1. This remark by Foucault should not, however, be read as a uniformly critical verdict against Sartre, with whom Foucault maintained a complex relationship and who represented for him an important ally throughout the 1970s, notably through the Groupe d’Information sur les Prisons (GIP). Foucault’s later interviews (gathered in Dits et Écrits, Foucault 2001) reflect a considerably more nuanced, and at times admiring, assessment of Sartre as an engaged intellectual. For an extensive scholarly treatment of the philosophical relations between the two thinkers, see Flynn (1997, 2005). For biographical context on Foucault’s intellectual trajectory and his relationship with Sartre, see also Eribon (1991) and Macey (1993).

2. Derrida asks:

…What must a society such as ours be if a man [that is Sartre], who in his own way, rejected or misunderstood so many theoretical and literary events of his time—let’s say, to go quickly, psychoanalysis, Marxism, structuralism, Joyce, Artaud, Bataille, Blanchot—who accumulated and disseminated incredible misreadings of Heidegger and sometimes of Husserl, could come to dominate the cultural scene to the point of becoming a great popular figure? (Derrida 1992 [1995: 122])

It is an interesting question that Derrida poses, but it is also of its time (1983) and does not engage at all with what is significant and singular about Sartre’s own work.

3. This new orientation of Sartre’s philosophy is explicitly documented in the War Diaries [Carnets de la drôle de guerre], particularly in notebooks XI and XIV, where the dialogue with Being and Time directly shapes Sartre’s transition from pure consciousness to being-in-the-world (Sartre 1984).

4. This bold biographical inference has drawn criticism: Bourdieu (1986) explicitly targeted this kind of totalizing existentialist inference, and Genet himself contested certain of Sartre’s interpretations in later interviews. For a systematic treatment of the relationship between Sartre’s account of freedom and the biographical method in Sartre’s later project on Flaubert, see Howells (1988), ch. 7–8.

5. This method was partly borrowed from Henri Lefebvre (1959), who subsequently claimed priority over Sartre’s formulation — a minor but frequently noted polemic in the secondary literature.