Notes to Touch

1. On the evolution of the most central underlying elements of human touch (somatosensory and motor cortex), see Kaas 2004.

2. For a discussion of the issues raised by bodily awareness itself, see the entry on bodily awareness.

3. For work directly on the notion of bodily awareness, see De Vignemont 2007a, 2007b, 2014; Maravita et al. 2003, Schwenkler 2011, and the papers in Bermúdez et al. 1995.

4. De Vignemont and Massin (2015) do an especially nice job discussing the nature of cutaneous touch, among other things.

5. This is a very interesting area of the literature. Many works focus primarily on felt pleasure and pain (e.g., Helm 2002) whereas others clearly intend their views to also explain perceptual affect (e.g., Cutter and Tye 2011; Aydede and Fulkerson 2011). As we’ll see, the empirical literature on perceptual affect has recently been moving along at a swift pace, and philosophers are starting to play a more important role in these discussions.

Copyright © 2020 by
Matthew Fulkerson <mfulkerson@ucsd.edu>

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