## Why Popper’s definition of truthlikeness fails: the Tichý-Miller theorem

The so called Tichý-Miller theorem proved that Popper’s original definition of truthlikeness in terms of truth and falsity contents was technically untenable. It also launched the post-Popperian research program on truthlikeness, leading to a couple of new, refined definitions eschewing the problems of Popper’s one. It is instructive to see how this negative result works against Popper’s definition.

Let us suppose that $$A$$ and $$B$$ are both false, and that $$A$$’s truth content exceeds $$B$$’s. Let $$a$$ be a true sentence entailed by $$A$$ but not by $$B$$. Let $$f$$ be any falsehood entailed by A. Since $$A$$ entails both $$a$$ and $$f$$ the conjunction, $$a \amp f$$ is a falsehood entailed by $$A$$, and so part of $$A$$’s falsity content. If $$a \amp f$$ were also part of $$B$$’s falsity content $$B$$ would entail both $$a$$ and $$f$$. But then it would entail $$a$$ contrary to the assumption. Hence $$a \amp f$$ is in $$A$$’s falsity content and not in $$B$$’s. So $$A$$’s truth content cannot exceeds $$B$$’s without $$A$$’s falsity content also exceeding $$B$$’s.

Suppose now that $$B$$’s falsity content exceeds $$A$$’s. Let $$g$$ be some falsehood entailed by $$B$$ but not by $$A$$, and let $$f$$, as before, be some falsehood entailed by $$A$$. The sentence $$f\rightarrow g$$ is a truth, and since it is entailed by $$g$$, is in $$B$$’s truth content. If it were also in $$A$$’s then both $$f$$ and $$f\rightarrow g$$ would be consequences of $$A$$ and hence so would $$g$$, contrary to the assumption. Thus $$A$$’s truth content lacks a sentence, $$f\rightarrow g$$, which is in $$B$$’s. So $$B$$’s falsity content cannot exceeds $$A$$’s without $$B$$’s truth content also exceeding $$A$$’s. The relationship depicted in Diagram 4 simply cannot obtain: in this sense, that picture is an “impossible” one, like those in Escher’s famous drawings.