1. Machiavelli has received considerable attention among philosophers in relation to his arguments, notably in The Prince, regarding so-called “Dirty Hands”, i.e., rulers, in particular, doing wrong to achieve good. See the entry on the problem of dirty hands.

2. For one of the most influential statements of the abuse of public office for private gain definitions see Nye 1967: 417–27.

3. See the Foreign Corrupt Practices Act of 1977, Public Law 95–213 (5305), December 19, 1977, United States Code 78a, Section 103. See also Organization for Economic Co-operation and Development (OECD) Convention Against the Bribery of Foreign Public Officials in International Business Transactions of 15 February 1999. See the Other Internet Resources.

4. There might be exceptions, such as higher mammals or Martians. If so, this would be irrelevant to my concerns here.

5. Regarding the definition, note that agent B could in fact be agent A. Regarding clause (1), note that agent A is not necessarily morally responsible for the effect E₁ or E₂ that his or her action x produces.