Vagueness
There is wide agreement that a term is vague to the extent that it has borderline cases. This makes the notion of a borderline case crucial in accounts of vagueness. I shall concentrate on an historical characterization of borderline cases that most commentators would accept. Vagueness will then be contrasted with ambiguity and generality. This will clarify the nature of the philosophical challenge posed by vagueness. I will then discuss some rival theories of vagueness with an emphasis on many-valued logic, supervaluationism and contextualism. I will conclude with the issue of whether all vagueness is linguistic.
- 1. Inquiry Resistance
- 2. Comparison with Ambiguity and Generality
- 3. The Philosophical Challenge Posed by Vagueness
- 4. Many-valued Logic
- 5. Supervaluationism
- 6. Contextualism
- 7. Is All Vagueness Linguistic?
- Bibliography
- Other Internet Resources
- Related Entries
1. Inquiry Resistance
If you cut one head off of a two headed man, have you decapitated him? What is the maximum height of a short man? When does a fertilized egg develop into a person?
These questions are impossible to answer because they involve absolute borderline cases. In the vast majority of cases, the unknowability of a borderline statement is only relative to a given means of settling the issue (Sorensen 2001a, chapter 1). For instance, a boy may count as a borderline case of ‘obese’ because people cannot tell whether he is obese just by looking at him. A curious mother could try to settle the matter by calculating her boy's body mass index. The formula is to divide his weight (in kilograms) by the square of his height (in meters). If the value exceeds 30, this test counts him as obese. The calculation will itself leave some borderline cases. The mother could then use a weight-for-height chart. These charts are not entirely decisive because they do not reflect the ratio of fat to muscle, whether the child has large bones, and so on. The boy will only count as an absolute borderline case of ‘obese’ if no possible method of inquiry could settle whether he is obese. When we reach this stage, we start to suspect that our uncertainty is due to the concept of obesity rather than to our limited means of testing for obesity.
Absolute borderline cases are targeted by Charles Sander Peirce's entry for ‘vague’ in the 1902 Dictionary of Philosophy and Psychology:
A proposition is vague when there are possible states of things concerning which it is intrinsically uncertain whether, had they been contemplated by the speaker, he would have regarded them as excluded or allowed by the proposition. By intrinsically uncertain we mean not uncertain in consequence of any ignorance of the interpreter, but because the speaker's habits of language were indeterminate. (Peirce 1902, 748)
In the case of relative borderline cases, the question is clear but our means for answering it are incomplete. In the case of absolute borderline cases, there is incompleteness in the question itself.
When a term is applied to one of its absolute borderline cases the result is a statement that resists all attempts to settle whether it is true or false. No amount of conceptual analysis or empirical inquiry can settle whether removing one head from a two headed man counts as decapitating him. We could give the appearance of settling the matter by stipulating that ‘decapitate’ means ‘remove a head’ (as opposed to ‘make headless’ or ‘remove the head’ or ‘remove the most important head’). But that would amount to changing the topic to an issue that merely sounds the same as decapitation.
Vagueness is standardly defined as the possession of borderline cases. For example, ‘tall’ is vague because a man who is 1.8 meters in height is neither clearly tall nor clearly non-tall. No amount of conceptual analysis or empirical investigation can settle whether a 1.8 meter man is tall. Borderline cases are inquiry resistant. Indeed, the inquiry resistance typically recurses. For in addition to the unclarity of the borderline case, there is normally unclarity as to where the unclarity begins. In other words ‘borderline case’ has borderline cases. This higher order vagueness shows that ‘vague’ is vague.
2. Comparison with Ambiguity and Generality
‘Tall’ is relative. A 1.8 meter pygmy is tall for a pygmy but a 1.8 meter Masai is not tall for a Masai. Although relativization disambiguates, it does not eliminate borderline cases. There are shorter pygmies who are borderline tall for a pygmy and taller Masai who are borderline tall for a Masai. The direct bearers of vagueness are a word's full disambiguations such as ‘tall for an eighteenth century French man’. Words are only vague indirectly, by virtue of having a sense that is vague. In contrast, an ambiguous word has its ambiguity directly — simply in virtue of having multiple meanings.
This contrast between vagueness and ambiguity is obscured by the fact that most words are both vague and ambiguous. ‘Child’ is ambiguous between ‘offspring’ and ‘immature offspring’. The latter reading of ‘child’ is vague because there are borderline cases of immature offspring. The contrast is further complicated by the fact that most words are also general. For instance, ‘child’ covers both boys and girls.
Ambiguity and vagueness also contrast with respect to the speaker's discretion. If a word is ambiguous, the speaker can resolve the ambiguity without departing from literal usage. For instance, he can declare that he meant ‘child’ to express the concept of an immature offspring. If a word is vague, the speaker cannot resolve the borderline case. For instance, the speaker cannot make ‘child’ literally mean anyone under eighteen just by intending it. That concept is not, as it were, on the menu corresponding to ‘child’. He would be understood as taking a special liberty with the term to suit a special purpose. This would relieve him of the obligation to defend the sharp cut-off.
When the movie director Alfred Hitchcock mused ‘All actors are children’ he was taking liberties with clear negative cases of ‘child’ rather than its borderline cases. The aptness of his generalization is not judged by its literal truth-value (because it is obviously untrue). Likewise, we do not judge precisifications of borderline cases by their truth-values (because they are obviously not ascertainable as true or false). We instead judge precisifications by their simplicity, conservativeness, and fruitfulness. A precisification that draws the line across the borderline cases conserves more paradigm usage than one that draws the line across clear cases. But conservatism is just one desideratum among many. Sometimes the best balance is achieved at the cost of turning former positive cases into negative cases.
Once we shift from literal to figurative usage, we gain fictive control over our entire vocabulary -- not just vague words. When a travel agent says ‘France is a hexagon’, we do not infer that she has committed the geometrical error of classifying France as a six sided polygon. We instead interpret the travel agent as speaking figuratively, as meaning that France is shaped like a hexagon. Similarly, when the travel agent says ‘Reno is the biggest little city’, we do not interpret her as overlooking the vagueness of ‘little city’. Just as she uses the obvious falsehood of ‘France is a hexagon’ to signal a metaphor, she uses the obvious indeterminacy of ‘Reno is the biggest little city’ to signal hyperbole.
Given that speakers lack any literal discretion over vague terms, we ought not to chide them for indecisiveness. Where there is no decision to be made, there is no scope for vice.
Speakers would have literal discretion if statements applying a predicate to its borderline cases were just permissible variations in linguistic usage. For instance, Crispin Wright and Stewart Shapiro say a competent speaker can faultlessly classify the borderline case as a positive instance while another competent speaker can faultlessly classify the case as a negative instance.
For the sake of comparison, consider discretion between alternative spellings. Professor Letterman uses ‘judgment’ instead of ‘judgement’ because he wants to promote the principle that a silent E signals a long vowel. He still has fond memories of Tom Lehrer's 1971 children's song “Silent E”:
Who can turn a can into a cane?
Who can turn a pan into a pane?
It's not too hard to see,
It's Silent E.
Who can turn a cub into a cube?
Who can turn a tub into a tube?
It's elementary
For Silent E.
Professor Letterman disapproves of those who add the misleading E but concedes that ‘judgement’ is a permissible spelling; he does not penalize his students for misspelling when they make their hard-hearted choice of ‘judgement’. Indeed, like other professors, he scolds students if they fail to stick with the same spelling throughout the composition. Choose but stick to your choice!
Professor Letterman's assertion ‘The word for my favorite mental act is spelled j-u-d-g-m-e-n-t’ is robust with respect to the news that it is also spelled j-u-d-g-e-m-e-n-t. He would continue to assert it. He can conjoin the original assertion with information about the alternative: ‘The word for my favorite mental act is spelled j-u-d-g-m-e-n-t and is also spelled j-u-d-g-e-m-e-n-t’. In contrast, Professor Letterman's assertion that ‘Martha is a woman’ is not robust with respect to the news that Martha is a borderline case of ‘woman’ (say, Letterman learns Martha is younger than she looks). The new information would lead Letterman to retract his assertion in favor of a hedged remark such as ‘Martha might be a woman and Martha might not be a woman’ . Professor Letterman's loss of confidence is hard to explain if the information about her borderline status were simply news of a different but permissible way of describing her. Discoveries of notational variants do not warrant changes in former beliefs. For instance, when chess players using traditional notation for recording moves learned of algebraic notation, they did not revise any of their beliefs about past chess moves.
News of borderline status has an evidential character. Loss of clarity brings loss of warrant. If you do not lower your confidence, you are open to the charge of dogmatism. To concede that Martha is a borderline case of ‘woman’ is to concede that you do not know that she is a woman. That is why debates can be dissolved by showing that the dispute is over a borderline case. The debaters should be agnostic if they are dealing with a borderline case. They do not have a license to form beliefs beyond their evidence.
News of an alternative sense is like news of an alternative spelling; there is no evidential impact (except for meta-linguistic beliefs about the nature of words). Your assertion that ‘All bachelors are men’ is robust with respect to the news that ‘bachelor’ has an alternative sense in which it means a male seal. Assertions are not robust with respect to news of hidden generality. If an African girl says ‘No elephant can be domesticated’ but is then taught that there is another species of elephant indigenous to India, then she will lose some confidence; perhaps Indian elephants can be domesticated. News of hidden generality has evidential impact. When it comes to robustness, vagueness resembles generality more than vagueness resembles ambiguity.
Mathematical terms such as ‘prime number’ show that a term can be general without being vague. A term can also be vague without being general. Borderline cases of analytically empty predicates illustrate this possibility.
Generality is obviously useful. Often, lessons about a particular F can be projected to other Fs in virtue of their common F-ness. When a girl learns that her cat has a nictating membrane that protects its eyes, she rightly expects her neighbor's cat also has a nictating membrane. Generality saves labor. When the girl says that she wants a toy rather than clothes, she narrows the range of acceptable gifts without going through the trouble of specifying a particular gift. The girl also balances values: a gift should be intrinsically desired and yet also be a surprise. If uncertain about which channel is the weather channel, she can hedge by describing the channel as ‘forty-something’. There is an inverse relationship between the contentfulness of a proposition and its probability: the more specific a claim, the less likely it is to be true. By gauging generality, we can make sensible trade-offs between truth and detail.
‘Vague’ has a sense which is synonymous with abnormal generality. This precipitates many equivocal explanations of vagueness. For instance, many commentators say that vagueness exists because broad categories ease the task of classification. If I can describe your sweater as red, then I do not need to figure out whether it is scarlet. This freedom to use wide intervals obviously helps us to learn, teach, communicate, and remember. But so what? The problem is to explain the existence of borderline cases. Are they present because vagueness serves a function? Or are borderline cases side-effects of ordinary conversation — like echoes?
Unless special preventive measures are taken, the attempt to classify objects will unintentionally leave some unanswerable questions in its wake. Predicates are like multi-stage rockets. Rockets which shed components are not designed to spread space age thingamajigs to inaccessible places. But if no precautions are taken, rockets will sow mysteries. At the extreme end of this accidental continuum lie the analogues of borderline cases.
Every natural language is both vague and ambiguous. However, both features seem eliminable. Indeed, both are eliminated in miniature languages such as checkers notation, computer programming languages, and mathematical descriptions. Moreover, it seems that both vagueness and ambiguity ought to be minimized. ‘Vague’ and ‘ambiguous’ are pejorative terms. And they deserve their bad reputations. Think of all the automotive misery that has been prefaced by
Driver: Do I turn left?
Passenger: Right.
English can be lethal. Philosophers have long motivated appeals for an ideal language by pointing out how ambiguity creates the menace of equivocation:
No child should work.
Every person is a child of someone.
Therefore, no one should work.
Happily, we know how to criticize and correct all equivocations. Indeed, every natural language is self-disambiguating in the sense that each has all the resources needed to uniquely specify any reading one desires. Ambiguity is often the cause but rarely the object of philosophical rumination.
3. The Philosophical Challenge Posed by Vagueness
Vagueness, in contrast, precipitates a profound problem: the sorites paradox. For instance,
Base step: A one day year old human being is a child.Induction step: If an n day old human being is a child, then that human being is also a child when it is n + 1 days old.
Conclusion: Therefore, a 36,500 day old human being is a child.
The conclusion is false because a 100 year old man is clearly a non-child. Since the base step of the argument is also plainly true and the argument is valid by mathematical induction, we seem to have no choice but to reject the second premise.
George Boolos (1991) observes that we have an autonomous case against the induction step. In addition to implying plausible conditionals such as ‘If a 1 day old human being is a child, then that human being is also a child when it is 2 days old’, the induction step also implies ludicrous conditionals such as ‘If a 1 day old human being is a child, then that human being is also a child when it is 36,500 days old’. For some reason, we tend to overlook these easy counterexamples to the induction step.
With Boolos' helping hand, we have driven two stakes into the heart of the sorities paradox. Yet the paradox seems far from dead. The negation of the second premise classically implies a sharp threshold for childhood. For it implies the existential generalization that there is a number n such that an n day old human being is a child but is no longer a child n + 1 days.
Epistemicists accept this astonishing consequence. They think vagueness is a form of ignorance. Timothy Williamson (1994) traces the ignorance of the threshold for childhood to "margin for error" principles. If one knows that an n day old human being is a child, then that human being must also be a child when n + 1 days old. Otherwise, one is right by luck. Given that there is a threshold, we would be ignorant of its location.
Most philosophers believe that epistemicism is tantamount to the acceptance of a linguistic miracle. They boggle at the possibility that our rough and ready terms such as ‘child’ could so sensitively classify objects. Epistemicists counter that this bafflement rests on an over-estimate of the role of stipulation in meaning. They say much meaning is acquired passively by default rather than actively by decision.
Most philosophers doubt whether precise analytical tools fit vague arguments. H. G. Wells was amongst the first to suggest that we must moderate the application of logic:
Every species is vague, every term goes cloudy at its edges, and so in my way of thinking, relentless logic is only another name for stupidity — for a sort of intellectual pigheadedness. If you push a philosophical or metaphysical enquiry through a series of valid syllogisms — never committing any generally recognized fallacy — you nevertheless leave behind you at each step a certain rubbing and marginal loss of objective truth and you get deflections that are difficult to trace, at each phase in the process. Every species waggles about in its definition, every tool is a little loose in its handle, every scale has its individual. — First and Last Things (1908)
Many more believe that the problem is with logic itself rather than the manner in which it is applied. They favor solving the sorites paradox by replacing standard logic with an earthier deviant logic.
There is a desperately wide range of opinions as to how the revision of logic should be executed. Every form of deviant logic has been applied in the hope of resolving the sorites paradox.
4. Many-valued Logic
An early favorite was many-valued logic. On this approach, borderline statements are assigned truth-values that lie between full truth and full falsehood. Some logicians favor three truth-values, other prefer four or five. Perhaps the most popular is to use an infinite number represented by the real numbers between 0 (for full falsehood) and 1 (for full truth).
Critics object that this proliferation of truth-values exacerbates the over-precision of classical logic. Instead of having just one artificially sharp line between the truth and the false, the many-valued logician has infinitely many sharp lines such as that between statements with a truth of of .323483925 and those with a higher truth-value. In Mark Sainsbury's words, "… you do not improve a bad idea by iterating it." (1996, 255)
A proponent of an infinite valued logic might reply to Sainsbury with an analogy. It is a bad idea to model a circle with a straight line. Using two lines is not much better, nor is there is much improvement using a three sided polygon (a triangle). But as we add more straight lines to the polygon (square, pentagon, hexagon, and so on) we make progress -- by iterating the bad idea of modeling a circle with straight lines.
Indeed, it would be tempting to triumphantly conclude ‘The circle has been modeled as an infinitely sided polygon’. This victory declaration would itself need philosophical clarification. Has the circle been revealed to be an infinitely sided polygon? Have curved lines been replaced by straight lines? Have curved lines (and hence circles) been proven to not exist? A model can succeed without it being clear what has been achieved.
But it is premature to dwell on the simile ‘Precision is to vagueness as straightness is to curvature’. The many-valued logician must first vindicate the analogy by providing details about how to calculate the truth-values of vague statements from the truth-values of their component statements.
Proponents of many-valued logic meet this obligation with great industry. Precise new rules are introduced to calculate the truth value of compound statements that contain statements with intermediate truth-values. For instance, the revised rule for conjunctions is to assign the conjunction the same truth-value as the conjunct with the lowest truth-value.
These rules are designed to yield all standard theorems when all the truth values are 1 and 0. In this sense, classical logic is a limiting case of many-valued logic. Classical logic is agreed to work fine in the area for which it was designed -- mathematics.
Most theorems of standard logic break down when intermediate truth-values are involved. (An irregular minority, such as ‘If P, then P’, survive.) Even the classical contradiction ‘Bozo is bald and it is not the case that he is bald’ receives a truth-value of .5 when ‘Bozo is bald’ has a truth-value of .5. Many-valued logicians note that the error they are imputing to classical logic is often so small that classical logic can still be fruitfully applied. But they insist that the sorites paradox illustrates how tiny errors can accumulate into a big error.
Critics of the many-valued approach complain that it botches phenomena such as hedging. If I regard you as a borderline case of ‘tall man’, I cannot sincerely assert that you are tall and I cannot sincerely assert that you are of average height. But I can assert the hedged claim ‘You are tall or of average height’. The many-valued rule for disjunction is to assign the whole statement the truth-value of its highest disjunct. Normally, the added disjunct in a hedged claim is not more plausible than the other disjuncts. Thus it cannot increase the degree of truth. Disappointingly, the proponent of many-valued logic cannot trace the increase of assertibility to an increase the degree of truth.
Epistemicists explain the rise in assertibility by the increasing probability of truth. Since the addition of disjuncts can raise probability indefinitely, the epistemicists correctly predict that we can hedge our way to full assertibility. However, epistemicists do not have a monopoly on this prediction.
5. Supervaluationism
According to supervaluationists, borderline statements lack a truth-value. This neatly explains why it is universally impossible to know the truth-value of a borderline statement. Supervaluationists offer details about the nature of absolute borderline cases. Simple sentences about borderline cases lack a truth-value. Compounds of these statements can have a truth-value if they come out true regardless of how the statement is precisified. For instance, ‘Either Mr. Stoop is tall or it is not the case that Mr. Stoop is tall’ is true because it comes out true under all ways of sharpening ‘tall’. Thus the method of supervaluations allows one to retain all the theorems of standard logic while admitting "truth-value gaps".
One may wonder whether this striking result is a genuine convergence with standard logic. Is the supervaluationist characterizing vague statements as propositions? Or is he merely pointing out that certain non-propositions have a structure isomorphic to logical theorems? (Some electrical circuits are isomorphic to tautologies but this does make the circuits tautologies.) Kit Fine (1975, 282), and especially David Lewis, characterize vagueness as hyper-ambiguity. Instead of there being one vague concept, there are many precise concepts that closely resemble each other. ‘Child’ can mean a human being at most one day old or mean a human being at most two days old or mean a human being at most three days old …. Thus the logic of vagueness is a logic for equivocators. Lewis' idea is that ambiguous statements are true when they come out true under all disambiguations. But logicians normally require that a statement be disambiguated before logic is applied. The laws of logic are about propositions. The mere fact that an ambiguous statement comes out true under all its disambiguations does not show that the statement itself is true. Sentences which are actually disambiguated may have truth-values. But the best that can be said of those that merely could be disambiguated is that they would have had a truth-value had they been disambiguated (Tye 1989).
Supervaluationism will converge with classical logic only if each word of the supervaluated sentence is uniformly interpreted. For instance, ‘Either a carbon copy of Teddy Roosevelt's signature is an autograph or it is not the case that a carbon copy of Teddy Roosevelt's signature is an autograph’ comes out true only if ‘autograph’ is interpreted the same way in both disjuncts. Vague sentences resist mixed interpretations. However, mixed interpretations are permissible for ambiguous sentences. As Lewis himself notes in a criticism of relevance logic, ‘Scrooge walked along the bank on his way to the bank’ can receive a mixed disambiguation. When exterminators offer ‘non-toxic ant poison’, we charitably switch relativizations within the noun phrase: the substance is safe for human beings but deadly for ants.
Even if one agrees that supervaluationism converges with classical logic about theoremhood, they clearly differ in other respects. Supervaluationism requires rejection of inference rules such as contraposition, conditional proof and reductio ad absurdum (Williamson 1994, 151-152). In the eyes of the supervaluationist, a demonstration that a statement is not true does not guarantee that the statement is false.
The supervaluationist is also under pressure to reject semantic principles which are intimately associated with the application of logical laws. According to Alfred Tarski's Convention T, a statement ‘S’ is true if and only if S. In other words, truth is disquotational. Supervaluationists say that being supertrue (being true under all precisifications) suffices for being true. But given Convention T, supertruth would then be disquotational. Since the supervaluationists accept the principle of excluded middle, they would be forced to say ‘P’ is supertrue or ‘Not P’ is supertrue (even if ‘P’ applies a predicate to a borderline case). This would imply that either ‘P’ is true or ‘Not P’ is true. (Williamson 1994, 162-163) And that would be a fatal loss of truth-value gaps for supervaluationism.
There is a final concern about the "ontological honesty" of the supervaluationist's existential quantifier. As part of his solution to the sorites paradox, the supervaluationist will assert ‘There is a human being who was a child when n days old but not when n + 1 days old’. For this statement comes out true under all admissible precisifications of ‘child’. However, when pressed the supervaluationist will add an unofficial clarification: "Oh, of course I do not mean that there really is a sharp threshold for childhood."
After the clarification, some wonder how supervaluationism differs from drastic metaphysical skepticism. In his nihilist days, Peter Unger (1979) admitted that it is useful to talk as if there are children. But he insisted that strictly speaking, vague terms such as ‘child’ cannot apply to anything. Unger was free to use supervaluationism as a theory to explain our ordinary discourse about children. (Unger instead used other resources to explain how we fruitfully apply empty predicates.) But once the dust had cleared and the precise rubble came into focus, Unger had to conclude that there are no children.
Officially, the supervaluationist rejects the induction step of the sorites argument. Unofficially, he seems to instead reject the base step of the sorites argument.
6. Contextualism
Just as contextualism in epistemology runs orthogonal to the familiar divisions amongst epistemologists (foundationalism, reliabilism, coherentism, etc.), there are contextualists of every persuasion amongst vagueness theorists. They develop an analogy between the sorites paradox and indexical sophistries such as:
1. Base step: The horizon is more than 1 meter away.
2. Induction step: If the horizon is more than n meters away, then it is more than n + 1 meters away.
3. Conclusion: The horizon is more than a billion meters away.
The horizon is where the earth meets the sky and is certainly less than a billion meters away. (The circumference of the earth is only forty million meters.) Yet when you travel toward the horizon to specify the n at which the induction step fails, your trip is as vain as the pursuit of the rainbow. You cannot reach the horizon because it shifts with your location.
All contextualists accuse the sorites monger of equivocating. In one sense, the meaning of ‘child’ is uniform; the context-invariant rule for using the term (its “character”) is constant. However, the set of things to which the term applies (its “content”) shifts with the context. In this respect, vague words resemble indexical terms such as: I, you, here, now, today, tomorrow. When a debtor tells his creditor on Monday ‘I will pay you back tomorrow’ and then repeats the sentence on Tuesday, there is a sense in which he has said the same thing (the character is the same) and a sense in which he has said something different (the content has shifted because ‘tomorrow’ now picks out Wednesday).
According to the contextualists, the rules governing the shifts prohibit us from interpreting any instance of the induction step as having a true antecedent and a false consequent. The very process of trying to refute the induction step changes the context so that the instance will not come out false. Indeed, contextualists typically emphasize that each instance is true and so compel our assent. Direct attacks on the induction step can never be successful. One is put in mind of Seneca's admonition to Nero: “However many you put to death, you will never kill your successor.”
How strictly are we to take the comparison between vague words and indexical terms? Scott Soames (2002, 445) answers that all vague words literally are indexical.
This straightforward response is open to the objection that the sorites monger could stabilize reference. When the sorites monger relativizes ‘horizon’ to the northeast corner of the Empire State Building's observation deck, he seems to generate a genuine sorites paradox that exploits the vagueness of ‘horizon’ (not its indexicality).
All natural languages have stabilizing pronouns, ellipsis, and other anaphoric devices. For instance, in ‘Jack is tired now and Jill is too’, the ‘too’ forces a uniform reading of ‘tired’. Jason Stanley suggests that the sorites monger employ the premise:
If that1 is a child then that2 is too, and if that2 is too, then that3 is too, and if that3 is too, then that4 is too, … and then thati is too.
Each ‘thatn’ refers to the nth element in a sequence of worsening examples of ‘child’. The meaning of ‘child’ is not shifting because the first occurrence of the term governs all the subsequent clauses (thanks to ‘too’). If vague terms were literally indexical, the sorites monger would have a strong reply. If vague terms only resemble indexicals, then the contextualist needs to develop the analogy in a way that circumvents Stanley's counsel to the sorites monger.
There is certainly no shortage of more guarded contextualists. Hans Kamp, the founder of contextualism, maintained that the extension of vague words orbits the speaker's store of conversational commitments. In a more psychological vein, Diana Raffman says changes in context trigger gestalt shifts between look-alike categories.
Stewart Shapiro integrates Kamp's ideas with Friedrich Waismann's concept of open texture. Shapiro thinks speakers have discretion over borderline cases because they are judgment dependent. They come out true in virtue of the speaker judging them to be true. Given that the audience does not resist, borderline cases of ‘child’ can be correctly described as children. The audience recognizes that other competent speakers could describe the borderline case differently. As Waismann lyricizes “Every description stretches, as it were, into a horizon of open possibilities: However far I go, I shall always carry this horizon with me.” (1968, 122)
American pragmaticism colors Delia Graff's contextualism. Consider dandelion farms. Why would someone grow weeds? The answer is that ‘weed’ is relative to interests. Dandelions are unwanted by lawn caretakers but are wanted by farmers for food, wine, and medical uses. Delia Graff thinks this surprising relativity extends to all vague words. For instance, ‘child’ means a degree of immaturity that is significant to the speaker. Since the interests of the speaker shifts over time, there is an opportunity for a shift in the extension of ‘child’. Graff is reluctant to describe herself as a contextualist because the context only has an indirect effect on the extension via the changes it makes to the speaker's interest.
The first challenge for the contextualist is to find enough shiftiness to block every sorites argument. Since vagueness reaches into every syntactic category, critics complain that contextualism is incompatible with the level of ambiguity accepted by linguistics and psycholinguists. Analogy: hydrologists agree there is much hidden water but all hydrologists are scientifically committed to denying Thales' claim that all is water.
Another concern is that some sorites involve predicates that do not give us an opportunity to equivocate. For instance, some vague predicates are too complex for us to reason with. Consider the predicate obtained by iterating ‘mother of’ a thousand times (Sorensen 2001, 33). This predicate could be embedded in a sorites that would never generate context shifts.
Other unthinkable sorites argument use predicates that can only be grasped by individuals in other possible worlds or by creatures with different types of minds than ours. More fancifully, there could be a vague predicate that instantly kills anyone who thinks about it.
7. Is All Vagueness Linguistic?
Supervaluationists encourage the view that all vagueness is a matter of linguistic indecision: the reason why there are borderline cases is that we have not bothered to make up our minds. Many supervaluationists maintain that this indecision is functional. Instead of committing ourselves prematurely, we can fill in meanings as we go along in light of new information and interests. This conjecture is promising for the highly stipulative enterprise of promulgating and enforcing laws (Endicott 2000). Judges frequently seem to exercise and control discretion by means of vague language. However, there is the suspicion that the real work is being done by the generality of the legal propositions rather than their vagueness (Sorensen 2001b).
Objects themselves do not seem to be the sort of thing that can be general, ambiguous, or vague. Thus the Romantics appear to be committing a category mistake when they characterize sea foam as vague. Indeed, there used to be a consensus that believers in vague objects were committing the fallacy of verbalism — inferring that an object has the property that its representation has.
A minority of philosophers now believe that there are vague objects (clouds, Mount Everest, perhaps even entities of quantum physics). There is a precedent for this revival. Peter van Inwagen recalls that in the 1960s, there was a consensus that all necessity is linguistic. Most philosophers now take the possibility of essential properties seriously.
Indeed, some allege that supervaluationists inadvertently rely on metaphysical vagueness to characterize linguistic vagueness (Merricks 2001). If ‘Bozo is bald’ lacks a truth-value because there is no fact to make the statement true, then the shortage appears to be ontological rather than linguistic.
The view that vagueness is always linguistic has been attacked from other directions. Mental imagery seems vague. When rising suddenly after a prolonged crouch, I "see stars before my eyes". I can tell there are more than ten of these hallucinated lights but I cannot tell how many. Is this indeterminacy in thought to be reduced to indeterminacy in language? Why not vice versa? Language is an outgrowth of human psychology. Thus it seems natural to view language as merely an accessible intermediate bearer of vagueness.
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- Merricks, Trenton (2001) "Varieties of Vagueness", Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, LXIII: 145-157.
- Peirce, C.S. (1902) "Vague", in Dictionary of Philosophy and Psychology, J.M. Baldwin (ed.), New York: MacMillan, 748.
- Raffman, D. (1996) "Vagueness and context-sensitivity", Philosophical Studies, 81: 175-92.
- Sainsbury, R. M. (1996) "Concepts without boundaries", Vagueness: A Reader, Rosanna Keefe and Peter Smith (ed.), Cambridge, Massachusetts: MIT Press, 251-264.
- Shapiro, Stewart (2006) Vagueness in Context, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Soames, S. (1999) Understanding Truth, New York: Oxford University Press.
- Soames, S. (2002) "Precis of Understanding Truth and replies", Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, LXV: 429-452.
- Sorensen, Roy (2001a) Vagueness and Contradiction, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
- Sorensen, Roy (2001b) "Vagueness has no function in law", Legal Theory, 7/4: 385-415.
- Stanley, Jason (2003) "Context, interest-relativity, and the sorites", Analysis, 63: 269-80.
- Tye, Michael (1989) "Supervaluationism and the Law of Excluded Middle", Analysis, 49/3: 141-143.
- Unger, Peter (1979) "There are no ordinary things", Synthese, 4: 117-54.
- Van Inwagen, Peter (1990) Material Beings, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
- Waismann, Friedrich (1968) "Verifiability", in Logic and Language, Anthony Flex (ed.), Oxford: Basil Blackwell.
- Williamson, Timothy (1994) Vagueness, London: Routledge.
- Wright, Crispin (1995) "The Epistemic Conception of Vagueness", Southern Journal of Philosophy, 33 (Supplement): 133-159.
Other Internet Resources
- Bibliography of literature on vagueness and the Sorites Paradox, maintained by Justin Needle (Ph.D./Philosophy, U. Dundee, 1995)
[Please contact the author with other suggestions.]
Related Entries
boundary | identity | indexicals | law-and-language | logic: fuzzy | logic: many-valued | logic: paraconsistent | many, problem of | properties | Sorites paradox | temporal parts