1. For an illuminating discussion of the analogies between semantic rules and systems of etiquette, see McKeown-Green 2002.

2. Before turning to discussion of these two sorts of theories, it is worth noting that one prominent tradition in the philosophy of language denies that there are facts about the meanings of linguistic expressions. (See, for example, Quine 1960 and Kripke 1982; for critical discussion, see Soames 1997.) If this sort of skepticism about meaning is correct, then there is neither a true semantic theory nor a true metasemantic theory to be found, since the relevant sort of facts simply are not around to be described or analyzed. Discussion of these skeptical arguments is beyond the scope of this entry, so in what follows I’ll simply assume that skepticism about meaning is false.

3. These contexts are also sometimes called ‘intensional contexts.’ But this phrase is, somewhat confusingly, used in two different ways. The first is just as a synonym for ‘non-extensional context,’ i.e. a context in which substitution of expressions with the same reference/extension can change the truth-value of the sentence. The second is as a name for a context in which substitution of expressions with the same *intension* – that is, the same function from indices to extensions – *cannot* change the truth-value of the sentence. These are then contrasted with ‘hyperintensional contexts,’ which are contexts in which substitution of expressions with the same intension can change the truth-value of the relevant sentence. Hyperintensional contexts would be intensional in the first sense of the term but not the second. Because of these complications it is arguably best to stick with ‘non-extensional.’

4. While plausible, this principle is not uncontroversial; see entry on compositionality

5. Other broadly metaphysical objections to Russellianism target the assumption that some propositions have individuals among their constituents. Problems result if we assume that propositions cannot exist without their constituents existing. Consider the proposition that possibly Socrates does not exist. This seems to be true. But then it seems that there must be some possible world in which the proposition that Socrates does not exist is true. But if that proposition is true, it must exist; and if the proposition exists, then its constituents, including Socrates, must exist. But then, contra our assumption, the proposition that Socratres does not exist can’t be true after all. For discussion, see the entry on singular propositions.

6. According to the first sort of Russellian, we can’t adequately decide disputes about the semantics of names without also investigating the relationship between semantics and pragmatics; one of the important trends in recent semantics has been an increasing attempt to explain linguistic phenomena with an eye on both possible semantic and pragmatic explanations.

7. This is not to say that there is not controversy over the existence of these sorts of entities; there is. (See for discussion nominalism in metaphysics.) The point is just that many believe in the existence of entities of these kinds for reasons unconnected to the philosophy of language; these entities were not introduced to play the role of the contents of expressions.

8. One worry about this formulation concerns the apparent existence of pairs of sentences, like “If Obama exists, then Obama=Obama” and “If McCain exists, McCain=McCain” which are such that any rational person who understands both will take both to be true. These sentences seem intuitively to differ in content—but this is ruled out by the criterion above. One idea for getting around this problem would be to state our criterion of difference for senses of expressions in terms of differences which result from substituting one expression for another:

Two expressions e and e* differ in sense if and only if there are a pair of sentences, S and S* which (i) differ only in the substitution of e for e* and (ii) are such that some rational agent who understood both could, on reflection, judge that S is true without judging that S* is true.

This version of the criterion has Frege’s formulation as a special case, since sentences are, of course, expressions; and it solves the problem with obvious truths, since it seems that substitution of sentences of this sort can change the truth value of a propositional attitude ascription. Furthermore, the criterion delivers the wanted result that coreferential names like “Superman” and “Clark Kent” differ in sense, since a rational, reflective agent like Lois Lane could think that (17) is true while withholding assent from (18). For more discussion of Frege’s criterion of difference for senses, see Schellenberg (2012).

9. A third traditional problem for Fregeanism asks whether the Fregean can give an adequate treatment of indexical expressions. A classic argument that the Fregean cannot is given in Perry (1977); for a Fregean reply, see Evans (1981).

10. This is most natural for views, like Millian-Russellian views, which make meaning closely related to the entity in the world for which the word stands.