Porphyry

Porphyry (234?–305? C.E.) was a Neoplatonist philosopher, born in Tyre in Phoenicia. He studied with Longinus in Athens and then, from 263 to 268 C.E., with Plotinus in Rome, whose version of Platonism he adopted. Although he wrote on almost every branch of learning of his day, only a small part of his work survives. Notably, Porphyry edited Plotinus’ Enneads, establishing the form in which they have been read ever since. He also wrote the Isagoge, for centuries the standard introduction to logic in Byzantium, the Arabic world and the Latin West, as well as the now-lost polemic Against the Christians. His own metaphysics is set out in the Sententiae. Porphyry was the first Platonist to comment on Aristotle and held that Plato and Aristotle agreed on essentials. By applying Platonist doctrine to pagan religion, he defended philosophy, rather than ritual, as the way to the soul’s salvation. He remains a central figure in the spread of Neoplatonism and, as is increasingly recognized, an original philosopher.

• 1. Life
• 2. Works and Profile
• 3. Philosophical Views
  • 3.1 Religion
  • 3.2 Psychology and Ethics
  • 3.3 The Metaphysics of the Higher Realms
  • 3.4 Aristotle, Logic and Epistemology
• Bibliography
  • Editions and Translations
  • Other Primary Literature
  • General Works and Collections
  • Studies on Particular Topics
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Life

Porphyry was born in Tyre in Phoenicia (now in Lebanon), probably in 234 C.E. His Semitic name was Malchos, “king” in his native tongue, which he himself renders as “Basileus” in Greek. Since “Porphyrios” is attested as a personal name at Tyre, he may well have borne it from birth. Eunapius’ claim that it was Longinus who changed his name finds no support in other sources.

Little is known with certainty about his life beyond what can be gathered from his own Life of Plotinus, probably composed in 301 C.E. as a preface to his edition of Plotinus’ writings, the Enneads, which he arranged into six books of nine treatises each. The account in Eunapius’ Lives of Philosophers and Sophists depends on Porphyry’s Life and adds little that is reliable.

The main lines of the biography, as reconstructed by Goulet (2012a) on the basis of Bidez’s Vie de Porphyre (1913), are as follows. Porphyry studied in Athens with the Middle Platonist Longinus. A verbatim fragment from the third book of Against the Christians, preserved by Eusebius (Hist. eccl. VI 19, 5–8 = fr. 6F Becker), records that Porphyry met the Christian writer Origen “while still quite young”, probably at Caesarea towards the end of the 240s (Becker 2016, 4–5). (On the identity of this Origen and his relation to the Platonist Origen of the Life of Plotinus, see Zambon 2011 and Becker 2016, 151–153.) In 263 C.E. Porphyry moved to Rome, where he remained for some five years and adopted Plotinus’ version of Platonism. On Plotinus’ advice, he left for Sicily in 268 in order to recover from a bout of depression (“melancholy”), and he was still there when Plotinus died in 270. Little is known with certainty about the remainder of Porphyry’s life; he probably died around 305. (On the Life of Plotinus and the edition of the Enneads, see Brisson et al. 1982–1992; an annotated English translation is provided in M. Edwards 2000; see also Pradeau 2023, 1–10.)

For Porphyry, the move from Athens to Rome entailed a philosophical reorientation, and one that did not occur without resistance. At the beginning of his stay, he composed a refutation of Plotinus designed to show that the intelligibles subsist outside the Intellect. Amelius answered him at Plotinus’ request, and after a further exchange of writings Porphyry recanted in a “palinode”, which he read before Plotinus’ class (Life of Plotinus 18). The status of the Ideas was precisely the main doctrinal point dividing the schools of Longinus and Plotinus.

The departure for Sicily in 268, which the Life of Plotinus (11) attributes to melancholy and to Plotinus’ advice, has prompted other explanations. One places it in a political context: around the time of Gallienus’ assassination in 268 C.E., nearly every principal member of Plotinus’ circle left Rome (Pradeau 2023, 5–8). According to a rival conjecture, the departure resulted from a doctrinal rupture with Plotinus over Aristotle’s categories (Evangeliou 1988, 4–5; Saffrey 1992). The Life of Plotinus, however, says nothing of any such rupture, and the suggestion is difficult to reconcile with Porphyry’s extraordinary editorial devotion to his master in the following decades.

The stay in Sicily seems to have been lengthy and productive: Eusebius suggests that Against the Christians was written there, and Augustine calls him “Porphyry the Sicilian”. A stay at Carthage and a period spent at Tyre are also attested, and Porphyry must subsequently have returned to Rome. There is no evidence that Plotinus’ school survived its founder or that Porphyry succeeded him in any formal sense. Even the widespread view that Iamblichus was Porphyry’s student has been questioned (Goulet 2012a), since it rests on late sources and on literary connections (the De mysteriis is a reply to Porphyry’s Letter to Anebo). It is clear, at any rate, that Iamblichus was strongly influenced by Porphyry, even if he later reacted vehemently against some of his positions.

Late in life, Porphyry married Marcella, the widow of a friend and the mother of seven children. He presents the marriage as motivated solely by her philosophical nature, since the return to the intelligible admits no distinction of sex (Letter to Marcella 33; Pradeau 2023, 16–18). After ten months, he left her in order to attend to “the need of the Hellenes”, backed by “the urging of the gods” (Letter to Marcella 4). This formula has been interpreted as a summons to help prepare Diocletian’s persecution of 303, on the strength of Lactantius’ report of an anonymous pagan philosopher who wrote against the Christians. The identification has been judged unpersuasive (see Goulet 2012a). According to a more deflationary interpretation, “the Hellenes” are simply the philosophical schools, and Porphyry was being called back to the service of pagan philosophical teaching in Athens or Rome (Pradeau 2023, 29–30).

2. Works and Profile

Porphyry was a prolific author who wrote on a wide range of topics. The fullest modern inventory, the catalogue in Goulet (2012a), records more than sixty titles, most of them now lost or surviving only in fragments. The following works are extant, though not all of them complete: the Life of Plotinus; the Life of Pythagoras; the Letter to Marcella; On Abstinence from Eating Food from Animals; the Starting-points Leading to the Intelligibles, usually referred to as the Sententiae; the Isagoge (Introduction); On the Cave of the Nymphs; the Introduction to Ptolemy’s Tetrabiblos; and commentaries on Ptolemy’s Harmonics and Aristotle’s Categories, of which Porphyry wrote two (see section 3.4.1). The Life of Pythagoras is the only nearly intact portion of the Philosophical History, a selective “canon” in four books running from the ancient sages through Pythagoras and Socrates to Plato, in whom philosophy attains the full revelation of the truth (Zambon 2012b). The Sententiae are, in effect, a condensed digest of the Enneads and a decisive link between Plotinus and Proclus’ Elements of Theology (D’Ancona 2005). The individual sentences differ widely in length and kind. Some are excerpts from or paraphrases of the Enneads, some are definitions or classifications, and some are arguments clarifying difficult points in Plotinus, such as the impassibility of incorporeals or the wanderings of the individual soul. Throughout, the stress falls on the difference between bodies and incorporeals, with the aim of leading the soul up to Intellect (Brisson 2012a).

The work To Gaurus, transmitted under Galen’s name, is almost certainly his. In addition, fragments survive of a number of works on psychology – one of them, the Symmikta zetemata, partly reconstructed by Dörrie (1959) – and of commentaries on Plato’s Timaeus and on treatises by Aristotle. The extant fragments and testimonia are collected in Smith 1993, which deliberately excludes works that had already received separate editions, such as the Timaeus commentary, the Letter to Anebo and Against the Christians. Porphyry also wrote on such diverse subjects as grammar, philology, rhetoric and geometry.

Pierre Hadot (1968) argued, in addition, that Porphyry was the author of the anonymous fragments of a commentary on Plato’s Parmenides, preserved on seven palimpsest leaves of a Gospel book from Bobbio (Turin, Biblioteca Nazionale, F VI 1). Since the manuscript perished in the Turin library fire of 1904, knowledge of the text depends on Kroll’s edition of 1892. Hadot’s attribution has been widely accepted, but has also been challenged (see section 3.3.2).

Two further possible additions to this corpus have recently been proposed. First, a Syriac treatise on first principles and matter has been identified as a translation or adaptation of a lost Greek work by Porphyry. It survives, without title or author’s name, in a single ninth-century manuscript from the Monastery of the Syrians in Egypt (Dayr al-Suryan, Syr. 27), where the text is scattered across leaves that are no longer in their original sequence. Arzhanov (2021) has edited it under the title On Principles and Matter (see the essays collected in Arzhanov (ed.) 2024). The treatise contains an extensive doxography of the doctrines of matter and first principles among earlier Platonists and, in its opening section, among the natural philosophers, the latter drawn largely from Aristotle’s Physics and Metaphysics (Bergamo 2024; on the doctrine of the treatise, see section 3.3.3). The attribution to Porphyry is supported, among other things, by the author’s reference to Plotinus and Longinus as his teachers and by extensive parallels with the section on matter in Calcidius’ commentary on the Timaeus (§§302–320). It is generally regarded as plausible. At the same time, these parallels confirm Waszink’s old hypothesis that Calcidius here depends, directly or indirectly, on Porphyry (Michalewski 2022a; Chase 2024; for reservations about Waszink’s reconstruction, see Reydams-Schils 2020, 172–190). Whether the common source of the two texts was Porphyry’s lost Timaeus commentary itself, a later summary of it, an independent treatise On Principles or On Matter, or an essay arising from Porphyry’s teaching on the dialogue remains uncertain (Chase 2024).

The second possible addition has emerged from the Hebrew tradition. The preface to the De’ot ha-pilosofim of the thirteenth-century Jewish scholar Shem-Tov Ibn Falaqera contains a verbatim quotation ascribed to “Porphyry of Tyre”. It urges that doctrines which strike the hearer as strange and contrary to long-held beliefs be investigated rather than dismissed out of habit. Its editors tentatively accept it as a genuine fragment of uncertain provenance (Freudenthal and Johnson 2020). It may derive from the lost Philosophical History, whose method of assessing competing doctrines it would suit, though this remains a hypothesis in need of further confirmation (Chiaradonna 2023, 199–200; see section 3.3.1).

Bidez (1913) portrayed the young Porphyry as inclined towards religion and superstition, but held that Porphyry became a more rational thinker during his time with Plotinus and later reverted to some extent to his earlier outlook. Subsequent research has found no clear support for this account of Porphyry’s development, and a sustained case against it argues instead for a complex unity of thought organized around “philosophical translation” (Johnson 2013, 9–15). On this account, the apparent gulf between works that seem to legitimize traditional polytheistic worship and those that appear critical of it or concentrate on the higher levels of the divine is not evidence of a two-stage intellectual development. Rather, it is the outcome of a single, continuous activity of transposing religious and cultural material into a Platonic framework.

Porphyry is sometimes presented as highly influential in the spread of Neoplatonism rather than as an original philosopher. The former claim is certainly true: he applied Neoplatonic doctrines to traditional pagan religion and myth and was a more outward-looking thinker than his master. The judgement that he was unoriginal may, however, be overhasty, since only a small sample of his writings survives and his more theoretical works are clearly underrepresented in it. What is extant suggests a close doctrinal affinity with Plotinus, with the exception of the disputed Parmenides commentary and his distinctive interpretation of Aristotle’s Categories, which has consequences for his view of the structure of the sensible realm.

Later Neoplatonists made extensive use of his commentaries. Most of what they report about the earlier exegetical tradition is thought to have reached them through Porphyry. Yet they regularly preferred “the divine Iamblichus” to “the philosopher Porphyry”, reputed to be merely the “most learned” of the commentators: “the Syrian is inspired, the Phoenician is (only) learned”, according to an alleged Pythian oracle (Goulet 2012b).

Beyond the logical corpus translated by Boethius, Porphyry left his mark on the Latin West above all through Augustine. The “books of the Platonists” which Augustine read at Milan in 386, and which precipitated his conversion, probably included works by both Plotinus and Porphyry. On one reconstruction, Porphyry’s On the Return of the Soul was among them (Courcelle 1948, 159–176); on another, the libri Platonicorum are to be identified with the Philosophy from Oracles (Beatrice 1989, 2023). Augustine has been described as at once “disciple and adversary of Porphyry” (Madec 1964). Porphyry’s reception in the Western and Eastern traditions is extensive and would require separate treatment (Erismann 2012; Hugonnard-Roche 2012; for the Arabic tradition, Adamson 2007; D’Ancona 1999).

3. Philosophical Views

It seems safe to assume that, before his encounter with Plotinus, Porphyry’s philosophical views were shaped by Longinus, Numenius and other Middle Platonists, in addition to Plato, Aristotle and the other classics of Greek philosophy. After meeting Plotinus, he became a follower of his version of Platonism, even if elements of his Middle Platonist background continued to show through in his post-Plotinian phase (Zambon 2002). This picture is suggested both by the Life of Plotinus and by the Sententiae, the only extant work certainly attributable to Porphyry in which he sets out his basic philosophical views.

For Plotinus and Porphyry, there is a categorial gap between two realms, the sensible and the intelligible. The latter contains three “hypostases” (three distinct metaphysical levels): the One, Intellect and Soul. The One, the first cause of everything else, is characterized by a sheer unity that places it beyond being, thought and description in language. Intellect is the sphere of real being, identified with the Platonic Forms, which are also the thoughts of a universal intellect. Soul, the lowest of the intelligible hypostases, is directly responsible for the sensible realm.

The sensible realm, an imperfect image of the intelligible, itself consists of levels. At the top are ensouled living beings, among them the sensible cosmos, which comprises the lesser organisms. Below them come forms in matter, bodies and matter itself, which are results of Soul’s creative activity but are not intelligible entities.

The relationship between these levels is generally described in terms of a doctrine of double activity: each higher level has a characteristic internal activity, which is accompanied by an external power or activity that constitutes the level below. This corresponds to the traditional Platonic relationship between paradigms and imitations (for qualifications to this view in Porphyry, see section 3.3.1). One consequence is the rejection of artisanal causation in the case of metaphysical principles. A higher principle does not plan, choose or turn towards its product, nor is it diminished by producing it; its external activity follows from what it is, in the way that heat follows from fire or radiance from the sun.

Human beings have, so to speak, one leg in each realm. Through the body and its non-rational soul (the seat of appetitive and spirited desires and of sense-perception), they belong to the sensible realm. Through their higher soul (intellect), they belong to the intelligible realm. Indeed, the true human being is to be identified with the intellect and the intelligible Human.

This is Plotinus’ philosophy, which Porphyry shares in broad outline (see the entry on Plotinus). There are, however, differences in terminology, which reveal in Porphyry a scholarly bent largely absent from Plotinus. Porphyry is also generally more interested than Plotinus in reconciling Aristotle with Platonism, as emerges from his more positive attitude towards the doctrine of Aristotle’s Categories. What follows focuses on certain points where Porphyry diverges from Plotinus, has been taken to diverge from him, or may be seen as developing his thought further.

3.1 Religion

In the Platonic tradition before Porphyry, authors such as Plutarch and Plotinus had already interpreted classical Greek mythology as philosophical allegory, but Porphyry takes this approach much further and far more systematically. For him, Homer’s text has a hidden philosophical meaning behind the literal one (see On the Cave of the Nymphs); his Philosophy from Oracles presented some kind of synthesis of pagan oracles and cultic practice with Platonic philosophy.

The philosophical stakes of his religious works lie in the relation between cult and philosophy as ways to the soul’s salvation. It is characteristic of post-Iamblichean Neoplatonism (from 330 C.E. onwards) that religion, religious rites and theurgy were taken to provide an alternative path to the soul’s salvation alongside philosophy (see the entry on Iamblichus). Porphyry did not share this view, and Iamblichus criticized him for his sceptical attitude towards theurgy in the Reply to Porphyry (transmitted as the De mysteriis). The criticism was not limited to theurgy but extended to fundamental psychological and metaphysical issues. Porphyry did not deny the efficacy of magic, but he restricted it to the sphere of nature: magic is not a means of contact with the intelligible realm, as philosophy is (Smith 2011b, 4–5).

His position is clearest in On the Return of the Soul (De regressu animae), known through the long extracts given by Augustine in book X of the City of God. There Porphyry distinguished, like Plotinus, between the lower or “spiritual” (pneumatic) part of the soul, receptive of the images of corporeal things, and the higher, intellective soul, free from material influence. Ritual practice and theurgy can purify only the spiritual part, raising it at most to the ethereal region and granting it visions. The salvation and ascent of the intellective soul are achieved by philosophy alone, which is accessible to only a few (Smith 1974, 122–141). Augustine also repeatedly cites Porphyry’s admission that he had not yet found a “universal way for the liberation of the soul” (universalis via animae liberandae; Smith 1974, 136–141; Busine 2012a).

The work can accordingly be read as a manifesto for the necessity of philosophy: its concessions to theurgy – a mere “quasi-purgation” reserved for those incapable of philosophizing – were possibly slight in the original and have been magnified by Augustine’s polemic (Johnson 2013, 141–143). Later antiquity duly remembered Porphyry, together with Plotinus, among those who gave primacy to philosophy, in contrast to the “hieratics” Iamblichus, Syrianus and Proclus (Damascius, In Phaedonem I 172).

The polemic with Iamblichus is conducted chiefly in the Letter to Anebo, likewise fragmentary and known primarily through Iamblichus’ reply. That work is in fact the “Response of the master Abamon to the letter of Porphyry to Anebo”; the title De mysteriis dates only from the fifteenth century (Saffrey and Segonds 2012, xl–xli; the scattered fragments of the letter are critically reconstructed in the same edition). Though addressed to an Egyptian priest, the letter manifestly targets Iamblichus himself; its date is disputed (Saffrey and Segonds 2012; Busine 2012c). Porphyry sets out the questions and contradictions he has encountered in investigating pagan rite – above all the coherence of praying to, invoking and even compelling beings that are supposed to be impassible. Iamblichus’ response rejects the very premise of this approach: for Iamblichus, it is not thought that unites the theurgist with the gods (Reply to Porphyry II 11), so that ritual possesses an efficacy superior to that of intellectual activity.

The Letter to Marcella takes a similar line (Pradeau 2023, 24–29). Its critique of contemporary cult practice is continuous with that of On Abstinence. Animal sacrifice is senseless in relation to an incorporeal divinity, and it is impious to suppose that the gods’ favour can be won or bought. God is honoured by knowledge alone, so that the philosopher is the true priest (ch. 17) and the only genuine temple is the one that the intellect establishes in the soul (chs. 11 and 19). The insistence that the soul possesses within itself, in intellect, the power of its own divinization is exactly what theurgy denies. The traditional cults may nonetheless still be practised, provided one abstains from animal sacrifice.

A parallel stance shapes On Statues (Peri agalmatōn), preserved almost entirely in Eusebius, which offers allegorical interpretations of the iconography of a long series of Greek and Egyptian deities (the fragments and testimonia are newly collected, with a German translation, in Männlein-Robert 2024). Behind virtually every god stands a power (dynamis; see section 3.3.1 on the doctrine of powers). The proper contemplation of a cult image, understood as a reminder (hypomnēma) rather than as a receptacle of divine presence, can thus serve as a “gate” for the soul’s ascent towards Intellect (Viltanioti 2017). The approach to the cult image is therefore rational and anagogic rather than theurgic, in contrast to that of Iamblichus, who presented statues as filled with divine presence.

There are tensions within this corpus. The oracles collected in the Philosophy from Oracles prescribe animal sacrifice to the lower ranks of the divine hierarchy, whereas On Abstinence II rules it out for the philosopher who aims at the highest god. Whether this amounts to a genuine inconsistency is disputed. On one reading, it does not: Porphyry presents oracles commending blood sacrifice without ever endorsing the practice in his own authorial voice, and the inclusion of an oracle in the collection does not entail acceptance of its surface meaning, since the gods were held to speak in riddles requiring interpretation (Johnson 2013, 131–132). The same interpretation finds a persistent elitism running through the corpus: no one attains definitive salvation apart from theosophia (Johnson 2013, 184). On a rival reading, the salvation of the soul is the organizing theme of Porphyry’s entire output (Simmons 2015). In response to the Christian claim that Christ is the one way of salvation for all, Porphyry would have offered a tiered universalism, with distinct ways corresponding to the level a soul has reached: traditional cult and theurgy for the uneducated, continence for novice philosophers and philosophy proper for the mature Platonist (Simmons 2015, 121–122).

Against the Christians, finally, comprised fifteen books according to the Suda. The standard collection of fragments (Harnack 1916) is methodologically fragile; a new collection of the fragments, testimonia and dubia, with German translation and commentary, is now available in Becker 2016. The date of composition is contested (Smith 2009, 34–35); only a terminus post quem of 270 is secure (Zambon 2012c). The very existence of a separate treatise has also been denied. On Beatrice’s reconstruction, the anti-Christian fragments derive not from a lost Against the Christians but from the Philosophy from Oracles, understood as a single comprehensive work of philosophical initiation that included anti-Christian polemic (Beatrice 2023).

The surviving material reveals a polemic grounded in critical examination of the biblical text. Porphyry rejected the allegorical interpretation of the Old Testament and attacked Origen, its most authoritative Christian exegete, with particular vehemence (fr. 39 Harnack = fr. 6F Becker). He also dated the book of Daniel to the time of Antiochus IV Epiphanes, arguing that it was written after the events it purported to predict. Since every surviving fragment comes from Christian authors – the work was refuted by Methodius, Eusebius and Apollinaris and repeatedly ordered to be destroyed by imperial decree – the surviving image of the treatise is heavily filtered (Zambon 2012c).

3.2 Psychology and Ethics

3.2.1 Soul and Reproduction

As regards the soul, Porphyry seems in all essentials to follow Plotinus. In addition to the Sententiae, On Abstinence and To Gaurus, quite a few fragments of other works bearing on his psychology are preserved, especially in Nemesius, Stobaeus and Augustine.

The soul is an intelligible entity, but the one directly engaged with the sensible realm. Building on Plotinus, Porphyry distinguishes two aspects of the soul (Sent. 4). The soul in itself is apparently identical with the rational soul. A second power of the rational soul, the lower soul, is the soul in relation to the body and is alone directly involved with it. The lower soul is responsible for those functions of the soul that directly involve the body: sense-perception, desires, emotions and vital functions such as growth. Whereas the earlier tradition sometimes sharpened this distinction into a doctrine of two distinct souls in each person, Porphyry insists on the unity of the human soul: the lower functions are powers dependent on the rational soul (Deuse 1983, 169–217). This distinction between the soul itself and its powers is an instance of the doctrine of double activity or power (see section 3.3.1).

Problems arise when one tries to explain how something in itself incorporeal can be present in an extended body. Porphyry resolves this difficulty by saying that the soul is not locally present in the body but is present to it through a certain disposition or inclination towards it (Sent. 3; 4). Strictly speaking, one should not say “it is there” but “it acts there” (Nemesius, On the Nature of Man 3, p. 42, 8–9 Morani = 261F Smith; cf. Sent. 27–28). From Porphyry’s “inquiry” (zētema) preserved by Nemesius, it further emerges that the embodied soul’s relation to the body is a case of “unfused union” (asynchytos henōsis): a union in which the constituents retain their identity and can in principle be separated (Nemesius, 3, p. 38, 12–40, 20 Morani = 259F Smith; Dörrie 1959). Porphyry here draws on Stoic theories of mixture without essentially departing from Plotinus (Emilsson 1994).

In Against Boethus, preserved in fragments by Eusebius, Porphyry argues that the soul as form of the body – that which makes the body alive – must be distinguished from the soul as an intellective entity, which constitutes its essential nature. The latter is immortal, and the Peripatetic Boethus mistakenly conflates the two (Karamanolis 2006, 91–98; Trabattoni 2020). New testimony has been recovered from an anonymous Byzantine treatise attributable to Michael Psellus which, on Rashed’s reconstruction, draws on Proclus’ lost commentary on the Palinode of the Phaedrus. It reports that some “later sages” – perhaps including Porphyry – called the soul’s life-giving nature “animation” (empsychia), assigning the phantasmata to it while reserving non-imagistic intellections for the soul itself (Rashed 2016; cf. section 3.4.4).

For Porphyry, as for Plotinus, what matters most is to free one’s soul from the troubles of the body and the sensible world, so that it may become fully what it essentially is, a part of the intelligible world. Reason should rise to the level of Intellect, perhaps even to that of the One itself. Porphyry seems to suppose that the soul may, after successive reincarnations, free itself from the sensible realm for good (Smith 1974, 56–68). According to at least some of the evidence, he rejects the incarnation of human souls into animal bodies, interpreting the Platonic passages that suggest it as not intended literally, though this evidence has been judged incomplete and one-sided (Deuse 1983, 129–166; Smith 1984).

The one work in which Porphyry addressed the freedom of the embodied soul at length, On What Is Up to Us, survives in four fragments in Stobaeus (frs. 268F–271F Smith; cf. Wilberding 2011). It is an exegesis of the Myth of Er that reconciles Plato’s Fates and Necessity with human responsibility by distinguishing two levels at which Plato uses the word “life” (bios). A generic life – man, woman, dog, swan – is chosen by the soul before embodiment and is thereafter binding (transmigration into animal lives is here taken at face value; contrast the evidence cited above). A particular life within that generic life (soldier, king) is chosen freely by embodied human beings. The result is a twofold compatibilism (Johnson 2015). What appears in embodied life to be beyond our control, such as being born a woman, was itself the soul’s free but now irreversible and forgotten choice. At the same time, the Necessity that ratifies that choice plays no part in the moral quality of the particular life: some things within that life (one’s parents) are due to chance, while others (the philosophical life) are “up to us”, the soul retaining a free will capable of self-determined acts even in the body. Porphyry applies this account to astrology, taking a stricter line than Plotinus, who had allowed the stars a limited causal role through cosmic sympathy (Ennead II.3). Astral configurations indicate (sēmainousin) the lives of those coming to birth but do not compel (anankazein) them, since it is the dispositions of the souls themselves that determine those lives. The Introduction to Ptolemy’s Tetrabiblos and the astrological oracles of the Philosophy from Oracles are arguably consistent with this framework (see Bezza 2012).

To Gaurus on How Embryos are Ensouled, transmitted under Galen’s name but almost certainly Porphyry’s (see section 2; editions: Wilberding 2011; Brisson et al. 2012), offers an account of the development of the embryo and of its relations to the parents, arguably elaborating Plotinus’ views (Wilberding 2008). Porphyry explains, among other things, how children come to resemble both parents. The embryo develops from the father’s seed but has no soul of its own. It is governed by the vegetative soul of the mother, who puts a permanent stamp on it through a process of blending in which the embryo’s nature retains its individuality. This account allows the mother a much greater influence than previous thinkers had allowed her. To Gaurus has been taken as the backbone of a “core theory” of reproduction shared by the major Neoplatonists from Plotinus to Philoponus (Wilberding 2017, 58–99). The offspring’s individual soul enters from outside – on Porphyry’s view, at birth – with the World-Soul acting as a kind of cosmic matchmaker that supplies a suitable descended soul. The embryo is thus a plant-like being, an animal “in potentiality” only in the sense of aptitude (epitēdeiotēs), and becomes an animal only at birth (Brisson 2012b). Porphyry’s embryology thus directly applies the metaphysics of procession and reversion to living beings. Since every product is inferior to its producer, the father’s seed lacks actual motion and must receive it from the nature in the mother (To Gaurus 14.3).

3.2.2 Ethics and Vegetarianism

Porphyry defends vegetarianism in On Abstinence, addressed to Castricius Firmus, a member of Plotinus’ circle and former vegetarian who had resumed eating meat. On the one hand, abstinence is motivated by the goal of freeing oneself from the body and the sensible realm. There are, however, ethical concerns as well. Porphyry attributes a certain degree of rationality to animals and emphasizes what they have in common with human beings. It is plainly unjust, he contends, to harm creatures that intend no harm to us: his vegetarianism is therefore also a matter of justice (Tuominen 2015).

How far this appeal to animal rationality expresses Porphyry’s own view has become the subject of lively debate. The difficulty is that, in the logical works, “irrational” figures as a specific differentia constitutive of non-human animals (see section 3.4.4). One interpretation presses this conflict and proposes reading Book III of On Abstinence as a dialectical attack on the Stoics (G. F. Edwards 2014, 2016, 2018). Porphyry would thus argue that animals are rational on the Stoic conception of reason – in his eyes, a downgrading of reason to the level of imagination – so that, on their own principles, the Stoics must extend justice to them. Porphyry himself would then be committed neither to animal rationality in his own, more demanding sense, which ties reason to the intellection of the Forms, nor to the Stoic thesis that justice extends only to rational beings. A different reading (Sirkel 2021) accepts the dialectical setting and the decoupling of justice from rationality but resists the denial of animal reason. Porphyry introduces as “true and Pythagorean” the thesis that every soul sharing in perception and memory is rational (On Abstinence III 1, 4), treats rationality as a matter of degree and endorses the evidence for it. On this view, animals are rational to an extent, even though what qualifies a creature for just treatment is its harmlessness rather than its reason.

Porphyry’s ethics in On Abstinence has recently received a comprehensive philosophical reassessment (Tuominen 2025). Against the tendency to deny that Porphyry extends genuine, other-regarding moral concern to non-human creatures, Tuominen argues that the treatise distinguishes virtue as an inner condition of the soul from virtue in external action, and that justice in action consists in refraining from harming harmless animate creatures (Tuominen 2025, 27–31, 203–210). On the question of rationality, this reading likewise takes the argument of Book III to be largely ad hominem, but concludes that Porphyry deliberately leaves his own position undisclosed (Tuominen 2025, 139–146, 189–192).

In Sent. 32 Porphyry sets out his views on the virtues, developing Plotinus’ account in Ennead I.2. He distinguishes four hierarchically ordered kinds of virtue: civic, purificatory, contemplative and paradigmatic (the Platonic Forms of the virtues). The paradigmatic in some way comprises all the rest, while a person may be virtuous at the civic level without possessing the higher forms. At all four levels Porphyry posits the four cardinal virtues of Plato’s Republic, differently though analogously defined at each level. Wisdom as a purificatory virtue, for instance, is the soul’s “not forming opinions in accordance with the body, but acting on its own”. As a contemplative virtue, it is the contemplation of the essences in Intellect. The theory is an attempt to reconcile the Republic, the Phaedo and the Theaetetus within a coherent Platonic metaphysics, and was accepted and expanded upon by later Neoplatonists.

Differences between Porphyry and Plotinus can be detected in their views on the emotions and on happiness. Whereas Plotinus holds that the emotions should be eradicated and that happiness consists in the life of Intellect alone (Ennead I.4.3), Porphyry recommends metriopatheia, “moderate emotions”, and allows for degrees of happiness. Not only the intellectually virtuous person but also the civically virtuous person is happy, albeit to a lesser degree (Karamanolis 2006, 303–308). These differences reflect Porphyry’s endeavour to bring Plato and Aristotle into harmony.

How much weight the civic virtues actually carry is, however, disputed. On one reading, their role should not be overstated (Johnson 2013, 292–296). In the Letter to Marcella 25–27 Porphyry distinguishes three laws: the law of God, the law of nature and the law “posited” in nations and cities. The last, he observes, can punish an offender whom it apprehends, but it reaches neither one whom it fails to apprehend nor anyone’s deliberate choice (prohairesis). His advice is to grasp the law of nature, to ascend from it to the divine law and thereafter to give no thought to the written law at all. Read alongside this passage, the account of the civic virtues in Sent. 32 looks distinctly qualified: the civic virtues “adorn the mortal person”, belong to the life of the herd and serve only as a preparation (prodromoi) for the purificatory virtues. Porphyry’s ideal thus implies a withdrawal from civic involvement.

The same chapters, however, have been read differently (Pradeau 2023, 30–36). The three laws present a gradation extremely close to that of Sent. 32, but transposed onto the social plane – projected onto the laws binding a civic community. They are not meant to oppose or supersede one another but to succeed and accord with one another, each being the condition of access to the next. The scheme deliberately accommodates unequal progress within a single community, and it accords a relative but genuine value to the ethics of the other schools, which are assigned their place in the gradation rather than dismissed. Aristotelian metriopatheia corresponds to the civic degree, complete freedom from the passions to the purificatory one. A distinctive feature of the letter emerges at the purificatory degree. Where the Sententiae draw on Stoic material for it, chs. 27–31 assign the corresponding role to Epicurean precepts on nature, self-sufficiency and the removal of disturbance, following the pattern of the favourable treatment of Epicurean ethics in On Abstinence I 49–55. The philosophical weakness of the doctrine means that it can serve only as a starting-point, never as the end-point, of the Platonic return.

3.3 The Metaphysics of the Higher Realms

This section considers first Porphyry’s relation to Plotinus’ doctrine of the hypostases (3.3.1), then the anonymous commentary on the Parmenides and the debate over its attribution to Porphyry (3.3.2), and finally his cosmology: the interpretation of the Timaeus, the generation of the world and the doctrine of matter (3.3.3). In this last area, the newly recovered On Principles and Matter has substantially enlarged the body of evidence.

3.3.1 Porphyry and Plotinus’ Metaphysics

The hierarchy of hypostases – the One, Intellect and Soul – has already been sketched. On the basis of the texts that can be attributed to Porphyry with certainty, in particular the Sententiae, there is no strong reason to suppose that his metaphysics differed significantly from that of Plotinus, though he does not always follow Plotinus’ vocabulary. Porphyry also conceives the branches of philosophy differently from Plotinus, who regards dialectic as the supreme philosophical method (Hadot 1966; Strange 2007). This emerges, for instance, from his arrangement of Plotinus’ treatises, which follows a sequence of ethics, physics, psychology and metaphysics or “epoptics” (the contemplation of higher principles).

One respect in which Porphyry’s vocabulary shifts the emphasis of the inherited doctrine is his treatment of power (dynamis). Whereas Plotinus explains the relation between the levels of reality in terms of a twofold activity, Porphyry speaks of a double power: every level possesses an internal power belonging to its essence, which produces an external power constituting the level below (Smith 1974, 2–19). This preference for dynamis over energeia has been connected with Plotinus’ exclusion of activity from the One (Smith 1996, 70–71). One consequence is that powers supply the connective structure of reality (Viltanioti 2017). Procession is a gradual pluralization and weakening (hyphesis) of power, while reversion is the corresponding unification and convergence through a “superabundance of power” (Sent. 11, 35, 37). The doctrine yields a more continuous and dynamic picture of reality and underwrites the anagogic function assigned to cult images in On Statues (see section 3.1).

Where Porphyry speaks in his own voice, he appears above all as an exegete of Plotinus. The fragments on Plato’s theology from the fourth book of the Philosophical History (220F–223F Smith) present the doctrine of the three hypostases as an interpretation of Plato. They closely track the treatise in which Plotinus had introduced his theory (Ennead V.1; Strange 2007, 25–31). The fragments do contain variations: an apophatic account of the first God, for whom “One” and “Good” are only the least inappropriate designations; the identification of the third hypostasis with the cosmic Soul; and a distinction between the “pre-eternal” procession of Intellect from the One and its eternal existence. These appear to be attempts to explicate and expand Plotinus on difficult points rather than to correct him. Since the fragments also show similarities in language and doctrine to the anonymous commentary on the Parmenides, they lend independent support to the attribution discussed in section 3.3.2 (Strange 2007, 32–33).

3.3.2 The Anonymous Commentary on the Parmenides

As mentioned above, Hadot (1961, 1968) made a case for identifying Porphyry as the author of the anonymous commentary on Plato’s Parmenides, surviving only in fragments on Parmenides 137c–143a (for a detailed survey of its contents and of the attribution debate, see Chase 2012). Hadot’s case rested on extensive correspondences with Porphyry’s vocabulary, on characteristically Porphyrian themes, on passages that presuppose Plotinus’ teaching while rendering it explicit, and on the recurrence of the commentary’s doctrines in Marius Victorinus, Porphyry’s Latin translator. The hypothesis gained wide acceptance, but subsequently suffered several blows. On one side, the arguments have been judged conjectural and the lexical parallels inconclusive, with a later, post-Porphyrian author proposed instead (Smith 1987, 738–741; M. Edwards 1990; Linguiti 1995). On the other, literal parallels between Victorinus and the Gnostic Zostrianos, read and refuted in Plotinus’ school, have suggested an earlier, pre-Plotinian common source (Tardieu 1996), and the commentary itself has been assigned to the circle of Numenius (Bechtle 1999; Corrigan 2000; cf. Rasimus 2011, who shows that supposedly Porphyrian traits occur in Gnostic texts unavailable to Hadot). On this view, the allegedly Porphyrian features of the commentary are in fact pre-Porphyrian. The alternative hypotheses, however, have not proved easier to defend. Lexical analysis indicates that the commentary is post-Plotinian (Linguiti 2002; cf. Steel 2002), which militates against a Middle Platonic dating – a dating that in any case presupposes an otherwise unattested pre-Plotinian tradition of Parmenides commentaries. Numenius’ first god, moreover, remains an intellect, not an activity beyond being and knowledge. The Gnostic parallels can be explained by later Gnostic reworkings drawing on Porphyry (Abramowski 2006; Majercik 2001), and Proclus’ silence loses its force if his knowledge of Porphyry was mediated by Iamblichus (Dillon 1992, 2007). Hadot’s hypothesis therefore remains a strong candidate for explaining the commentary’s philosophical content (Zambon 2002; Chase 2012).

The six fragments run from the first hypothesis to the opening of the second. Those on the first hypothesis (I–X) develop a negative theology largely continuous with Plotinus: the One is called “one” for its infinite power and not, as Speusippus is said to have held, for its smallness; it can be grasped only in a conception that conceives nothing (II 16–17), an anticipation of the theme of learned ignorance (cf. Sent. 25; on the theme’s afterlife in Arabic Neoplatonism, see D’Ancona 1993); likeness, unlikeness and the rest of what we ascribe to it are affections of ours, just as “sunset” describes the earth’s inhabitants and not the sun. The One itself, meanwhile, enjoys a knowledge beyond knowledge and ignorance, prior to the division of subject and object (V 10–11, 34). One element appears not to be Plotinian. The fragment concluding the exegesis of the first hypothesis reports, with respect tempered by circumspection, the doctrine of the Chaldaean Oracles and their exegetes, according to which Power and Intellect are united in the simplicity of the Father, i.e., the One; Plotinus ignores the Oracles entirely.

The best-known passage is the fifth fragment (XI–XII), on the opening of the second hypothesis (Parm. 142b). Taking the dialogue as Plotinus had taken it, the commentator identifies the “one that is” with the second principle; but this One is itself the first Being and so cannot straightforwardly be said, as Plato says it must be, to “participate in ousia”. Two solutions are offered. On the first, metechein is taken “horizontally”, as referring to the relation between One and Being within the second principle. The One in question is no longer the pure One, and “the property of being” is co-altered with it, as “animal” and “rational” alter one another in the definition of man, so that there is no mere juxtaposition of One and Being (XI 5–19). The second One thus has the structure of a species: “one” stands as genus, “being” as specific differentia, functioning as what Porphyry calls an essential quality (In Cat. 95, 19; see Chiaradonna 2015 on this passage as evidence for Porphyry’s authorship). On the second, more celebrated solution, participation is “vertical”: the second One’s participation in ousia consists in its derivation from the First, whose own ousia must be understood in a wholly peculiar way. The One beyond essence and Being is neither being nor essence nor activity, but rather acts and is pure acting itself, so that it is also Being itself prior to Being (XII 22–27). Hadot saw here the first appearance in Western thought of an infinitival being (einai), distinct from participated, substantivized being (to on) – an insight immediately foreclosed, since this subjectless acting is at once hypostatized as an “Idea of Being” (XII 32–33). On a different reading, the commentator is not claiming that an “activity of being” precedes objectified being (Chiaradonna 2023, 170–179). His point is rather that being and activity, which constitute the second One, pre-exist in the First in purely infinitival form: the infinitive marks a difference in metaphysical status from the substantive. The closest parallel is the Stoic contrast, reported by Seneca (Letter 117.11–13), between the corporeal quality “wisdom” and the incorporeal predicate “being wise”. “Being” then remains a maximally general predicate, and neither the esse existentiae nor the actus essendi is prefigured here.

The sixth fragment (XIII–XIV, on Parm. 143a) distinguishes two states of the Intellect. In one, it cannot “enter into itself” and remains in a state of total transcendence. In the other, it deploys itself through the successive stages of Existence (hyparxis), Life and Thought, corresponding to permanence, procession and reversion. Here the distinction between the first and second hypostases becomes blurred: the ineffable One is somehow also the first member (“Father”) of the triad and in this context, identical with being. Positing a first principle that is part of such a composite is un-Plotinian. But Damascius censures Porphyry for precisely this identification of the principle of all with the Father of the intelligible triad, so that an apparent objection to the attribution in fact supports it. The commentary as a whole thus documents an otherwise unattested attempt to reconcile Plotinus’ metaphysics with the Chaldaean Oracles and Middle Platonic doctrines: an attempt for which Porphyry remains the likeliest candidate.

3.3.3 Cosmology: The Timaeus and On Principles and Matter

One area in which Porphyry’s own metaphysical position can now be described in considerably greater detail is cosmology, and in particular the interpretation of the generation of the world in Plato’s Timaeus. The testimonia from his Timaeus commentary preserved in Proclus and Philoponus, read together with the newly recovered On Principles and Matter (see section 2), reveal him as a central figure in the late ancient debate over whether the world had a beginning in time (Michalewski 2024a, 173–186). Plutarch and Atticus took Plato’s statement that the world is generated (Timaeus 28b) literally, as implying a temporal beginning preceded by a disorderly precosmic motion of matter. Against them, Porphyry maintained that the world is generated in the sense that it is composite and perpetually dependent on its incorporeal causes, not in the sense that it began to exist. Accordingly, he read the disorderly motion of Timaeus 30a as representing not a chaotic precosmic state of matter but the nature of bodies considered hypothetically apart from their divine cause. Within the single, non-temporal act of demiurgy, he further distinguished two logically distinct aspects: the informing of matter, by which bodies are constituted, and the ordering of bodies, by which the world comes about. This interpretation was elaborated in discussions within Plotinus’ school, developing a line of exegesis opened by Severus and pursued by Plotinus in his oral teaching (Michalewski 2024a, 187–216). (On the quotations from Severus’ commentary on the Timaeus preserved in the treatise, see Dillon 2024 and Michalewski 2022b.) Porphyry’s account rests on a doctrine of the non-temporal causality of incorporeal principles, which act by their very being. This causality is at once timeless and simultaneous: since divine Intellect has complete mastery of its material and needs no tools, form enters matter, wherever nothing hinders it, atemporally (achronōs) and all at once (athroōs) (Proclus, In Tim. I 395, 10–22). Hence the world does not come to be through a process of generation: God brought it into being at once with his thought (hama noēmati: Philoponus, On the Eternity of the World VI 8, 148, 25–149, 11), and there is no moment at which matter subsisted without form (Michalewski 2024a, 153–158). Porphyry’s equation of the simultaneous with the timeless, later resisted by Simplicius (In Phys. 106, 27–107, 5 = 131F Smith), makes this instantaneous demiurgy fully compatible with the world’s sempiternity (Marongiu 2024, 9–12). In articulating this account, Porphyry integrated Aristotelian analyses of form, actuality and privation into the framework he inherited from Plotinus. He thereby turned Atticus into the emblem of a mistaken, anthropomorphic conception of divine craftsmanship and set the agenda for subsequent Neoplatonic exegesis of the Timaeus.

On one point, he seems quietly to diverge from Plotinus. Whereas Plotinus describes matter as absolute privation and non-being, Porphyry treats it as privation of form and as a genuine substrate of bodies. The closing section of On Principles and Matter (§95) also shows that Longinus, like Atticus, located disorderly motion in precosmic matter. Porphyry’s criticism of this view amounts to a second recantation of his first teacher’s doctrine (Michalewski 2024b), parallel to the palinode reported in the Life of Plotinus 18. A further divergence is attested by Proclus: Porphyry, claiming to follow Plotinus, identified the Demiurge with the hypercosmic Soul and the Demiurge’s paradigm with that Soul’s Intellect (In Tim. I 306, 31–307, 7). This interpretation was censured by Iamblichus and Proclus as un-Plotinian (D’Ancona 1999, 76–86).

The methodological opening of On Principles and Matter (§§17–28) documents Porphyry’s method for attaining the principles of bodies (Chiaradonna 2024b). Porphyry distinguishes two directions of exposition: synthesis, which derives what is posterior from what is prior, and analysis, which reasons back from what is posterior and more familiar to us. Since first principles cannot be derived from anything prior, he begins with analysis. Perceptible bodies are broken down into their elements, and these in turn into their qualities and forms, until the ultimate subject in which forms and qualities are imprinted (namely, matter) is reached. A complementary synthesis then reveals that the ordered arrangement of forms and qualities in bodies cannot be accounted for without an ordering Intellect and the Forms as its thoughts. The background is not the Platonist conception of analysis as an anagogic ascent to the Forms (as in Alcinous), but rather the physical sense found in Alexander of Aphrodisias and in Plotinus’ On Matter (Ennead II.4.6): the dissolution of hylomorphic compounds into their ultimate constituents.

The treatise can be read as Porphyry’s intervention in the long-standing Platonist debate – from Eudorus to Atticus – over whether matter qualifies as a principle and what its causal role is (Karamanolis 2024). Porphyry integrates Aristotle’s conception of matter into Platonic cosmology. Matter is not perceptible and is conceived through privation (cf. Sent. 42). It is pure potentiality that never exists in actuality by itself, a principle only in a logical sense. What the Demiurge creates are bodies, not matter, and he creates them timelessly, “by his very being”. An apparent tension remains. The first part of the treatise argues for two coordinate principles – God qua Intellect, containing the Forms as its thoughts, and matter – and is silent about the One. Yet the Porphyry of the fragments preserved in Proclus criticizes Atticus precisely for positing two co-equal principles. One suggestion is that the treatise presents an account deliberately restricted to the principles of the natural, enmattered world, which Porphyry elsewhere subordinates to his overarching monism (Greig 2024). How this “Middle Platonist”-sounding text is to be integrated into his Neoplatonic metaphysics remains an open question.

3.4 Aristotle, Logic and Epistemology

Porphyry occupies a pivotal place in the ancient reception of Aristotle. He was, so far as the extant evidence shows, the first Platonist to write full-scale commentaries on Aristotle’s works, and indeed to comment on Aristotle at all (Karamanolis 2004, 2006). After him, the view that Plato and Aristotle are fundamentally in agreement became common property among the Neoplatonists, whose curriculum incorporated the study of Aristotle – beginning with the Categories – as a preparation for that of Plato. He thereby also became a figure of major importance in the history of logic. He established the tradition of treating the Categories as a basic introductory text, and his Isagoge served as a standard introduction in Byzantium, in the Arabic world and, through Boethius’ translations, in the Latin West. The Categories and the Isagoge together remained basic introductory texts in philosophy for centuries (see section 3.4.4). The following subsections consider his work as a commentator (3.4.1), his interpretation of the Categories (3.4.2), his treatises on the relation between Plato and Aristotle (3.4.3), and the Isagoge and the acquisition of concepts (3.4.4).

3.4.1 The First Platonist Commentator on Aristotle

So far as the extant evidence shows, Platonist philosophers before Plotinus did not possess extensive first-hand knowledge of Aristotle’s school treatises. The Categories was an exception. It had been discussed by Platonists, Peripatetics and Stoics since the first century B.C.E., with Platonist attitudes ranging from tacit appropriation (Alcinous) to the polemical aporiai of Atticus, Lucius and Nicostratus. Works such as the Physics and the Metaphysics, by contrast, had only a limited presence in Middle Platonist debates (Chiaradonna 2024a; for a different account, see Karamanolis 2006, 28–36).

Plotinus marks a turning point. Aristotle’s views, arguments and vocabulary are pervasive in the Enneads and form an essential part of Plotinus’ philosophical project, while Peripatetic commentaries such as those of Aspasius, Alexander and Adrastus were read in his school (Life of Plotinus 14). Yet Plotinus is critical of some of Aristotle’s key theories, and he incorporated earlier Platonist objections, including some of Nicostratus’, into On the Genera of Being (Enneads VI.1–3).

Against this background, Porphyry’s engagement with Aristotle appears as a new beginning. Significantly, Simplicius refers to Porphyry as “the cause of all that is good for us” (In Cat. 2, 5–6). Writing a running commentary on an entire work entails both acceptance of the authority of the text and a connection with teaching (Karamanolis 2004, 2018). Porphyry could satisfy both conditions. He held not only that some Aristotelian doctrines, suitably construed, are compatible with Plato’s, but also that Aristotle systematically investigated areas that Plato had not explored. Aristotle’s works therefore contain theories that must be credited to Aristotle himself and cannot be appreciated without close reading on their own terms.

Porphyry’s exegetical activity ranged over much of the Aristotelian corpus (the evidence is surveyed in Chase 2012). He wrote two commentaries on the Categories: the extant short commentary in question-and-answer form and the much larger commentary in seven books dedicated to Gedalius (Ad Gedalium), now lost. Gedalius is otherwise unknown, but his Jewish name tells against regarding him as a fictional addressee and may be connected with Porphyry’s unusual interest in Jewish learning (Menn 2017). Commentaries on the De interpretatione and on Physics I–IV are certain; a monograph on categorical syllogisms formed the basis of Boethius’ work on the subject; and critical engagement with the Prior Analytics, the Sophistical Refutations, the Nicomachean Ethics and Metaphysics 12 is attested. There is, by contrast, no trace of a commentary on the De anima – perhaps a sign of Porphyry’s caution towards Aristotle’s psychology (see section 3.4.3).

The orientation of these works is telling. Porphyry’s named authorities are Peripatetics (Andronicus, Boethus of Sidon, Herminus), and parallels show that he silently drew on – and perhaps incorporated parts of – Alexander of Aphrodisias’ works. In the Isagoge, likewise, he announces that he will set down what “the old masters, and especially the Peripatetics among them” have said (Isagoge 1, 14–16). The Peripatetic material, moreover, is expressed in the philosophical lingua franca of the age, so that alleged Stoic elements merely reflect terminology that had long since become common property (Barnes 2003, xviii–xix; for qualifications, see Chiaradonna 2008). No Platonist figures among his authorities, and his few references to Platonist interpreters are invariably critical: the short commentary rejects Atticus’ view on homonyms, while the Ad Gedalium rebutted the objections of Lucius and Nicostratus.

Knowledge of the Ad Gedalium, for centuries dependent on the testimonia of Dexippus and Simplicius, has recently been substantially enriched. Fourteen pages of the Archimedes Palimpsest preserve part of an anonymous late ancient commentary on the Categories which, on the basis of converging indications, can plausibly be identified with the Ad Gedalium (Chiaradonna et al. 2013; on the palimpsest, see Netz et al. 2011). Besides preserving verbatim quotations from Boethus, the new text shows that the puzzle “Socrates is a man; man is a species; therefore Socrates is a species” was given its classic form by Nicostratus. It solves the puzzle by means of Alexander’s doctrine that the universal is an accident of the definable nature: “man is a species” predicates of man not its essence but the accidental feature of being common to a plurality (see section 3.4.2).

3.4.2 The Interpretation of the Categories

Porphyry attached exceptional importance to the Categories, which he regarded as introductory not just to logic but to the whole of philosophy (In Cat. 56, 28–29). His exegesis starts from the traditional problem of determining the purpose (prothesis) of the treatise. His solution draws on the earlier Peripatetic tradition, above all on Boethus of Sidon: the categories are simple significant expressions considered insofar as they signify things differing in genus. The Categories is thus a work about the expressions used to signify the sensible things around us, not a treatise of primary ontology (In Cat. 57, 19–58, 20; Strange 1987, 1992; on an older Peripatetic origin for this semantic reading, traced back to Andronicus of Rhodes, see Griffin 2012). More precisely, it is about the most general names of “first imposition”: names of things, as opposed to names of names, such as “noun” and “verb”. Porphyry distinguishes this reading from two rivals: the view that the treatise is about words qua words and the view that it is about beings qua beings. Since the latter, ontological reading was Plotinus’ own, Porphyry’s discussion of the subject matter of the treatise is an implicit reply to his master. The extant commentary operates with a twofold relation between significant words and things, whereas other sources ascribe to Porphyry a threefold relation between words, concepts and things. This triadic account may derive from the Ad Gedalium (Griffin 2012; see section 3.4.4).

This semantic approach grounds Porphyry’s solution to the most obvious difficulty the treatise posed for a Platonist: its claim that sensible particulars are primary substances – the very point on which Nicostratus and Plotinus had criticized Aristotle for neglecting intelligible beings. Porphyry argues that words are “messengers of things” (In Cat. 58, 23–29) and that human language refers primarily to the perceptible beings first encountered in experience, so that the division of the categories reflects the basic distinctions among sensible things. This explains why Aristotle calls sensible particulars primary substances even though he elsewhere takes intelligible substances to be primary: sensible particulars are primary in relation to us, not in themselves (In Cat. 91, 19–27). The intelligible substances Porphyry lists in stating the objection are Aristotle’s own: the intelligible god, intellect and the Forms, “if indeed there are Forms” (In Cat. 91, 14–17). Aristotle is thus defended out of his own resources rather than by appeal to Platonist principles. This use of the distinction between what is prior by nature and what is prior in relation to us appears to be a Porphyrian innovation. Alexander held that particulars are prior by nature, while Plotinus mentions the suggestion that the particular is prior because it is “more familiar in relation to us” only to dismiss it (Ennead VI.3.9, 38–42). The argument allows Porphyry to shield Aristotle’s account of substance from Plotinus’ criticism and to render it compatible with the Platonic hierarchy of being, and it was widely adopted in the later Neoplatonist commentary tradition (Strange 1987).

The semantic reading does not, however, make the Categories ontologically innocent. Porphyry’s professed avoidance of deep ontological questions in the Isagoge (1, 9–16), together with the absence of distinctively Platonic doctrines from the introductory logical works, has suggested that his logic is an ontologically neutral discipline that could be adopted by different philosophical schools (Ebbesen 1990; Barnes 2003, xix). Yet ontology is far from absent from these works. What they contain is a simplified and partial ontology, limited to perceptible beings (Chiaradonna 2008). This ontology is, moreover, of a definite stamp: the Peripatetic ontology in the essentialist version developed by Alexander, combined with a semantic framework going back to Boethus. Boethus’ fragments are largely transmitted precisely through the Ad Gedalium, as excerpted by Simplicius (Chiaradonna and Rashed 2020). Porphyry’s appropriation of Boethus is, however, selective: he takes over his semantics while rejecting the nominalist and particularist ontology on which it rested. Against Boethus, who had assimilated the enmattered form to a non-substantial qualification of the material substrate, Porphyry maintains that form is “productive of substance” and therefore “substance-like” (ousiōdes). The composite is accordingly a substance in virtue of its form (Simplicius, In Cat. 78, 21–24). This account of enmattered form converges with the doctrine of matter as a genuine substrate of bodies (see section 3.3.3). Porphyry also takes over Alexander’s doctrine that universals are accidents of definable natures (In Cat. 81, 3–22; see sections 3.4.1 and 3.4.4).

An obscure doctrine of the Ad Gedalium concerns predication itself. In two fragments preserved by Simplicius, Porphyry distinguishes two statuses of a universal such as animal: the “coordinated” (katatetagmenon), embedded in the particular, and the “uncoordinated” (akatatakton). In essential predication, the uncoordinated is predicated of the coordinated: to call a particular man “man” is no different from calling Socrates “Socrates” (Simplicius, In Cat. 53, 4–9 and 79, 12–30 = 56F and 59F Smith; the pair of terms also occurs in the palimpsest commentary, In Cat. 5, 16–25). On one hypothesis, the uncoordinated universal is the transcendent Form, so that essential predication expresses the participation of sensible items in their ante rem causes (Hadot 1966). The distinction also answers a semantic need: the universal coordinated with a particular is particularized, and only the uncoordinated universal can be predicated in common of many individuals. The question is then whether the uncoordinated universal is the transcendent genus or a concept. Much, indeed, favours the latter interpretation (Lloyd 1990, 64–68, who renders the pair as “allocated” and “unallocated”; see section 3.4.4): the short commentary treats the common predicate as a post rem notion drawn from particulars (see section 3.4.4), and an ante rem Form cannot be synonymously predicated of its instances without collapsing the hierarchy between them. Yet Iamblichus’ criticisms suggest that Porphyry did not sharply separate the predicative from the hierarchical ordering of genera, so that a metaphysical reading of the uncoordinated cannot be ruled out (Chiaradonna 2023, 155–159).

How Porphyry’s position relates to Plotinus’ critical discussion of the categories in Enneads VI.1 and VI.3 is debated. On one view, there is a genuine breach: Porphyry accepted Aristotelian essentialism about sensible objects, along with Aristotle’s categorization of them, whereas Plotinus did not, though it was Porphyry’s line that won the day in late antiquity (Chiaradonna 2002, 48–54). On another view, there is substantial continuity between the two (de Haas 2001). On this reading, Plotinus’ critical discussion already prepares the positive account developed by Porphyry. The debate has been further complicated by the observation that Plotinus’ On the Genera of Being may itself bear traces of discussions between master and student. Close parallels connect Enneads VI.1 and VI.3 with characteristic Porphyrian arguments otherwise unattested before Porphyry: that form is “productive of substance”, that particulars are primary “in relation to us” and that genus has a genealogical sense (see section 3.4.3). Plotinus reports these arguments only to resist them (Chiaradonna 2024a). Conversely, Porphyry’s later works preserved elements of Plotinus’ classroom teaching (Henry 1987; Arzhanov 2021; Michalewski 2024a, 205–216).

3.4.3 The Harmony of Plato and Aristotle

Porphyry’s engagement with Aristotle was not confined to commentary. He composed two works comparing Aristotle’s philosophy with Plato’s. One argued for their unity: On Plato and Aristotle Belonging to One and the Same School, in seven books according to the Suda (= 239T Smith). The other treated their disagreement: On the Difference between Plato and Aristotle, attested by Elias (On Porphyry’s Isagoge 39, 6–8 = 238T Smith). The presence of the two titles suggests that he did not take Aristotle’s philosophy to be simply identical with Plato’s: harmony obtains in the essential doctrines and is compatible with acknowledged differences (Karamanolis 2018). The scattered evidence offers a glimpse of how Porphyry demarcated the two philosophies. Against Boethus on the Soul (see section 3.2.1) suggests that he rebutted the Peripatetic criticism of the Phaedo’s arguments for immortality and rejected, or at least qualified, Aristotle’s view that the soul is the entelechy of the body. His target, however, may have been a materialistic interpretation of Aristotle rather than Aristotle himself. A fragment from the Physics commentary shows him accepting Aristotle’s theory of the four causes while regarding it as incomplete: Plato had already given a fuller account by also considering the paradigmatic and instrumental causes (= 120F Smith; Adamson 2007, 152–153). In the same commentary, Porphyry assigns the investigation of the principles of physical beings not to the natural philosopher, who merely uses them, but to the metaphysician (= 119F Smith). Accordingly, the extant fragments mostly explain Aristotle’s physics on its own terms, while the deeper account of the principles of nature is reserved for works such as the Timaeus commentary. The Physics commentary also circulated in Arabic, and a fragment preserved in that tradition shows Porphyry reading Aristotle’s analogy between nature and art in terms of the Platonic relation between paradigm and image (463F Smith; Adamson 2007, 152–154).

Porphyry’s treatment of genus and being displays the same pattern of endorsement and reframing. In the Isagoge he makes the ten categories the first genera and treats being as homonymous rather than as a single genus (Isagoge 6, 6–11). While this doctrine is undeniably Peripatetic, his account of genus has un-Peripatetic aspects. Porphyry regards genera as kinds of lineage or unities of derivation: the first genus plays the role of a principle or origin for the species under it, just as the Heraclids are the “genus” of those descended from Hercules (Isagoge 2, 7–13; 6, 2–4). By giving full weight to this genealogical meaning of genus, he paves the way for the later Neoplatonist solution, adopted by Dexippus and Simplicius in reply to Plotinus’ objections: perceptible and intelligible substances fall under a single genus in virtue of the derivation of the former from the latter. In the Isagoge he explicitly refers to Plato in this context (6, 14), and his lost commentary on the Sophist may have combined Plato’s method of division with Aristotle’s theory of genus, species and differentia. That he put the theory of genus to theological use is shown by Iamblichus’ objection to his account of the divine hierarchy as a kind of genus whose levels are determined by specific differentiae (Reply to Porphyry [De mysteriis] I 4).

A much-discussed body of evidence connects Porphyry’s project with Ammonius Saccas, Plotinus’ teacher in Alexandria. Hierocles of Alexandria (fifth century) reports, in his lost On Providence preserved by Photius, that Ammonius put an end to the conflict between the schools by showing that Plato and Aristotle agree “in the essential and most necessary doctrines” (Photius, Library, cod. 214, 172a2–9). In the Life of Plotinus (14), moreover, Porphyry himself says that Plotinus brought “the nous of Ammonius” to bear on his investigations. Since Ammonius probably left no writings and Hierocles wrote two centuries later, an intermediate source must be assumed. According to a hypothesis going back to Dörrie (1955), Hierocles’ account derives from Porphyry, who would then have presented Ammonius as prefiguring his own harmonizing Platonism, with Plotinus as the link between them (Chiaradonna 2016).

3.4.4 The Isagoge, Universals and the Acquisition of Concepts

The Isagoge, addressed to the Roman senator Chrysaorius, consists of a preface, five chapters treating genus, species, differentia, proprium and accident (the “five items”), and a series of chapters examining their mutual combinations. (The fullest modern treatments are the annotated editions of de Libera and Segonds 1998 and Barnes 2003.) The title transmitted by the Greek manuscripts, by Boethius and by the ancient commentators is simply Eisagōgē, “Introduction”. Ammonius and Boethius took the work to be an introduction to Aristotle’s Categories, and this reading is defended in the modern edition of de Libera and Segonds 1998. Porphyry himself, however, connects the five items also with definition, division and demonstration. On the rival reading, the Isagoge is conceived as preparatory to the study of predication, definition, division and demonstration (Barnes 2003, xiv–xvi). It is an introduction to logic – and thereby to philosophy – and only incidentally an introduction to the Categories.

Genus and species are predicated of a plurality in answer to “what is it?”: genus of things differing in species; species, in the strict sense, of things differing in number. A differentia answers “what sort of so-and-so is it?”: it divides a genus and, when combined with it, constitutes the species beneath it. A proprium in the strict sense belongs to one species alone, to all of it and always, as the capacity to laugh belongs to man; an accident may be present or absent without destroying its subject. The list itself reworks the four “predicables” of Aristotle’s Topics (I 4, 101b17–25): definition, genus, proprium and accident, the differentiae being ranged under the genus. Porphyry drops definition and gives species and differentia a standing of their own. The Isagoge is the first extant text to display this list of five, which Porphyry presents not as an innovation of his own but as the teaching of the old masters, and which virtually every later logician would rehearse (Barnes 2003, 30–31). The traditional label “five words” (pente phōnai, quinque voces) is, however, not Porphyry’s: he nowhere says what manner of items the five are (words, concepts or things: Barnes 2003, xii and 68–70).

The interplay of genus and species is displayed in a worked example within the category of substance (Isagoge 4, 21–32). The resulting descending series, represented by the later tradition as the Porphyrian tree (name and diagram alike are post-Porphyrian: Barnes 2003, 108–112), runs from substance, a most general genus, through body, animate body, animal and rational animal down to man, the most specific species, below which stand only individuals such as Socrates and Plato. Substance is only a genus, man only a species; each intermediate item is at once a species of what precedes it and a genus of what follows it (a “subaltern” genus) and each step of the descent is secured by a pair of divisive differentiae (animate and inanimate, rational and irrational; cf. Isagoge 9, 24–10, 21). Since being is not a genus (see section 3.4.3), no single tree covers everything: the ten categories stand as so many most general genera and first origins, and while the descent from each of them passes through finitely many species, the individuals below the lowest species are infinite. Porphyry accordingly repeats Plato’s advice to halt division at the most specific species and to leave the infinite individuals alone, since of them there is no knowledge (Isagoge 6, 11–23). The individual itself is characterized as constituted of proper features whose assemblage will never be found the same in anything else (Isagoge 7, 19–27), a formula whose Stoic background is debated (Barnes 2003, 150–153).

In the preface, Porphyry famously declines to address three questions as too deep for an introduction: whether genera and species subsist or lie in mere concepts; whether, if they subsist, they are corporeal or incorporeal; and whether they are separate from sensible items or exist in them (Isagoge 1, 9–16). These disclaimers no doubt contributed to the ease with which his introductory works were adopted as obligatory school readings, and they fixed the terms in which the medieval problem of universals would be debated (de Libera 1996, 35–49; Erismann 2012).

In the Categories commentary Porphyry sets out a positive doctrine of universals as post rem items, conceived from the objects encountered in sense-perception (In Cat. 90, 12–91, 27). Within this framework, ontological priority belongs to individuals, and the criterion of priority at work is that what removes something along with itself, without being removed along with it, is prior. This is a modal and existential test of what can exist without what, and one that Porphyry takes to be Aristotle’s own (In Cat. 90, 12–13; 118, 26–119, 3; Sirkel 2026). Individuals satisfy it collectively rather than one by one, since there are no uninstantiated kinds: removing all the particulars removes the species, whereas removing a single particular does not. Particulars are accordingly “causes of being” for the predicates said in common, which are conceived from them. The common predicates are thus concepts drawn from particulars. The background seems to be Alexander’s essentialist abstractionism, according to which universals are drawn from definable natures immanent in particulars: Porphyry gives an elementary and schematic version of this position rather than the particularist account of Boethus, for whom universals are mere concepts with no real counterpart distinct from individuals (Chiaradonna 2023, 91–137). Porphyry’s position has, however, been described as a conceptualism shared by most Neoplatonists (Lloyd 1990, 68–70, who nonetheless warns against calling it nominalism in the strict sense, since Porphyry never identifies universals with mere expressions).

Porphyry is indeed committed to a version of abstractionism with regard to the knowledge of sensibles. His Commentary on Ptolemy’s Harmonics contains an epistemological excursus (11, 5–22, 7) on the respective roles of sense-perception and reason (logos) in the acquisition of knowledge. It describes a process that begins with sense-perception and passes through apprehension and supposition to the formation and storage in the soul, by the image-making capacity (phantasia), of a concept (ennoia) identical with the enmattered form of the object. From this concept derive knowledge (epistēmē) and, finally, understanding (nous). The resulting ennoia is best understood as a mental image that nevertheless functions as a universal, since it captures only the characteristic features of the species (Lautner 2015). The account’s unmistakable reference to Plato’s Seventh Letter, moreover, counts against attributing to Porphyry a purely Aristotelian theory of the acquisition of knowledge (Chase 2010).

Whereas for Alexander abstraction was an alternative to Platonic innatism, for Porphyry it is rather a preliminary step. The knowledge attained through abstraction ultimately triggers the intellection of true being, that is, of the separate Forms (In Harm. 14, 4–6). Reason, moreover, judges and corrects sense-perception in virtue of its prior possession of the forms, “having grasped everything in advance” (In Harm. 15, 16–16, 4). Porphyry thus adopts an Aristotelian account of abstraction framed at both ends by Platonic recollection: at the beginning, since knowledge starts from common notions that may reflect innate traces of intelligible being, and at the end, since abstraction ultimately triggers the understanding of the Forms (Chiaradonna 2026, 81–85). Against such readings, however, it has been argued that the innatist element dominates throughout: the introductory works argue within an Aristotelian framework, so that their seemingly abstractionist passages need not represent Porphyry’s own, consistently innatist, position; an “Aristotelization” of Porphyry is therefore best avoided (Helmig 2012, 154–178). On this approach, Porphyry’s own doctrine of concept formation rests on recollection, in line with the later Platonist tradition. The question is controversial, but the Ad Gedalium, certainly not a work for beginners, likewise associates universal predicates with notions (epinoiai) grasped from particulars. What the introductory works leave undeveloped is spelled out in the Harmonics excursus, which rests on the same ontology as the Sententiae (Sent. 19 and 42). It is at least possible that Porphyry held a unitary doctrine, presented at different levels of complexity, that incorporates abstractionism and in which knowledge culminates in the noetic intuition of transcendent substance.

Bibliography

Porphyry’s works are available electronically in the original Greek in the Thesaurus Linguae Graecae collection. The following is a list of editions and translations of individual and fragmentary works, followed by a selection of secondary literature.

Editions and Translations

• Life of Plotinus
  • [Brisson et al. 1982–1992] Porphyre, La Vie de Plotin, 2 volumes, Paris: Librairie philosophique J. Vrin (Histoire des doctrines de l’antiquité classique, 6 and 16), 1982–1992. – Volume I: Travaux préliminaires et index grec complet, by Luc Brisson, Marie-Odile Goulet-Cazé, Richard Goulet, and Denis O’Brien, with a preface by Jean Pépin, 1982. – Volume II: Études d’introduction, texte grec et traduction française, commentaire, notes complémentaires, bibliographie, by Luc Brisson, Jean-Louis Cherlonneix, Marie-Odile Goulet-Cazé, Richard Goulet, Mirko D. Grmek, Jean-Marie Flamand, Sylvain Matton, Denis O’Brien, Jean Pépin, Henri Dominique Saffrey, Alain-Philippe Segonds, Michel Tardieu, and Pierre Thillet, 1992.
  • [M. Edwards 2000] Neoplatonic Saints: The Lives of Plotinus and Proclus by their Students (Translated Texts for Historians, 35), translated with an introduction and notes by Mark Edwards, Liverpool: Liverpool University Press, 2000. (Contains an annotated English translation of the Life of Plotinus, together with Marinus’ Life of Proclus.)
• Letter to Marcella (with the Life of Pythagoras in the first item)
  • Porphyre: Vie de Pythagore, Lettre à Marcella, edited by Édouard des Places, with an appendix by Alain-Philippe Segonds, Paris: Les Belles Lettres, 1982. (Contains the Greek text and a French translation.)
  • Porphyry, the Philosopher, to Marcella, text and translation with introduction and notes by Kathleen O’Brien Wicker, Atlanta, GA: Scholars Press, 1987.
  • Porphyry’s Letter to His Wife Marcella Concerning the Life of Philosophy and the Ascent to the Gods, translated by Alice Zimmern, with an introduction by David R. Fideler, Grand Rapids, MI: Phanes Press, 1986.
  • [Pradeau 2023] Porphyre – Lettre à Marcella: Édition critique, traduction française, introduction et notes (Philosophia Antiqua, 169), edited and translated by Jean-François Pradeau, Leiden/Boston: Brill, 2023.
• On Abstinence
  • On Abstinence from Killing Animals, translated by Gillian Clark, London: Duckworth, 2000.
  • Porphyre: De l’abstinence, 3 volumes, texte établi et traduit par Jean Bouffartigue et Michel Patillon (Volumes I–II: Books I and II–III, 1977–1979) and by Michel Patillon and Alain-Philippe Segonds, with the collaboration of Luc Brisson (Volume III: Book IV, 1995), Collection des Universités de France, Paris: Les Belles Lettres, 1977–1995. (Contains the Greek text and a French translation.)
• [Sent.] Sententiae
  • Porphyrii sententiae ad intelligibilia ducentes (Bibliotheca scriptorum Graecorum et Romanorum Teubneriana), edited by Erich Lamberz, Leipzig: B. G. Teubner, 1975. (The critical edition; its chapter numbering is followed above.)
  • Porphyre: Sentences, Greek text, French translation, interpretative essays and extensive commentary by Luc Brisson et al., 2 volumes, Paris: Vrin, 2005; includes an English translation, John Dillon (trans.), in Volume II, pp. 795–835.
  • Launching-Points to the Realm of Mind: An Introduction to the Neoplatonic Philosophy of Plotinus, translated by Kenneth Sylvan Guthrie, Grand Rapids, MI: Phanes Press, 1988. (This is the work that has been called the Sententiae above.)
• Isagoge (Introduction)
  • [de Libera and Segonds 1998] Porphyre: Isagoge – Texte grec, translatio Boethii, traduction par Alain de Libera et Alain-Philippe Segonds, introduction et notes par Alain de Libera (Sic et Non), Paris: Vrin, 1998. (Contains the Greek text, Boethius’ Latin translation, a French translation, and an extensive introduction and notes.)
  • [Barnes 2003] Porphyry: Introduction, translated with a commentary by Jonathan Barnes (Clarendon Later Ancient Philosophers), Oxford: Clarendon Press, 2003; paperback edition 2006. (Introduction, English translation and extensive philosophical commentary.)
• On the Cave of the Nymphs
  • Porphyry on the Cave of the Nymphs, translated by Robert Lamberton, Barrytown, NY: Station Hill Press, 1983. (Also includes the Greek text.)
  • Porphyre, L’Antre des nymphes dans l’Odyssée, Introduction, édition du texte grec, traduction et notes sous la direction de Tiziano Dorandi, Paris: Vrin, 2019.
• Commentary on Ptolemy’s Harmonics
  • Porphyry’s Commentary on Ptolemy’s Harmonics: A Greek Text and Annotated Translation, translated and edited by Andrew Barker, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2015.
  • Porphyrius: Commentarius in Claudii Ptolemaei Harmonica, edited by Massimo Raffa, Berlin/Boston: De Gruyter, 2016.
• Commentary on Aristotle’s Categories
  • Porphyry: “On Aristotle’s ‘Categories’”, translated by Steven K. Strange, London: Duckworth, 1992.
  • Porphyre: Commentaire aux Catégories d’Aristote, French translation by Richard Bodéüs, Paris: Vrin, 2008. (Contains the Greek text, a French translation and a commentary.)
• Commentary on Plato’s Timaeus
  • Porphyrii in Platonis Timaeum commentariorum fragmenta, collected and edited by Angelo Raffaele Sodano, Naples: privately printed, 1964.
• To Gaurus
  • [Wilberding 2011] Porphyry: To Gaurus on How Embryos are Ensouled and On What is in Our Power, translated by James Wilberding, London: Bristol Classical Press, 2011.
  • [Brisson et al. 2012] Porphyre. Sur la manière dont l’embryon reçoit l’âme (Histoire des doctrines de l’antiquité classique, 43), Luc Brisson, Gwenaëlle Aubry, Marie-Hélène Congourdeau, Françoise Hudry, et al., Greek text edited by Tiziano Dorandi, French translation by Luc Brisson, English translation by Michael Chase, Paris: Librairie Philosophique J. Vrin, 2012.
• Symmikta zetemata
  • [Dörrie 1959] Porphyrios’ «Symmikta Zetemata». Ihre Stellung in System und Geschichte des Neuplatonismus nebst einem Kommentar zu den Fragmenten (Zetemata, 20), Heinrich Dörrie, Munich: C. H. Beck, 1959.
• On Statues
  • [Männlein-Robert 2024] Mystik und Allegorese: Der Platoniker Porphyrios über Götterstatuen (Περὶ ἀγαλμάτων). Eine Studie zur spätantiken Religionsphilosophie (Roma Aeterna, 16), Irmgard Männlein-Robert, Stuttgart: Franz Steiner Verlag, 2024. (Contains the first complete collection of the fragments and testimonia, with Greek text and German translation.)
• Against the Christians
  • [Harnack 1916] Porphyrius, “Gegen die Christen”, 15 Bücher: Zeugnisse, Fragmente und Referate (Abhandlungen der Königlich Preußischen Akademie der Wissenschaften, Philosophisch-historische Klasse, 1916, 1), edited by Adolf von Harnack, Berlin: Reimer, 1916.
  • Porphyry Against the Christians (Studies in Platonism, Neoplatonism, and the Platonic Tradition, 1), translated with notes by Robert M. Berchman, Leiden: Brill, 2005.
  • [Becker 2016] Porphyrios, “Contra Christianos”: Neue Sammlung der Fragmente, Testimonien und Dubia mit Einleitung, Übersetzung und Anmerkungen (Texte und Kommentare, 52), edited by Matthias Becker, Berlin/Boston: De Gruyter, 2016.
• Letter to Anebo
  • [Saffrey and Segonds 2012] Porphyre: Lettre à Anébon l’Égyptien, texte établi et traduit par Henri-Dominique Saffrey et Alain-Philippe Segonds, Collection des Universités de France (Série grecque 492), Paris: Les Belles Lettres, 2012.
• On Principles and Matter
  • [Arzhanov 2021] Porphyry, ‘On Principles and Matter’: A Syriac Version of a Lost Greek Text with an English Translation, Introduction, and Glossaries (Scientia Graeco-Arabica, 34), edited and translated by Yury Arzhanov, Berlin/Boston: De Gruyter, 2021.
• Other Fragments
  • [Smith 1993] Porphyrii Philosophi Fragmenta: Fragmenta Arabica David Wasserstein interpretante, edited by Andrew Smith, Stuttgart/Leipzig: B. G. Teubner, 1993.
  • Porfirio, Sullo Stige (Testi a fronte, 99), edited with introduction, Italian translation and commentary by Cristiano Castelletti, with a presentation by Tiziano Dorandi, Milan: Bompiani, 2006.
  • The Homeric Questions, edited and translated by Robin R. Schlunk, Frankfurt am Main/New York: Peter Lang (Lang Classical Studies, 2), 1993. (Contains Greek text and an English translation.)
• Commentary on Plato’s Parmenides (disputed authorship)
  • “Ein neuplatonischer Parmenidescommentar in einem Turiner Palimpsest”, edited by Wilhelm Kroll, Rheinisches Museum für Philologie, 47, 1892, pp. 599–627. (The editio princeps, published before the manuscript was lost.)
  • [Linguiti 1995] “In Parmenidem, Cod. Taur. F VI 1”, edited by Alessandro Linguiti, in Corpus dei papiri filosofici greci e latini (CPF), Parte III, Commentari, Florence: Olschki Editore, 1995, pp. 63–202.
  • [Hadot 1968] Porphyre et Victorinus, 2 volumes, Pierre Hadot, Paris: Études Augustiniennes, 1968.
• Commentary on Aristotle’s Categories (palimpsest text)
  • [Chiaradonna et al. 2013] “A Rediscovered Categories Commentary”, Riccardo Chiaradonna, Marwan Rashed, David Sedley, and Natalie Tchernetska, in Brad Inwood (ed.), Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy, Volume 44, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2013, pp. 129–194.

Other Primary Literature

• Plotinus, Plotinus. The Enneads, edited by Lloyd P. Gerson, and translated by George Boys-Stones, John M. Dillon, Lloyd P. Gerson, R.A. King, Andrew Smith, and James Wilberding, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2018.
• Iamblichus, Jamblique: Réponse à Porphyre (De Mysteriis), text established, translated and annotated by Henri Dominique Saffrey and Alain-Philippe Segonds, with the collaboration of Adrien Lecerf, Collection des Universités de France, Paris: Les Belles Lettres, 2013.

General Works and Collections

• Bidez, Joseph, 1913, Vie de Porphyre, le philosophe néo-platonicien, avec les fragments des traités Περὶ ἀγαλμάτων et De regressu animae, Ghent: E. van Goethem / Leipzig: B. G. Teubner.
• Dörrie, Heinrich, Jan-Hendrik Waszink, Willy Theiler, Pierre Hadot, Angelo Raffaele Sodano, Jean Pépin, and Richard Walzer, 1966, Porphyre (Entretiens sur l’Antiquité classique, XII), Vandœuvres-Genève: Fondation Hardt.
• Edwards, Mark J., 2018, “Porphyrios”, in Christoph Riedweg, Christoph Horn, and Dietmar Wyrwa (eds.), Philosophie der Kaiserzeit und der Spätantike (= Grundriss der Geschichte der Philosophie) (Die Philosophie der Antike, 5/2), Basel: Schwabe, pp. 1327–1349, 1426–1434.
• Goulet, Richard et al., 2012, “Porphyre de Tyr”, in Richard Goulet (ed.), Dictionnaire des philosophes antiques, Volume 5.2, Paris: CNRS Éditions, pp. 1289–1468 (entry 263).
• Hadot, Pierre, 1999, Plotin, Porphyre: Études néoplatoniciennes, Paris: Les Belles Lettres. (A collection of Hadot’s articles on Plotinus and Porphyry.)
• Karamanolis, George, 2004, “Porphyry, the First Platonist Commentator on Aristotle”, in Peter Adamson, Han Baltussen, and Martin W. F. Stone (eds.), Philosophy, Science and Exegesis in Greek, Arabic and Latin Commentaries (Supplement to the Bulletin of the Institute of Classical Studies, 83.1–2), London: Institute of Classical Studies, volume 1, pp. 97–120.
• –––, 2006, Plato and Aristotle in Agreement? Platonists on Aristotle from Antiochus to Porphyry, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
• Karamanolis, George and Anne Sheppard (eds.), 2007, Studies on Porphyry (Bulletin of the Institute of Classical Studies Supplement, 98), London: Institute of Classical Studies, University of London.
• Smith, Andrew, 1974, Porphyry’s Place in the Neoplatonic Tradition: A Study in Post-Plotinian Neoplatonism, The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.
• –––, 1987, “Porphyrian Studies Since 1913”, in Wolfgang Haase (ed.), Aufstieg und Niedergang der römischen Welt (ANRW)/Rise and Decline of the Roman World, II.36.2, Berlin/Boston: De Gruyter, pp. 717–773; reprinted in Smith 2011a, ch. 14.
• –––, 2007, “Porphyry: Scope for a Reassessment”, in Karamanolis and Sheppard 2007, pp. 7–16; reprinted in Smith 2011a, ch. 15.
• –––, 2010, “Porphyry and His School”, in Lloyd P. Gerson (ed.), The Cambridge History of Philosophy in Late Antiquity, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, pp. 325–357.
• –––, 2011a, Plotinus, Porphyry and Iamblichus: Philosophy and Religion in Neoplatonism (Variorum Collected Studies Series CS979), Farnham/Burlington, VT: Ashgate. (A collection of reprints; the papers retain their original pagination)
• Sorabji, Richard (ed.), 1990, Aristotle Transformed: The Ancient Commentators and Their Influence, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press. (Articles on Porphyry, Aristotle and logic.)

Studies on Particular Topics

• Abramowski, Luise, 2006, “«Audi, ut dico»: Literarische Beobachtungen und chronologische Erwägungen zu Marius Victorinus und den ‘platonisierenden’ Nag Hammadi-Traktaten”, Zeitschrift für Kirchengeschichte, 117: 145–168.
• Adamson, Peter, 2007, “Porphyrius Arabus on Nature and Art: 463F Smith in Context”, in Karamanolis and Sheppard 2007, pp. 141–163.
• Arzhanov, Yury, 2024, “Some Notes on the Syriac Text of Porphyry’s On Principles and Matter”, in Arzhanov (ed.) 2024, pp. 1–16.
• ––– (ed.), 2024, Porphyry in Syriac: The Treatise ‘On Principles and Matter’ and its Place in the Greek, Latin, and Syriac Philosophical Traditions (Philosophy and Sciences in the Christian Orient, 1), Berlin/Boston: De Gruyter.
• Beatrice, Pier Franco, 1989, “Quosdam Platonicorum libros: The Platonic Readings of Augustine in Milan”, Vigiliae Christianae, 43: 248–281.
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• Porphyry, at the Open Library.
• Emilsson, Eyjólfur, “Porphyry”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2026 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/fall2026/entries/porphyry/>. [This was the previous entry on this topic in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy – see the version history.]

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Acknowledgments

For the 2026 update, this entry was mostly rewritten by Riccardo Chiaradonna, who has taken responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry. Eyjólfur Emilsson is still listed as a coauthor because some material has been retained from the previous version.