Chauncey Wright

First published Fri Jul 2, 2004; substantive revision Thu Sep 3, 2026

Chauncey Wright was an American philosopher of science of the second half of the nineteenth century and an early proponent of Darwinism in the United States. Sometimes cited as a founder of pragmatism, he is more appropriately remembered as an original thinker in the tradition of J. S. Mill’s utilitarianism.[1] Wright’s primary interest and originality lay in philosophy of science, but his insights and influence carried over to other venues, including philosophy of education and theory of meaning. Wright exercised a great influence at a crucial time in American cultural life — in the 1860s and 70s, when religious piety and Transcendentalism were waning. He wrote little and his influence was exerted by means of conversation and philosophical discussion with the circle of intellectuals and academics centered in Cambridge, Mass. from 1850–75. This circle included Charles S. Peirce, William James, and Oliver Wendell Holmes, Jr., all of whom acknowledged Wright’s influence.[2] Though often called the “forgotten American philosopher” (Madden, 1964), Wright has garnered increasing scholarly attention in the last forty years as a link between Continental positivism and American pragmatism (De Groot 2004, Pearce 2015, 2020). There is also recognition of Wright’s prescience in anticipating issues in contemporary evolution theory, in particular emergence in biological processes and exaptation, as opposed to adaptation, in natural selection (Parravicini, 2019; Gould and Vbra 1982).

Wright was an empiricist overall and a verificationist in his philosophy of science. While he was a proponent of philosophy as scientific method and a determined critic of the natural theology of his time, Wright’s views on these subjects often exhibit subtlety and nuance, characteristics running throughout his philosophy. He held that all knowledge originates from the “undoubted testimony of the senses” (PD 47) and that what are verified are predicted consequences of theory. At the same time, whether ideas derived from perception are free from preconceptions is less important than their being subject to the test of experience. This commitment to the sensory base of ideas both at the beginning and end of scientific investigation reinforced Wright’s belief that utility is what makes both nature and human affairs intelligible. The principle of utility informed his understanding of Darwin’s Origin of Species as offering not axioms for deduction but descriptive principles, in particular natural selection, that encompassed a wide range of disparate causes of change in organisms. From this vantage point on science, Wright became a penetrating interpreter and a brilliant defender of Darwinism in its introduction into the United States. In what follows, the nature of Wright’s empiricism is addressed first. The influence of Mill’s utilitarianism will be evident in his interpretation of Darwin, which is presented next. His views on cosmology and natural theology are followed by a consideration of his place in relation to both positivism and pragmatism.

1. Biographical Sketch

Chauncey Wright was born in 1830 in Northampton, Massachusetts, where his family had lived since colonial times and where his father had been a merchant and deputy-sheriff of the county. In 1848, he entered Harvard College. His education there included two years of advanced study in natural sciences. Graduating in 1852, he took employment with the Nautical Almanac office in Cambridge as a computer. This work constituted his livelihood throughout his life. He concentrated his work for each year into the last three months of the year, devoting the rest of the time to his own studies in the logic of science and metaphysics.

The first philosophical influence on Wright was the Scottish realist, Sir William Hamilton, whose works formed the curriculum for Francis Bowen’s teaching of philosophy at Harvard. Wright was, however, greatly influenced by John Stuart Mill’s criticism of Hamilton, and the influence of Mill is evident in Wright’s views on utility in science and ethics. The great conversion of his life came, however, with his reading of Darwin’s Origin of Species, published in 1859. Wright became an American defender of Darwin against his religious antagonists and also, like Harvard’s Asa Gray, against Darwin’s scientific critics in America.

Wright taught for a short time at Harvard but was not successful as a lecturer. He was an intellectual conversationalist and through his participation in a succession of study groups in Cambridge, influenced Charles S. Peirce, William James, and Oliver Wendell Holmes, Jr., among others. In spite of his perspicacity and his dispassionate logical approach to discussion, he also had a gentle, sometimes angelic, temperament. Children liked him and he was willing to spend time entertaining them. He was close to Charles Eliot Norton and his family and exchanged many letters with Norton’s sisters. When his friends were away for extended periods, Wright’s spirits and health suffered. He endured two bouts of deep depression from which his friends roused him. Among his friends Wright counted both William and Henry James. William James said of Wright, “Never in a human head was contemplation more separated from desire.” Wright died of a stroke in Cambridge, Massachusetts, in 1875, at the age of 45.[3]

2. Wright’s Philosophy of Science

2.1 Verification

Almost all of Wright’s writings are contained in two volumes, Philosophical Discussions, a collection of his articles published in American and British periodicals of the time, and Letters, collected shortly after his death by his friend James B. Thayer (Wright 1877 and 1878). Philosophical Discussion is hereafter cited in text as PD and Letters is cited as L. (These works are reprinted in Ryan and Madden 2000, Volumes 1 and 2.)

Two fundamental epistemological themes are prominent throughout his work: (1) sense perception provides the only evidence whose authority all humankind acknowledges, and (2) sense experience alone can produce the conviction and permanence that we believe knowledge should have. The first point addresses the problem of the diversity of truth claims, the second the expectation that genuine truth claims not be superseded. He said:

All observers not laboring under hallucinations of the senses are agreed, or can be made to agree, about facts of sensible experience, through evidence toward which the intellect is merely passive, and over which the individual will and character have no control. Such evidence is not the only kind which produces belief; though positivism maintains that it is the only kind which ought to produce so high a degree of confidence as all minds have or can be made to have through their agreements. (L 96)

Conviction should be accompanied by consensus, and only sense perception can claim consensus among honest investigators. Wright often acknowledged there were legitimate sources of belief besides sense perception — faith or rational introspection for instance — but none of them were adequate as sources of knowledge.

Wright did not analyze sense experience into sense data, adopting like Mill a type of phenomenalism (Madden 1993). In “The Evolution of Self-Consciousness,” Wright understands the distinction we make between ourselves and things as a product of evolution. As a species, it is part of our cognitive equipment to delineate natural objects out of phenomenal experience. We do not know things to exist apart from on-going experience. Ideas as mental images are signs:

Truths independent of all experience are not known to exist, unless we exclude from what we mean by “experience” that experience which we have in learning the meaning of words and in agreeing to definitions and the conventions of language, on the ground that they depend solely, or may be considered as depending solely, on a lexical authority, from which a kind of necessity proceeds, independent of reality in the relations and connections of the facts denoted by the words. (PD 229)

Language and concepts have a secondary established existence we cannot do without. Having set out this view, Wright did not linger to analyze phenomenal experience. His understanding of human evolved experience freed him to consider the large-scale processes governed by utility in nature, knowledge, and human affairs. Verification was crucial to this leap to the macro-level.

He said that the only difference between theories and facts is that theories are more complex and less directly testable (PD 44). Unlike later logical positivists, however, Wright did not hold that terms or descriptions for theoretical entities were meaningless or to be resolved only into propositions stating their verifiable consequences. In “The Genesis of Species,” Wright says that the unobservables postulated by science are “for the purpose of giving a material or visual basis to the phenomena and empirical laws of life in general”, and some of them “may yet exist” (PD 164–65). In this regard, he likened Darwin’s gemmule theory to Newton’s corpuscular theory of light and the molecular theory of matter. In alluding to the difficulty of representing the extremely small size of molecules as measured by Thomson, Wright said:

But there is no reason to doubt that in every such molecule there are still subordinate parts and structures; or that, even in these parts, a still finer order of parts and structures exists, at least to the extent of assimilated growth and simple division. Mr. Darwin supposes such growths and divisions in the vital gemmules. (PD 166)

The important thing about hypothesized unobservables is that they be related to actual phenomena in such a way as to have verifiable consequences.

Even at this, unobservables should not be specialized natures or forces taken to account just for certain phenomena. This was, according to Wright, the problem with scholastic substantial forms (PD 166–67). He criticized metaphysical concepts for being empirically poor; they do not link different phenomena and do not generate predictions that can be verified at the level of the tangible and visible. Unlike early modern critics of scholastic metaphysical concepts, Wright did not claim that scientific concepts are by comparison clear and simple. Indeed, theoretical entities in modern science can be hard to represent to ourselves because of the limitations of our conceptions to perceptible forms and properties (PD 166). Wright speculated that there were “orders of forces” between the physico-chemical and the vital, just as there are intermediate phenomena between the vegetative functions of an animal and sensibility, i.e., sensation and perception. But since sensibility presents the elements from which conceptions of size and movement must come, our conceptions of forces and hidden elements are limited to the sensible (PD 167). There are thus areas of nature we would investigate that are largely inaccessible to us because of empirical limitations. Wright did not resort to reductionism to bridge this gap in our knowledge. He said, “Can sensibility and the movements governed by it be derived directly by chemical synthesis from the forces of inorganic elements? It is probable, both from analogy and direct observation, that they cannot” (PD 167). To determine what theoretical entities are real is difficult but is nevertheless the task of science, which always concerns itself with facts.[4]

Given the realist tendency of his treatment of unobservables, indirect verification is an important part of Wright’s conception of the empirical basis of all knowledge. The theory of gravity, which Wright takes to be proven, “fails to become a fact in the proper sense” because it can never be verified by direct and immediate sensory activity. Its truth must be verified indirectly. He said:

Modern science deals then no less with theories than with facts, but always as much as possible with the verification of theories, — if not to make them facts by simple verification through experiment and observation, at least to prove their truth by indirect verification (PD 45).

A true theory is a fact, but it has been verified by “indirect, remote, and difficult means” (PD 41). Because there is no “complete inventory of our primary sources of knowledge,” there can be disagreement as to what constitutes a legitimate appeal to observation or what is a real verification (PD 45). Platonists or rationalists claim verification for their theories because they have made an observation of what reason reveals to them. The Platonist has made an induction. For Wright, verification means empirical judgment made upon deduction of consequences, not induction either from sense data or examination of self-consciousness (PD 47).

Nevertheless, even science that aims at a complete empiricism must admit some “ideal or transcendental elements,” but these elements must yield consequences that are testable, either by themselves or in conjunction with empirically derived notions (PD 47). For example, from Wright’s standpoint, the cosmological theory that the universe is developing, not just changing, might be a plausible interpretation of the data available to astronomers of his day. But he thought the notion of development relies implicitly on the idea of an end or culmination. So this “development theory,” which he calls “transcendental,” must still submit to empirical test (PD 17, 118). He denied Kant’s division of knowledge into “data of experience and conditions of experience” and so did not admit the transcendental in the sense of the rational a priori (L 106).

2.2 Induction

Despite Wright’s distinguishing verification from induction, the latter nevertheless played an important role in his philosophy of science. Wright did not think it informative to contrast intuition and induction, because they do not refer to different ultimate grounds of belief (PD 373). Intuition is “rapid, instinctive judgment, whether in the objective sensible perception of relatively concrete matters, or in the most abstract” (PD 372). Intuition is properly contrasted to inference, i.e., reasoning, whether inductive or deductive. “Inductive,” then, refers to the a posteriori source of reasoning, i.e., from evidence. It does not refer to a procedure for generalizing from evidence. He said, “In their primary signification and in this connection the terms ‘induction’ and ‘inductive’ refer directly to evidences, and not to any special means and processes of collating and interpreting them” (PD 372). So, induction may begin from a variety of sources. What philosophers, either Platonist or Cartesian, usually call intuition he understood to be induction from the data of self-consciousness.

Even induction from sense experience is not of one type. It may start with evidence taken from different levels of perceptual and experiential complexity and is at work at different stages of an investigation. This approach to induction is guided by the character of scientific knowledge itself, which Wright understood to be the relating of particular facts to more general ones (PD 205–206). But it also follows the character of natural phenomena. In biology in particular, the new science of evolution concerns the “external economy of life” and thus must investigate an accumulation of related facts of observation at the level of secondary causes (PD 99–100). Induction may come from ordinary experience, experiment, or the inspections of the field naturalist. He said, “Inductions are still performed for the most part unconsciously and unsystematically…. But when and however ideas are developed science cares nothing, for it is only by subsequent tests of sensible experience that ideas are admitted into the pandects of science” (PD 47).

For Wright, no axioms of science can be absolute. He said:

But all that is really implied in the name [axiom] is that truths when called axioms are used for the deductive proof of other truths, and that their own proof is not involved in the process. This does not deny, however, that they may be, as truths, the conclusions of other processes; to wit, the inductions of experience. If they are, then the only ultimate truths are the particulars of concrete experience, and no postulate or general assumption is inherent in science until its proceedings become systematic, or the truths already reached give direction to further research. (L 109)

Axioms are not foundational in an epistemological sense. We seek simple principles of physical reality but must be wary of taking them as foundations in the sense of ultimate simple facts. The only ultimate in knowledge is recourse to the empirical in verification. Though verification depends on deduction, it does not depend on absolutely true starting points of deduction to yield reliable knowledge. This part of Wright’s view reflects his assimilation of the positivist understanding of science as a taxonomy of practical experience with nature.

Wright’s understanding of induction figures in his defense of Darwin. In 1870, he commented on the almost universal acceptance of Darwin’s theory by the scientifically minded and attributed its success to “the skillful combination of inductive and deductive proofs with hypothesis.” This combination must rely, however, on a preceding simpler induction, he said. The near simultaneous discovery by Wallace and Darwin of the principle behind biological evolution testifies to their ability as naturalists to appreciate “the force of obscure and previously little studied facts” (PD 99).

3. Interpretation of Darwin

3.1 Evolution and Utility

Wright’s understanding of biological evolution was in advance of most of his contemporaries, and this was recognized by Darwin himself. Wright treated changes relevant to speciation in terms of different levels of causative and explanatory principles. Natural selection is a descriptive principle that unifies these other principles into a comprehensive account.

In his review articles, “The Philosophy of Herbert Spencer” and “The Genesis of Species,” Wright identified two errors in the interpretation of Darwin’s evolution. The first was the almost inevitable importation of teleological notions into the history of life and of the universe. Notions of development and progress incorporate hidden preferences about natural or moral outcomes. Spencer finds a “Law of Evolution” across spheres as diverse as cosmology, biological evolution, language, psychology, and social phenomena. His law is that, given the persistence of energy or force through the universe, all things develop from a simpler state, homogeneity, to a more complex state, heterogeneity. He drew upon the success of Darwin’s Origin of Species and applied its general description to other phenomena. Wright was highly critical of Spencer. For Wright, the proper objects of scientific research are “processes and the results of processes” (PD 73–74), a type of investigation practiced in the science of mechanics, with its notions of “conservation of force” and “correlation and equivalence of forces” (78). Objections to the word ‘force’ are obviated by the precision of its meanings in mechanics. Spencer’s sprawling ‘law’ of evolution has none of this precision and serves a cosmology that is unscientific.

Wright’s criticism of George Mivart on Darwin, in Wright’s essay, “The Genesis of Species,” is consistent with his criticism of Spencer but more illuminating about natural selection. Mivart places undue emphasis on the “accidental” as the source of novelty in biological evolution. He treats accidental variations as rare occurrences within stable species, which Mivart insisted could produce specialized organs only over a greater period of time than life has existed on earth. Wright disputed Mivart’s commitment to the stability of species and said that accidental causes are only accidental from the viewpoint of the human being: “An accident is what cannot be anticipated from what we know, or by any intelligence, perhaps, which is less than omniscient” (PD 141). Variations come out of concrete physical processes. These processes are the proper subjects of scientific investigation. Variations may persist without significance until combined with other traits brought about by other underlying processes. Darwin was not a Democritean (PD 131, 142). Within a complex matrix of causes, the arbiter of natural selection is the utility of variation through generations of a species. “The use (italics Wright’s) which may be presumed in general to govern selection is a combination, with varying degrees of importance, of all the actual uses in a structure” (PD 191).

Natural selection is a manifestation of the all-pervasive principle of utility, which he characterized in this way: “Let the questions of the uses of life, then, be put in this shape: To what ascertainable form or phase of life is this or that other form or phase of life valuable or serviceable?” (L 274–75). Features or parts of a living thing are forms or phases of life that serve the organism’s more general functions and its survival. Perception of colors, for instance, serves to avoid the effects of dispersion of light in perception and to make possible definition of objects in vision through limits in sensibility (L 279). Using teleological language without teleological intent, he said, “Colors were invented by Nature to avoid the confusing effects of dispersion” (L 279). The physical laws of optics in this case contribute to an adaptation useful to living things.

At this very early stage of reception of Darwin’s theory, Wright already understood that the general form of explanation by utility is more important than which particular explanation by natural selection is advanced to explain a feature or structure. In correspondence with Darwin, Wright said, “The inquiry as to which of several real uses is the one through which natural selection has acted for the development of any faculty or organ … has for several years seemed to me a somewhat less important question than it seemed formerly and still appears to most thinkers on the subject” (L 335). Wright thought there might be a plurality of uses for the same feature in the history of an organism. Sometimes these uses are contemporaneous; at other times they succeed one another in the course of evolution. Wright believed that thinking in terms of natural selection would shed light on physiological questions and connect chemical and physical explanations to the more complicated phenomena of life (PD 296). He realized that natural selection promised to be a research program for investigation that would unify biological science.

3.2 Wright in Light of Twenty-first Century Evolutionary Biology

Issues raised by Mivart and Wright as rational possibilities for interpreting evolution have figured importantly in the twenty-first century in discussions in evolutionary developmental biology (Evo-Devo) and epigenetics. These new sciences have shown that cooperation among organisms, regulatory networks internal to the organism, and different forms of “natural genetic engineering” (Shapiro 2011, 82–88) all have a role in evolutionary change. These developments are modifying the “Modern Synthesis” of twentieth-century Darwinism, whereby natural selection acts on genetic variations understood as random (Corning 2020). At the time of Mivart and Wright, how inheritance works (e.g., the work of Gregor Mendel) had yet to enter the scientific canon, and there was no evidence at the genetic level to decide between their interpretations, which were philosophical.

As a naturalist and believer in evolution himself, Mivart thought that the gradualism of Darwin’s natural selection, taken by itself, could not account for speciation. He reasoned that there must have been sudden changes in morphology and function (Gould’s later “hopeful monsters”), a suggestion at least compatible with the evident gaps in the fossil record, i.e., the absence of intermediate forms of species. Wright replied with the power of “legitimate hypothesis to supply the unknown incidental causes through which the principle has acted” (PD 148). Wright points out that features of an organism functional in one way are useful for other purposes, and non-functional inherited changes may become functional over time when combined with other changes. Wright articulates an idea of “unselected but useful” variations (Gould and Vrba 1982, 6). Although emergentism was a notion entertained by nineteenth-century British evolutionists (Parravacini 2019, 5), Wright insisted upon what we would call gradualism in underlying physical processes, since the alternative seemed to him always to import metaphysical conceits, like God. Mivart argued for the emergence of functional traits due to an organism’s innate tendency to variation in certain directions, a view Wright believed to originate in natural theology. With his understanding of the logic of material causes and utility, Wright could make natural selection flexible enough in hypothesis to account for emergent phenomena (PD 201). His utilitarian commitment, so purely rational, would be expanded concretely in a biological context only a century later.

Developments in Evo-Devo and epigenetics perhaps call into question Wright’s brilliant conception of “weather” as the governing analogy for all change at the material level, including in organisms. Innumerable phenomena transpire without purpose or recognizable development at the concrete level in nature (PD 131). Our finite minds are simply unable to grasp them as they have happened and continue to occur. Wright’s “cosmic weather” is presented in the following section. Weather-like change is harnessed by organisms, because in them utility supervenes upon material processes. Wright could envision no difference in the processes themselves between a physico-chemical context and a biological context (PD 137–8). Wright’s philosophical conception of natural change as weather perhaps survives more recent biological developments, insofar as he believed different levels of explanation were needed to understand the complexity of evolutionary change (PD 99–100). Natural selection could be compared to the fundamental laws of political economy, as these laws actually emerge in the fixing of value and prices through demand and supply (PD 137). To fail to investigate a principles operating at the level of the whole organism or at the level of populations would go against the “Aristotelian” tendency of mind of the scientific culture (PD 100). At the same time, the “weather-philosopher” errs when he thinks “he can discern regularities in the weather, which the known principles of mechanical and chemical physics will account for and to which they are subordinate” (PD 137–8). Principles of chemistry and physics are fundamental. Utility makes sense of living things. The rest is the imponderable complexity of weather.

3.3 Evolution and Human Behavior

Although he rejected Spencer’s application of the principle of evolution to history and civilization, Wright thought many aspects of human behavior and psychology could be treated by the principle of natural selection. At the urging of Darwin, Wright proposed a natural history of the origin of self-consciousness. In “The Emergence of Self-Consciousness,” he focuses on human awareness of different kinds of signs (usually vocal, he said) that recall images in thought. The images themselves act as signs when a human being reasons. Concepts too are images. The more vivid outward signs “are in the animal mind, merged in the things signified, like stars in the light of the sun” (PD 209). The conscious awareness of the difference between outward and inward signs is crucial to human awareness, he believed. This awareness may have come with the “consciousness of simultaneous internal and external suggestion” and the recognition of the outward sign as a substitute for the inward sign (PD 210). The key to rationality is the outward sign itself, i.e., elements of language, being made the object of attention (PD 206).[5]

At the level of psychology, utilitarian ethics was Wright’s model. He used the way humans make moral choices as an analogy for unconscious selection in the change of human language over time. Utility is not the motive of moral decision-makers. Rather, in the moral agent thinking rightly according to his principle of virtue, conscience will display the utilitarian principle. Similarly, there may be a variety of motives for adoption of a change in linguistic form or behavior: authority, ease of pronunciation, or distinctness from other utterances. The adoption of the change is what concerns natural selection. Natural selection shows the utility implicit unconsciously in selection by the agency of one of these motives (L 244). In commenting on moral behavior itself, Wright in effect based ethics on human nature, because of the importance he accorded to habit in human behavior:

The pains of disconcerted or frustrated habits, and the inherent pleasure there is in following them, are motives which nature has put into our wills without generally caring to inform us why; and she sometimes decrees, indeed, that her reasons shall not be ours. Practically, we find ourselves acting the more reasonably and more for the real ends of nature, in proportion as these are not our immediate motives, but give place to more completely devoted, single-purposed, and therefore effective powers, or to instincts and habits (L 242).

Wright thought utilitarianism needed, as a supplement, a developed philosophy of habit. In a way similar to his explanation of natural selection, he separated (1) the conditions militating toward habit, (2) immediate motives for choosing action, and (3) the larger principle governing selection of action.[6]

Wright labored in his essays and review articles to make Darwin’s theory understandable to the educated American public by countering the questions about what kind of explanation natural selection offered. Realizing that utility as a principle provided the logical form for Darwin’s theory, he insisted that natural selection could not submit to requirements of demonstration. It could not serve as an axiom from which deduction starts. Indeed, it should be compared to the principle of gravitation not as this concept figured in celestial mechanics or even in the laboratory but as gravitation is manifest “in the concrete courses of outward nature, in meteorology and physical geology.”

In responding both to friends and enemies of Darwin’s evolution, Wright sought to keep clear the minimal meaning of natural selection in scientific terms. In this way, he did great service to Darwin. Like a good positivist, he was protecting the new theory of evolution from annexation into cosmological speculation or alliance with the final causality that was always a part of natural theology.[7]

4. Cosmology and Argument Against Natural Theology

Wright had interesting and original views about the origin of the universe and changes in the heavens.[8] He believed it most likely that the universe is eternal, constituting “an order without beginning and without termination” (PD 4). It is governed by the principle of “counter-movements,” which he believed was manifest already in biological phenomena in the cycle of life and death, nutrition and decay. In the universe, gravitation and heat were the chief forces involved in counter-movements. Geology manifests the principle, in the relation of forces producing elevations, compressions, erosion, and deposits, and it is even more markedly evident in meteorological phenomena. Utility played no role at this level of interactions of matter. Wright believed that changes in interstellar space constituted, in a way similar to meteorology, “cosmical weather” (PD 10). He was concerned that the nebular hypothesis of the origin of solar systems, presented as a plausible scientific hypothesis by Laplace and supported by the observations of Herschel, was too readily taken in support of a “developmental hypothesis” about the universe, namely that the universe was created and had evolved toward an end congenial to supporting human life. He accepted the nebular hypothesis in terms of the physical laws that yielded the developmental hypothesis, both in astronomy and biology. But he called it the “derivative hypothesis” to connote the fact that “in several classes of phenomena hitherto regarded as ultimate and inexplicable, physical explanations are probable and legitimate” (PD 17). He meant by this that scientific cosmology need entertain no extra-scientific principles as fundamental: “the constitution of the solar system is not archetypal, as the ancients supposed, but the same corrupt mixture of law and apparent accident that the phenomena of the earth’s surface exhibit” (PD 9).

Wright was aware that the second law of thermodynamics militated against his cosmology of cosmic weather continuing in an endless succession of phenomena in infinite time. But he believed the “tendency to diffuse the mechanical energies of nature” that was characteristic of the laws of heat was considered too narrowly by Thomson and others. There was a “round of actions” in the complex interactions of heat and gravitation through space that set up the counter-movements of continuous change (L 177). To the scientific Aristotelian mind that Wright claimed to have, the theory of “wasting” raised more questions than it answered, and so he deferred his own full acceptance of it (PD 87). Wright’s approach to this issue illustrates his penchant, evident also in his acute and ready understanding of natural selection, to focus on large-scale effects of natural law as making sense of nature. In this, his mind worked against the reductionist tendencies of philosophers who had less experience with and sympathy for science itself. He was interested in the persistent patterns evident to sense perception set up by the operation of natural law at levels inaccessible to perception.

Wright’s cosmic weather has received attention from Vincent Colapietro as a description of human experience at the level of everyday life (Colapietro 2015). The stories we create of our own lives are only covers for the “meshwork” (Tim Ingold’s term) of life events, some of which we initiate, others of which we undergo, but none of which can be completely separated and understood. Colapietro connects William James’ description of human isolation in an indifferent cosmos (Pragmatism, 54) to “the purposeless vagaries of cosmic weather” in Wright (2015, 28). For Colapietro, negotiating the human weather world is at work in both Peirce’s inquiring style of writing and in the literary vision of Walker Percy (Colapietro 2019, 2024).

A constant theme for Wright is the rejection of natural theology. He did not believe that there could be philosophical arguments, starting from natural phenomena, whether motion or the intelligible forms of living things, that prove the existence of a deity. He also believed it was impossible to identify in nature genuine final causes, ends present naturally that are always prior to the subordinate causes that bring about those ends. He said:

By what criterion … can we distinguish among the numberless effects, that are also causes, and among the causes that may, for aught we can know, be also effects, — how can we distinguish which are the means and which are the ends? (PD 36).

That the universe has a purpose or that the forms of living things given by nature have an inevitability or natural priority to them can be believed on grounds of faith but can in no way be disclosed or supported by scientific investigation of nature. Perhaps judging from the state of philosophy and theology in the American institutions of higher learning in the mid-nineteenth century, Wright believed that metaphysics had no other purpose than the service of natural theology. He was never precise about what he meant by metaphysics. He was unacquainted with the philosophy of being and did not consider philosophically the role of analogy in scientific thinking. Metaphysics for him was limited to an ontology of natural things and their causes. He treated metaphysics and philosophy interchangeably: “The questions of philosophy proper are human desires and fears and aspirations — human emotions — taking an intellectual form” (PD 50). A spirit of inquiry free of these influences motivates science, but it is “necessarily, at all times, a weak feeling” and could have little effect on civilization until a body of scientific learning had been developed. He said, “And we owe science to the combined energies of individual men of genius, rather than to any tendency to progress inherent in civilization” (PD 51). Philosophy belongs with the fine arts and religion. Its attainments are not great but its motives are noble (PD 52). This ad hominen argument against philosophers — that their enterprise is not rational and disinterested — would have found ready reinforcement in Comte’s rejection of metaphysics in favor of scientific method. Wright did not follow Comte, however, in Comte’s recommendation of a religion of humanity for the masses to take the place of religion. Building a prescriptive social program as an addendum to scientific method was itself unscientific.

5. Wright, Positivism, and Pragmatism

In a letter of 1869, Wright explained the advantages of positivism over the “older philosophy.” Positivism, he said, is a system of “universal methods, hypotheses, and principles” founded on the sciences. It is not a universal science itself but must be “coextensive with actual knowledge, and exhibit the consilience of the sciences” (L, 141). Consilience was a term used by William Whewell in 1858 to describe the coherence and mutual consistency of different scientific disciplines as they develop. This coherence, for Whewell, was a test of the truth of the sciences.[9]

In his criticism of Herbert Spencer, Wright cites positivism frequently as the correct form of scientific philosophy. Wright did not fully endorse Comte’s views, however, even apart from Comte’s social philosophy.[10] On method, Comte said that the ancients failed to make more progress in science because they lacked the principle of empirical verification. Wright believed the ancients possessed the critical methods of science but did not pursue them single-mindedly (PD 48). They combined their investigations with emotional motives, which “gave an anthropomorphic and teleological character” to their views of nature. Wright took up the positivist point of view, but he discriminated among its many claims. For Wright, Mill was more dispassionate than Comte, but even Mill could be improved by a broader interpretation of Darwin’s discovery.

In recent scholarship, the term, positivism, has come under scrutiny from historians of American philosophy who have the advantage of a greater distance from positivism’s role in twentieth-century American thought. Trevor Pearce shows that positivism was a general term for a scientific approach to philosophy, which served the rejection of more traditional–particularly religiously inflected–philosophies. “Positive” connoted judgment by means of observed facts, eschewing speculation about causes (Pearce 2015, 444). Wright qualifies as a positivist on this description.

A development arising from this general positivist turn was to take some sensory and cognitive experiences as signs instead of percepts or concepts. In a passage that parallels Comte, Wright says that every scientific distinction is of value in classification and “must coincide with and be of use as a sign of other distinctions —that is, be a mark of the things distinguished by it” (PD 370).[11] As we saw above, Wright traced the emergence of self-consciousness to human awareness of the difference between outward and inward signs. The key to rationality is the outward sign itself, i.e., elements of language, being made the object of attention (PD 206). This turn to signs, present in both Comte and Wright, preceded Peirce’s development of a genuine semeiotic theory. The interest in signs was part of the general positivist turn.

Edward Madden, in a work on Wright which has not been excelled, distinguished Wright from pragmatists like James and Peirce on more than one basis. Wright held nothing like the views of James and Peirce on the role of chance or the indeterminate in nature (Madden 1963, 82–91). Tychism, as it was called, is fundamental to the emergence of novelty in Peirce’s universe. The “by chance” is important for there to be freedom of will for James. Just as decisive a difference between them and Wright is their different understandings of meaning and truth. While for James and Peirce, “sensual consequences” in the form of the useful are the very meaning of a proposition, Wright held truth to be the agreement of thought with experience (L 325). He held a minimal sort of correspondence theory of truth. What Wright had in common with the pragmatists were views held more generally among scientific empiricists. Insofar as he articulated the logic of scientific inquiry without adding a theory of his own, Wright could be understood as providing a foundation for later pragmatism epistemologies (Madden 1963, 77–79).

Since he did not reduce meaning to use, Wright cannot be placed among the scientific verificationists (early or twentieth-century) who made unobservables fictional entities or eliminated them entirely (e.g., Ernst Mach). (For a comparison of Mach and Wright, see De Groot 2004.) According to Giuffrida (1978), who is in agreement with Madden on Wright’s theory of meaning, Wright distinguished meaning from significance. Propositions have cognitive meaning, but their significance (signification) depends on their being verified.

Wright’s philosophical position is a type of naturalism. He resisted skepticism, idealism, and realism, regarding them all as defects of thought. He believed scientists discover structures and features of natural things, and previously unknown hidden entities, as well as phenomenal laws that govern the behavior of natural things. In this respect, his positivism is methodological and precautionary, a preparation for scientific realism. In treating the origin of consciousness, he said that idealism and natural realism are the two philosophical positions to issue from taking sense data and emotions as the primarily real. In idealism, the conscious subject is immediately known through his perceptions, i.e., the phenomena, and the existence of an external world can only be an inference from the phenomena known to belong to the self (PD 230). He rejected this but also rejected natural realism, which holds that “both the subject and object are absolutely, immediately, and equally known through their essential attributes in perception.” According to Wright, the immediacy of sensible qualities to consciousness entails that there is no way to separate subject and object in consciousness. But, he continued:

All states of consciousness are, it is true, referred to one or the other, or partly to each of the two worlds [subject and object]; and this attribution is, in part at least, instinctive, yet not independent of all experience, since it comes either from the direct observation of our progenitors, or, possibly, through the natural selection of them; that is, possibly through the survival of those who rightly divided the worlds, and did not often mistake a real danger for a dream or for an imagined peril, nor often mistake a dream of security for reality. If. . . we mean by immediacy such an instinctive attribution, independent of repeated connections of attributes in their subject through the individual’s own experiences, then “natural realism” is most in accordance with our view. (PD 231)

In this quotation, Wright suggests that the division of subject from object may constitute “rightly dividing the world” as indexed by survival value. A division made in these terms, rather than by an individual’s experiences of himself and the world, is a reasonable basis for natural realism. Wright’s view in this passage is consistent with the position of Hume that human beings by nature make connections between ideas and the world and that skepticism about these connections is useless and idle. In this regard, Wright’s position anticipates that of P.F. Strawson, a twentieth-century logical analyst. Strawson said our beliefs, e.g., in the existence of bodies, “are not grounded beliefs and at the same time are not open to serious doubt” (Strawson 1985, 19). Wright here articulates a similar point couched in terms of natural selection of beliefs. Also like Strawson, Wright took for some purposes ordinary experience as what is primarily real, while for other purposes he took the entities and properties given in physical theory as the real. This pluralistic approach came from Wright’s acceptance of different levels of experience as equally valid starting points for science. Also evident in this passage, however, is the way Wright made biological evolution the basis for all other accounts of nature and human psychology. In this respect, his approach is a forerunner of John Dewey’s philosophy of nature.

Bibliography

Primary Literature

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  • Ryan, Frank X. and Edward Madden (eds.), 2000, The Evolutionary Philosophy of Chauncey Wright, Sterling, VA: Thoemmes Continuum. Volumes 1 and 2.

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