Cosmological Argument

First published Tue Jul 13, 2004; substantive revision Wed Jul 1, 2026

The cosmological argument is less a specific argument than an argument type. It uses a general pattern of argumentation (logos) that makes an inference from particular, alleged facts about the universe (cosmos) to the existence of a unique being, generally identified with or referred to as God or Allah. Among these initial facts are that beings or events in the universe are causally dependent or contingent, that the universe (as the totality of contingent things) is contingent in that it could have been other than it is or could have not existed at all, that the Big Conjunctive Contingent Fact possibly has an explanation, or that the universe came into being. From these contended facts some philosophers and theologians argue deductively, inductively, or abductively by inference to the best explanation that a first cause, sustaining cause, unmoved mover, necessary being, or personal being (God) exists that brought about, caused, and/or sustains the universe. For some theists, the cosmological argument is part of classical natural theology, whose goal is to provide evidence for the claim that God exists (Loke 2026: chaps. 5 & 6). At the same time, contemporary discussions of the argument generally occur outside of considerations of natural theology but have generated a cottage industry of philosophical issues of their own.

On the one hand, the argument arises from human curiosity as to why there is something rather than nothing or something of a specific sort rather than something else. It invokes a concern for some full, complete, ultimate, or best explanation of what exists contingently. On the other hand, it raises intrinsically important philosophical questions about contingency and necessity, causation and explanation, part/whole relationships (mereology), possible worlds, infinity, sets, the nature of time, the nature and origin of the universe, and multiverses. In what follows we will first sketch out a very brief history of the argument. Then we will note three types of argument before focusing on a variety of contemporary versions of the deductive cosmological argument: one based on metaphysical grounding, another on a restricted version of the Principle of Sufficient Reason (PSR), and a third based on a weak version of that principle. (An argument based on a strong version of the PSR will be found in a supplement.) We then turn to the argument constructed from the alleged facts that the universe had a beginning and the impossibility of an infinite temporal regress of causes. After presenting an inductive version of the cosmological argument, we consider whether the cosmological argument has significance.

1. Historical Overview

Although in Western philosophy the earliest formulation of a version of the cosmological argument is found in Plato’s Laws, 893–96, the classical argument is firmly rooted in Aristotle’s Physics (VIII, 4–6) and Metaphysics (XII, 1–6). Islamic philosophy enriches the tradition, developing two types of arguments. Arabic philosophers (falasifa), such as Ibn Sina (c. 980–1037), developed the argument from contingency, which was taken up by Thomas Aquinas (1225–74) in his Summa Theologica (I,q.2,a.3) and in his Summa Contra Gentiles (I, 13). Influenced by the Neoplatonist John Philoponus (5th c) (Davidson 1969), the mutakallimūm—theologians who used reason and argumentation to support their revealed Islamic beliefs—developed the temporal version of the argument from the impossibility of an infinite temporal regress, now referred to as the kalām cosmological argument. For example, al-Ghāzāli (1058–1111) argued that everything that begins to exist requires a cause of its beginning. The world is composed of temporal phenomena preceded by other temporally-ordered phenomena. Since such a series of temporal phenomena cannot continue to infinity because an actual infinite is impossible, the world must have had a beginning and a cause of its existence, termed Allah or God (Craig 1979: part 1). This version of the cosmological argument entered medieval Christian tradition through Bonaventure (1221–74) in his Sentences (II Sent. D.1,p.1,a.1,q.2).

While the cosmological argument does not figure prominently in Asian philosophy, a very abbreviated version of it, proceeding from dependence, can be found in Udayana’s Nyāyakusumāñjali I,4. In general, philosophers in the Nyāya tradition argue that since the universe has parts that come into existence at one occasion and not another, it must have a cause. We could admit an infinite regress of causes if we had evidence for such, but lacking such evidence, God must exist as the non-dependent cause. Many of the objections to the Naiyāyikas’ argument contend that God is an inappropriate cause because of God’s nature. For example, since God is immobile and has no body, he cannot properly be said to cause anything. The Naiyāyikas reply that God could assume a body at certain times, and in any case, God need not create in the same way humans do (Potter 1977: 100–07).

René Descartes (1596–1650) advanced his version of the cosmological argument as not only a piece of natural theology that proved God’s existence by natural reason but that also served an epistemic function of guaranteeing that God could not be deceiving him (Meditations on First Philosophy, Preface & Meditation 3). Enlightenment thinkers such as Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz and Samuel Clarke reaffirmed the cosmological argument. Leibniz (1646–1716) appealed to a strengthened principle of sufficient reason, according to which “no fact can be real or existing and no statement true without a sufficient reason for its being so and not otherwise” (Monadology, §32). Leibniz used the principle to argue that the sufficient reason for the “series of things comprehended in the universe of creatures” (§36) must exist outside this series of contingencies and is found in a necessary being that we call God (§38). Samuel Clarke (1675–1729) likewise employed the principle of sufficient reason in his cosmological argument (Rowe 1975: chap. 2).

The cosmological argument came under serious assault in the 18th century, first by David Hume and then by Immanuel Kant. Hume (1748) attacked as non-evidential both the view of causation presupposed in the argument (that causation is an objective, productive, necessary power relation that holds between things) and the Causal Principle—every contingent being has a cause of its existence—that lies at the heart of the argument. Kant (1787) contended that the cosmological argument, in identifying the necessary being as the most real being, relies on the ontological argument, which in turn is suspect. We will return to these criticisms below.

In the first part of the 20th century, with the rise of Positivism, the argument was largely abandoned outside of Thomistic circles. For critics like J.J.C. Smart (1955), the claim of the cosmological argument that God necessarily exists is equivalent to “Necessarily, God exists.” But since existence claims cannot be logically necessary, the statement is absurd. However, he notes, within us lies a deep-seated question: why should anything exist at all? Smart does not know what sort of question this is. It is not, he notes, a “proper question,” for interpreted along the lines of the cosmological argument it is “an absurd request for the nonsensical postulation of a logically necessary being” (46), nonsensical in that logical necessity can only be applied to propositions, not to beings. However, he continues, this awe-inspiring theological question appeals to those with a religious attitude. In this, the cosmological argument is reduced to a mystical role, catering to our emotions but devoid of rational content.

Both theists and nontheists in the last part of the 20th century and the first part of the 21st century generally show a healthy skepticism about the argument. Alvin Plantinga concludes “that this piece of natural theology is ineffective” (1967: chap. 1) and, from his later Reformed Epistemology, unnecessary since belief in God can be properly basic. Richard Gale contends, in Kantian fashion, that since the conclusion of all versions of the cosmological argument invokes an impossibility, no cosmological arguments can provide examples of sound reasoning (1991: chap. 7). (However, Gale seems to have changed his mind and in subsequent writings proposed and defended his own version of the cosmological argument, which we will consider below.) Similarly, Michael Martin (1990: chap. 4), John Mackie (1982: chap. 5), Quentin Smith (Craig and Smith 1993), Bede Rundle (2004), Wes Morriston (2000, 2002a, 2003, 2010), and Graham Oppy (2006: chap. 3; and elsewhere), among numerous others, reason that no current version of the cosmological argument is sound or provides probabilistic evidence. Yet dissenting voices can be heard. Robert Koons (1997) employs mereology and modal and nonmonotonic logic in taking a “new look” at the argument from contingency. In his widely discussed writings William Lane Craig marshals multidisciplinary evidence for the truth of the premises found in the kalām argument, as does Andrew Loke (2017; 2022). Richard Gale and Alexander Pruss propose a version based on a so-called weak principle of sufficient reason that leads to a finite God that is not omnibenevolent, while Michael Almeida constructs a version of the argument based on modal realism and a strong principle of sufficient reason. Richard Swinburne, rejecting deductive versions of the cosmological argument, proposes an inductive argument that is part of a larger cumulative case for God’s existence.

In short, in contrast to the first half of the last century, contemporary philosophers contribute increasingly detailed, complex, and sophisticated arguments on both sides of the debate as to the soundness, cogency, or usefulness of the cosmological argument. Some discussions are connected to natural theology; most others are unconnected but important for their philosophically complex and subtle reasoning and the issues they raise.

2. Typology of Cosmological Arguments

Philosophers employ diverse classifications of the cosmological arguments. Swinburne distinguishes inductive from deductive versions. Craig distinguishes three types of deductive cosmological arguments in terms of their approach to an infinite regress of causes. The first, advocated by Aquinas, is based on the impossibility of an essentially ordered (ontological) infinite regress. A renewed interest in the Thomistic versions of the cosmological argument (Arp 2016) focuses on the defense of this thesis (Kerr 2012; Feser 2013; Cohoe 2013; Cook 2022), while a parallel argument from grounding also is advanced. Although we will not consider the Thomistic cosmological arguments in detail, we will address these two issues in Section 4.

The second argument type, which Craig terms the kalām argument, holds that an infinite temporal regress of causes is impossible because an actual infinite is impossible, and even if it were possible it could not be temporally realized. We will consider this in detail in Section 8 below.

The third, espoused by Leibniz and Clarke, is overtly founded on the Principle of Sufficient Reason (Craig 1980: 282–83), although it appears that all versions use some form of that principle. We develop versions of this in Sections 5–7.

Craig notes that the distinction between these types of arguments is important because objections raised against one version may be irrelevant to other versions. So, for example, a critique of a particular version of the Principle of Sufficient Reason (PSR), which one finds developed by William Rowe or Richard Gale, might not be telling against the Thomistic or kalām versions of the argument.

Another way of distinguishing between versions of the argument is in terms of the relevance of time to the argument. In Aquinas’s version, dependence, not a temporal relation, is the primary focus. He argues not for a first cause in time but rather for a grounding or sustaining cause (Siniscalchi 2018: 691). The kalām version, on the other hand, argues for a first cause in time. Hence, the temporal ordering of the causal sequence is central, introducing issues regarding the nature of time and temporally-ordered infinite series into the discussion.

3. Complexity of the Question

A discussion of the complexity of the question that initiates the cosmological argument can be found in the Supplementary Document: Complexity of the Question.

4. Argument from Grounding

We will not address Thomas Aquinas’s Five Ways in detail here, but recent literature suggests informative comparisons of some contemporary discussions with features of his arguments. Aquinas argued that every essentially-ordered causal series is either infinite or terminates in a first, uncaused cause. In an essentially ordered series, which is asymmetric, irreflexive, derivative, and transitive, each effect has no intrinsic causal power but depends on prior causal activity. That is, the subsequent power depends for its causal activity upon the causal activity of the prior members of the series (ordered logically, not necessarily temporally) (Aquinas 1984: I, q.2, a.2). Consequently, there must be a first, i.e., non-dependent, cause. Theoretically, the universe could have existed infinitely in time, for God can make something that always existed. An eternal created thing is not contradictory (Aquinas 1984: q.2, a. 1 & 2). But an independent, essentially-ordered, causally-efficacious, infinite series is impossible, for if there were no initial, self-sufficient causal power, there would be no subsequent causal powers. As Caleb Cohoe (2013) notes, “Aquinas’s account of causality is closer to contemporary theories of ontological dependence than it is to the predominant contemporary theories of causality…. It is primarily a vertical relation, not a horizontal one.”

Ben Cook attempts to supplement the traditional argument regarding the impossibility of an actual series of essentially-ordered things by appealing to a powers theory of possibility. The argument is that for any possibly true proposition, there must be something that has the power to bring it about that it is a possibly true proposition. He argues that if “possibilities are grounded in powers and if secondary causes are not equipped with the powers necessary to ground corresponding possibilities”, an infinite regress of an essentially-ordered series is impossible (2022: 752). “If a power is conferred, then it has to be conferred by something that possesses the relevant power intrinsically, and so can confer it on others. But if so, then anything with a purely conferred power for some activity cannot exercise that power without the ongoing activity of that which confers” (753). Since not all powers can be conferred, there must be something that grounds each member of the series and that has the power intrinsically (a primary or first cause).

Thomas Oberle (2022: 158) responds that arguments defending this premise make a critical confusion. It is true that removing a primary cause in a finite series will remove the causal efficacy in the series. But, he argues, affirming that an essentially ordered series is infinite is not equivalent to removing the primary cause of a finite, essentially-ordered series with respect to enabling causal efficacy.

Ross Cameron responds that in this per se series, we are given an account of x’s causal efficacy in terms of the transitive causal efficacy of that on which x depends. But without an initial cause, we are given an explanatory account in terms of that very explanatory account, and thus we have a vicious regress that fails to explain x’s causal efficacy. “Each account depends for its [explanatory] success on the success of the account at each subsequent stage, and since the sequence goes on to infinity, the promise [of an explanation] is never fulfilled” (2022: 20). While a per accidens series can be infinite without suffering a vicious regress, such cannot be the case with a per se series. Oberle (2024) responds that there is no vicious regress if the series is considered distributively rather than collectively(see Section 5.3)

In short, the debate hinges in part on the distinction between per se and per accidens series, how the series is to be understood, and whether invoking this distinction begs the question or constitutes a real difference.

A second comparison with the Thomistic argument is the emergence of cosmological arguments based on ontological grounding, which mirrors the direction that Thomas took when speaking about proper causation. Thomas gave the example of the stone being moved by a stick, which is moved by the hand, which is moved by the arm, which is moved by the soul. The movement of the stone and stick can be understood as grounded in ontologically prior movements. This grounding argument has been developed by Duen-Yen Deng to construct a cosmological argument for the existence of an ungrounded being that provides the ground for everything else. Deng introduces a “well-foundedness principle: There is no indefinitely descending chain of grounding” (2020: 419). If there were an indefinite chain, the groundedness would never be achieved but always deferred. Thus, every non-fundamental entity is grounded in some fundamental entity or entities. To move to the conclusion that there is only one fundamental entity, he appeals to what he terms the Laser principle: “One should not multiply fundamental entities beyond necessity” (420). These principles, supplemented by a third principle, allow him to conclude that the best theory invokes one fundamental grounding entity. As he notes, the argument is effective only if one grants his principles. We will say more about grounding in Section 5.2 and the well-foundedness principle (which we have already noted is contested) in Section 8.

5. Argument from Contingency

Defenders of the cosmological argument from contingency contend that everything that is dependent or contingent requires explanation or grounding for its existence. It is important to stress that what needs explanation is the existence of what is contingent, not the existence of everything (that is, of necessary beings as well). It is not that necessary beings are self-explanatory; rather, necessary beings just are (brute facts). Failure to recognize this leads to confusion about what the cosmological argument is arguing for and failure to understand why it makes no sense to ask for the explanation of the necessary or to claim that a necessary being (e.g., God) is self-explanatory (see this confusion in Shaun Nichols 2025: S24).

5.1 A Deductive Argument from Contingency

As an a posteriori argument, the cosmological argument from contingency begins with a fact known by experience, namely, that something contingent, which either could or could not be, exists. We might sketch out a version of the argument as follows.

  1. A contingent being (a being such that if it exists, it could have not-existed) exists.
  2. All contingent beings have a fully adequate or complete explanation for their existence.
  3. A contingent being cannot provide an explanation for its own existence.
  4. The fully adequate or complete explanation for the existence of a contingent being must either invoke solely other contingent beings or include a non-contingent (necessary) being.
  5. Contingent beings alone cannot provide the fully adequate or complete explanation for the existence of contingent beings.
  6. Therefore, the fully adequately or complete explanation of the existence of contingent beings must include a non-contingent (necessary) being.
  7. Therefore, a necessary being (a being such that if it exists, it cannot not-exist) exists.
  8. The universe, which is composed only of contingent beings, is contingent.
  9. Therefore, the necessary being is something other than the universe. (For a Thomistic version of this argument, see Siniscalchi 2018: 690–93).

In the argument, steps 1–7 attempt to establish the existence of a necessary (non-contingent) being; steps 8–9 attempt in some way to identify it.

Over the centuries philosophers have suggested various instantiations for the contingent being noted in premise 1. In his Summa Theologica (I,q.2,a.3), Aquinas argued that we need a causal explanation for things in motion, things that are caused, and contingent beings.[1] Others, such as Richard Swinburne (2004), propose that the contingent being referred to in premise 1 is the universe. The connection between the two is supplied by John Duns Scotus, who argued that even if the essentially ordered causes were infinite, “the whole series of effects would be dependent upon some prior cause” (Scotus [c. 1300] 1964: I,D.2,p.1,q.1,§53). Richard Gale (1999) calls this the “Big Conjunctive Contingent Fact”. Whereas the contingency of particular existents is generally undisputed, not the least because of our mortality, the contingency of the universe deserves serious defense (see Section 5.2). Premise 2 invokes a moderate version of the Principle of Sufficient Reason, according to which there must be a fully adequate explanation for any contingent being or event. Applied here, the Principle of Sufficient Reason supports the contention that if something is contingent, there must be a fully adequate reason or explanation why it exists rather than not exists. The point of premise 3 is simply that something cannot explain its own existence, for this would require it to already exist (in a logical if not in a temporal sense). Premise 4 is true by virtue of the Principle of Excluded Middle: what explains the existence of the contingent being either are other solely contingent beings or include a non-contingent (necessary) being. Conclusions 6 and 7 follow validly from the respective premises.

For many critics, premises 2 and 5 hold the key to the argument’s success or failure. The truth of Premise 5 depends upon the requirements for an adequate explanation. Using the Principle of Sufficient Reason (PSR), what is required here is an account in terms of sufficient conditions that provides a fully adequate explanation of why something is, or alternatively, why this particular effect and not another came to be. Swinburne (2004: 75–79), and Alexander Pruss (2006: 16–18) after him, note diverse kinds of explanations. In a full explanation the causal factors—in scientific causation, contemporary or immediately precedent causal conditions and natural laws; in personal causation, persons, their intentions, and supporting causal conditions—are sufficient for the occurrence of an event. They “together necessitate the occurrence of the effect” (Swinburne 2004: 76).

It does not allow a puzzling aspect of the explanandum to disappear: anything puzzling in the explanandum is either also found in the explanans or else explained by the explanans. (Pruss 2006: 17)

It suffices to explain why something comes about given the immediately present causal conditions but leaves unexplained why those explanatory causal conditions and/or reasons themselves hold.

Pruss and Swinburne argue that the kind of explanation required by the PSR is a complete explanation. In a complete explanation, every aspect of the explanandum and explanans at the time of the occurrence is accounted for; nothing puzzling remains.

A complete explanation of the occurrence of E is a full explanation of its occurrence in which all the factors cited are such that there is no [further] explanation (either full or partial) of their existence or operation in terms of factors operative at the time of their existence or operation. (Swinburne 2004: 78)

Quinn argues that an adequate explanation need not require a complete explanation (2005: 584–85); a partial explanation might do just as well, depending on the context. Among these adequate explanations of why this actual world obtains rather than another possible world (including one with no contingent beings) is that the universe is an inexplicable brute fact or that God strongly actualized the world (although not everything in it). He refuses to take sides on the debate between kinds of explanations, except to say that science cannot provide an adequate explanation if the explanatory chain is infinite, for the chain of causes is itself contingent or it ends in an initial contingency not scientifically accountable. However, not only does Quinn not clarify what constitutes an adequate explanation, but as Pruss contends, the PSR “is not compatible with an infinite chain of explanations that has no ultimate explanans” (2006: 17), for in an infinite chain something puzzling remains to be explained, with the result that the PSR would again have to be invoked to explain what is puzzling. However, as we will question below, is the brute fact of the universe any more unacceptable as a complete explanation than the brute fact of a necessary being such as God?

One worry with understanding the PSR in this way is that it may lead to a deterministic account that not only may bode ill for the success of the argument but on a libertarian account may be incompatible with the contention that God created freely. Pruss, however, envisions no such difficulty, for giving reasons neither makes the event deterministic nor removes freedom.

What gives sufficiency to explanation is that mystery is taken away, for example, through the citing of relevant reasons, not that probability is increased…. Once we have said that x freely chose A for R, then the only thing left that is unexplained is why x existed and was both free and attracted by R. (Pruss 2006: 157,158)

One might reply that an explanation needs to be given for why x was attracted to R1 rather than to R2, and that if that explanation is given, x’s choice is not free but determined by the degree to which x is attracted to different reasons. However, Pruss might respond that being “attracted by” is not to be understood in any deterministic sense. One might freely consider an option to be the best without being necessitated to choose it (Loke 2022: 276–77). The debate hinges on how one understands how reasons function in human agency.

Finally, some argue that explanations must be either natural (impersonal) or non-natural (personal). Propositions 8 & 9 assert that if the contingent being identified in 1 is the universe, given that the universe encompasses all natural existents and the laws and principles governing them, the explanation must be in terms of a non-natural, eternal, necessary being that provides an intentional, personal, ultimate explanation. Since the argument proceeds independent of temporal considerations, the argument does not necessarily propose a first cause in time but allows for a first or primary sustaining cause of the universe. As Aquinas noted (1984), the philosophical arguments for God’s existence as first cause are compatible with the eternity of the universe, although he rejects the latter based on divine revelation.

Whether propositions 8 and 9 are an intrinsic part of the cosmological argument is debated. Kant argued that the argument had two parts, the first establishing the existence of an absolutely necessary being; the second part, identifying this being as the most real being (1787:40). For him, without the second part, the concept of a necessary being is empty. The issue achieves significance when the question arises whether the argument has religious significance, that is, whether the necessary being to which the argument concludes is God. We will return to this in Section 10.

Critics have objected to key premises in the argument. We will consider the most important objections and responses.

5.2 Objection 1: The Universe Just Is

Interpreting the contingent being in premise 1 as the universe, Bertrand Russell denies that the universe needs an explanation (premise 2); it just is. Russell, following Hume (1779), contends that since we derive the concept of cause from our observation of particular things, we cannot ask about the cause of something like the universe that we cannot experience. The universe needs no explanation; it is “just there, and that’s all” (Russell 1948 [1964]: 175). This view was reiterated by Stephen Hawking (1987: 651).

Robert Koons takes issue with Russell’s reasoning. We do not need to experience every possible referent of the class of contingent things to be able to conclude that a contingent thing needs a cause or explanation. “To know that a rubber ball dropped on a Tuesday in Waggener Hall by a redheaded tuba player will fall to the ground,” I do not need a sample that includes tuba players dropping rubber balls at this location (Koons 1997: 202). Likewise, we do not need to experience something like the universe having a cause to understand that the universe needs a cause or explanation.

Morriston (2002a: 235) responds that although it is true that we do not need to experience every instance to derive a general principle, the universe is a very different thing from what we experientially reference when we say that things cannot come into existence without a cause. Tuba players are not “anything remotely analogous to the ‘initial singularity’ that figures in the Big Bang theory of the origin of the universe”.

Defenders of the argument from contingency respond that there is a key similarity between the cosmos and its contents, namely, both are contingent, and as such a fully adequate or complete explanation for the existence of the cosmos is necessary. Whether the universe is eternal or not is irrelevant to the contention that as contingent it needs an explanation. Similarly, even if its existence were a brute contingent fact, that it as contingent exists rather than not-exists needs an explanation. (We will say more about the Principle of Sufficient Reason that lies behind this claim in Section 5.4.)

But, one might reply, why should we think that the cosmos is contingent? Defenders of the contingency of the universe contend that if the components of the universe are contingent, the universe itself is contingent. Russell replies that the move from the contingency of the components of the universe to the contingency of the universe commits the Fallacy of Composition, which mistakenly concludes that since the parts have a certain property, the whole likewise has that property. Hence, whereas we legitimately can ask for the cause of particular things, to require a cause of the universe based on the contingency of its parts is mistaken.

Russell correctly notes that arguments of the part-whole type can commit the Fallacy of Composition. For example, the argument that since all the bricks in the wall are small, the wall is small, is fallacious. Yet it is an informal fallacy of content, not a formal fallacy. Sometimes the totality has the same quality as the parts because of the nature of the parts invoked—the wall is brick (composed of baked clay) because it is built of bricks (composed of baked clay). The universe’s contingency, theists argue, resembles the second case. If all the contingent things in the universe, including matter and energy, ceased to exist simultaneously, the universe itself, as the totality of these things, would cease to exist. Thus, if the universe can cease to exist, it is contingent and requires an explanation for its existence (Reichenbach 1972: chap. 5).

(It is worth noting that on the one hand, “universe” can refer to what is spatio-temporally connected to us. On the other hand, “universe” can refer to the totality of contingent beings (Oppy 1999: 384). This argument for the contingency of the universe from its component, contingent parts coalesces these two understandings in the cosmological argument.)

Whether this argument for the contingency of the universe is similar to that advanced by Aquinas in his Third Way depends on how one interprets Aquinas’s argument. Aquinas holds that “if everything can not-be, then at one time there was nothing in existence” (ST I,q.2,a.3). William Rowe (1975: 160–67) argues that what looks like a similar argument in Samuel Clarke for the contingency of the universe is fallacious, for even if every contingent being were to fail to exist in some possible world, it may be the case that there is no possible world that lacks a contingent being (on Aquinas, see Plantinga 1967: 5–6; Kenny 1969: 56–66). That is, although no being would exist in every possible world, every possible world could possess at least one contingent being. In such a case, although each being is contingent, something must exist.

Haldane (Smart and Haldane 1996: 132) defends the cogency of Aquinas’s reasoning on the grounds that Aquinas’s argument is fallacious only on a temporal reading, but Aquinas’s argument employs an atemporal ordering of contingent beings. That is, Aquinas does not hold that over time there would be nothing, but that in the per se ordering of causes, if every contingent thing in that order did not exist, there would be nothing.

Rowe (1975: 166) develops a different argument to support the thesis that the universe must be contingent. He argues that it is necessary that if God exists, then it is possible that no dependent beings exist. Since it is possible that God exists, it is possible that it is possible that no dependent beings exist. (This conclusion is licensed by the modal principle: If it is necessary that if p then q, then if it is possible that p, it is possible that q.) Hence, it is possible that there are no dependent beings; that is, that the universe is contingent. Rowe takes the conditional as necessarily true in virtue of the classical concept of God, according to which God is free to decide whether or not to create dependent beings.

To avoid any hint of the Fallacy of Composition and to avoid its complications, Koons (1997: 198–99) formulates the argument for the contingency of the universe as a mereological argument. If something is contingent, it contains a contingent part. The whole and part overlap and, by virtue of overlapping, have a common part. Since the part in virtue of which they overlap is wholly contingent, the whole likewise must be contingent. (For an assessment of Koons’s overall mereological argument, see Rutten 2012, chap. 3.)

One might approach Russell’s thesis regarding the brute fact of the universe from a different direction. If theists are willing to accept the existence of God as the necessary being as a brute fact, why cannot nontheists accept the existence of the universe as a brute fact, as a necessary being? Bede Rundle, for example, argues that what has necessary existence is causally independent. Matter has necessary existence, for although it undergoes change as manifested in particular bits of matter, the given volume of matter found in the universe persists, and as persisting, matter/energy does not have or need a cause. This accords with the Principle of Conservation of Mass-Energy, according to which matter and energy are never lost but rather transmute into each other. As indestructible, matter/energy is the necessary being. Consequently, although the material components of the universe are contingent vis-à-vis their form, they are necessary vis-à-vis their existence. On this reading, there is not one but there are many necessary beings, all internal to the universe. Their particular configurations are contingent, but since matter/energy is conserved it cannot be created or lost.

Interestingly enough, this approach was anticipated by Aquinas in his third way in his Summa Theologica (I,q.2,a.3). Once Aquinas concludes that necessary beings exist, he then goes on to ask whether these beings have their existence from themselves or from another. If from another, then we have an unsatisfactory infinite regress of explanations. Hence, there must be something whose necessity is from itself. As Kenny points out, Aquinas understands this necessity in terms of being unable to cease to exist (Kenny 1969: 48). Although Aquinas understands the uncaused necessary being to be God, Rundle takes this to be matter/energy itself.

One question that arises with Rundle’s view is whether there could have been more or less matter/energy than there is. That is, if there is n amount of matter/energy in the world, could there be a possible world with +n or -n amounts of matter/energy? We do not know how much matter/energy existed in the first 10-35 seconds of the universe. Even if the universe currently operates according to the principle of the Conservation of Matter and Energy, Rundle’s thesis depends on the contention that during the very early phase of rapid expansion, a period of time we know little about, this principle held. A second significant problem concerns what follows from the existence of necessary beings. If the matter/energy nexus constitutes the necessary being, what causally follows from that nexus is itself necessary, and contingency, even in the composing relations within the universe, would disappear. Everything in the universe would be necessary, which is a disquieting position. Third, O’Connor (2004) argues that since the necessary being provides the ultimate explanation, there is no explanation of the differentiation of the kinds of matter or of contingencies that matter/energy causally undergo, for example, in terms of space-time location.

We will return to the question of the contingency of the universe below.

5.3 Objection 2: Explaining the Individual Constituents Is Sufficient

Whereas Russell argued that the universe just is, David Hume held that when the parts are explained the whole is explained.

But the whole, you say, wants a cause. I answer that the uniting of these parts into a whole…is performed merely by an arbitrary act of the mind, and has no influence on the nature of things. Did I show you the particular causes of each individual in a collection of twenty particles of matter, I should think it very unreasonable should you afterwards ask me what was the cause of the whole twenty. This is sufficiently explained in explaining the parts. (Hume 1779: part 9)

Hume contends that uniting the parts or individual constituents into a whole is a mental act. In reality, only individual, causally-related events exist, not whole sets of events. When we have provided an account of each of these individual, causally-related events we have explained the whole. We need nothing more.

Rowe objects to what he terms the Hume-Edwards Principle (HEP, named after David Hume and Paul Edwards)—that by explaining the parts we have explained the whole.

When the existence of each member of a collection is explained by reference to some other member of that very same collection, then it does not follow that the collection itself has an explanation. For it is one thing for there to be an explanation of the existence of each dependent being and quite another thing for there to be an explanation of why there are dependent beings at all. (Rowe 1975: 264)

Pruss (1999) expands on Rowe’s argument. An explanation of the parts may provide a partial but not a complete explanation. The explanation in terms of parts may fail to explain why these parts exist rather than others, why they exist rather than not, or why the parts are arranged as they are. Each member or part will be explained either in terms of itself or in terms of something else that is contingent. The former would make them necessary, not contingent, beings. If they are explained in terms of something else, they still remain unaccounted for, since the explanation would invoke either an infinite regress of causes or a circular explanation. Pruss employs the chicken/egg sequence: chickens account for eggs, which account for chickens, and so on where the two are paired. However, appealing to an infinite chicken/egg regress or else arguing in a circle explains neither any given chicken nor egg. (Pruss and Rasmussen 2018: 45)

Thomas Oberle defends the Hume-Edwards Principle (that in fully grounding each fact, the plurality of facts is explained) against the charge that it is circular. Oberle takes the plurality of contingent facts to be explained in the cosmological argument as “neither the conjunction nor set of all contingent facts, nor the existentially quantified fact there are contingent facts” (2024: 1419). Understanding this plurality to be distributive rather than collective, each individual member of the plurality is explained by or grounded in other individual, contingent members, so that according to HEP, if each of the contingent facts is explained by or grounded in other contingent facts, even to infinity, then the plurality of contingent facts is explained. Oberle contends that the need for a collective understanding of grounding is unsupported. Thus, since the contingent fact to be explained is not included in its explanation, invoking HEP in an infinite series of explanations is not circular.

Even if invoking HEP is not circular, the question remains whether an infinite series of contingencies can provide a fully sufficient reason for the existence of contingent facts either distributively or collectively. Richard Swinburne notes that an explanation is complete when “any attempt to go beyond the factors which we have would result in no gain of explanatory power or prior probability” (2004: 89). Contingent grounds are incomplete to fully explain why something exists rather than something else or than nothing and why it is as it is. Appeal to the non-contingent gives additional explanatory power. Gale (1991: 257–58) concludes that if we are to explain the parts of the universe and their specific concatenation, we must appeal to something other than those parts. Oberle responds that this again invokes a collective understanding of grounding, for which he finds no motivation. However, this reply still leaves open the Swinburne/Pruss demand for a complete explanation or grounding of particular contingent beings.

To avoid the Hume-Edwards objection, Rutten constructs a cosmological argument around the notion that the sum of all caused simple objects is an object that has an uncaused cause “whose effect is ontologically prior to every other caused object” (2012: 124). Put roughly, Rutten argues that “the sum of all caused simple objects, if not empty, is an object” (132). The cosmos (which includes all universes) is composed of simple objects (atomism) and hence is a composite object. Every object is either caused or is the cause of other objects, or both (what he terms causalism, which he understands as part of the fabric of the world, where everything is causally intertwined). Rutten understands causation as a relation between objects, not between events or states of affairs. Since the cosmos as an object contains a caused proper part, it is caused (brought into existence). The cause cannot be part of the composite object, otherwise the composite object would not be disjoint from its cause and would have to cause itself to exist. Thus, there is an uncaused object that is the cause of the cosmos. His contention is that if one grants his atomism and causalism, then “one cannot reasonably be both an atomist and a causalist, while at the same time deny that there is a first [uncaused] cause” (123).

Rutten has a very expansive notion of “object”. It includes not only abstract mathematical objects, concepts, and propositions (22), but e.g., space-time and the structure of the objects (150–54), a point he addresses (168–69). Further, by invoking a causal relation holding between objects, whether concrete or abstract, Rutten invokes a version of the Principle of Causation, to which we now turn.

5.4 Objection 3: The Principles of Causation and Sufficient Reason Are Suspect

Critics of the cosmological argument contend that the Causal Principle or, where applicable, the broader Principle of Sufficient Reason (PSR) that underlies versions of the argument, is suspect. As Hume argued, there is no reason for thinking that the Causal Principle is true a priori, for we can conceive of events occurring without conceiving of their being caused, and what is conceivable is possible in reality (1748: IV). Neither can an argument for the application of the Causal Principle to the universe be drawn from inductive experience. Even if the Causal Principle applies to events in the world, we cannot extrapolate from the way the world works to the world as a whole (Mackie 1982: 85; Kant 1787: B638).

Several replies are in order. First, Hume’s conceivability to possibility argument is unsound. For one thing, whose conceivability is being appealed to here? For another, someone who fails to understand a necessarily true proposition might conceive of it being false, but from this it does not follow that it possibly is false. A person might think (wrongly) that pi is a determinate number, but it does not follow that it is so. In the phenomenology of conceivability, what is really conceivable is difficult if not impossible to differentiate from what some might think is conceivable. And even if something is conceivable, say in a logical sense, it does not follow that it is factually possible. One might conceive that, since heads can be distinguished from tails on a coin, they can actually be separated, but factually such is impossible. What is distinguishable is not necessarily separable. Hume, it seems, confuses epistemic with ontological conditions. Hence, the argument based on conceivability is suspect (Reichenbach 1972: 57–60).

Second, some suggest a pragmatic-type argument to show that the Causal and Sufficient Reason principles are true, namely that the principles are necessary to make the universe intelligible. Without such principles, Pruss argues, science itself would be undercut. “Claiming to be a brute fact should be a last resort. It would undercut the practice of science” (Pruss 2006: 255). Utilization of the principles best accounts for the success of science, indeed, for any investigatory endeavor (Koons 1997; see also Koons 2008: 111–12, where he argues that it is “a subjectively required presumption needed for immunity to internal defeaters”). The best explanation of the success of science and other such rational endeavors is that the principles really indicate how reality operates.

Shaun Nichols and Justin Steinberg conducted experiments to determine whether people believed that the PSR was necessary. They concluded that the principle could be defended on the ground that people “presuppose something like the PSR in their explanatory outlook” and “this might provide grounds for thinking that the cosmological argument is indeed intuitive” (Nichols 2025: S24).

Critics reply that the principles justified pragmatically only have methodological or practical and not ontological justification. As John Mackie argues, we have no right to assume that the universe complies with our intellectual preferences for causal order. We can simply work with brute facts; beginning with them, science would work just as well.

In defense of the PSR, Pruss goes further to suggest that the PSR is “self-evident, obvious, intuitively clear, in no need of argumentative support” (2006: 189). For example, he holds that the Principle of Sufficient Reason—“necessarily, every contingently true proposition has an explanation” (he defers on whether the principle also applies to necessarily true propositions)—is self-evident in the sense that anyone who understands it correctly understands that it is true. These persons might not know it to be self-evidently true, but they do understand it to be true. This is consistent with other persons denying that it is self-evident, for those who deny it might misunderstand the principle in various ways.

The problem with the claim of self-evidence is that it is a conversation ender, not a starter. One who denies its self-evidence might think that those who hold to the principle are the ones who experience conceptual blindness. In contrast to analyticity, self-evidence holds in relation to the knowers themselves, and here intuitions vary, perhaps according to philosophical or other types of perspectives. Furthermore, if the principle truly is self-evident, it would be strange to respond to skeptics by attempting to give arguments to support that contention, and were such demanded, the request would itself invoke the very principle in question.

Pruss responds that being self-evident is not incompatible with providing arguments for self-evident propositions, and he thinks that arguments can show the truth of the PSR to those who deny its self-evidence. Among the numerous arguments that he advances is a modal argument employing a Weak Principle of Sufficient Reason, according to which “every contingent proposition possibly has a complete explanation” (Pruss 2006:234–35). Since “reason” has two senses, explanation and evidence, one might ask for reasons for or evidence of the truth of the Principle of Sufficient Reason without invoking the Principle. (See the introduction to the entry on the principle of sufficient reason).

Peter van Inwagen (1983: 202–04) argues that the PSR must be rejected. If the PSR is true, every contingent proposition has an explanation. Suppose P is the conjunction of all contingent true propositions. Suppose also that there is a state of affairs S that provides a sufficient reason for P. S cannot itself be contingent, for then it would be a conjunct of P and entailed by P, and as both entailing and entailed by P would be P, so that it would be its own sufficient reason. However, no contingent proposition can explain itself. Neither can S be necessary, for from necessary propositions only necessary propositions follow. Necessary propositions cannot explain contingent propositions, for if x sufficiently explains y, then x entails y, and if x is necessary so is y. So, S cannot be either contingent or necessary, and hence the PSR is false. Thus, if the cosmological argument appeals to the PSR to establish the existence of a necessary being whose existence is expressed by a necessary proposition as an explanation for contingent beings, it fails in that it cannot account for the contingent beings it purportedly explains.

However, as Pruss notes (2006: chaps. 6 & 7), “The word sufficient can be read in two different ways: the reason given can be logically sufficient for the explanandum, or it can sufficiently explain the explanandum” (2006: 103). According to Pruss, we need not hold to the strong claim of logical sufficiency about the relation between explaining and entailment in cases where the explanation is brought about by libertarian free agency. Although God is a necessary being, his connection with the world is through his free agency, and free actions explain but do not entail the existence of particular contingent states.

Clearly, the soundness of the deductive version of the cosmological argument hinges on whether principles like that of Causation or Sufficient Reason are more than methodologically true and on the extent to which these principles can be applied to things, events, or facts. Critics of the argument will be skeptical regarding the universal application of the principles; defenders of the argument generally not so, at least as limited to contingencies. Perhaps the best one can say, with Taylor, is that even those who critique the PSR (understood broadly that every contingent thing, event, or fact must have a sufficient cause, reason, or ground) invoke it when they suggest that defenders of the principle have failed to provide a sufficient reason for thinking it is true.

The principle of sufficient reason can be illustrated in various ways,…but it cannot be proved…. If one were to try proving it, he would sooner or later have to appeal to considerations that are less plausible than the principle itself. Indeed, it is hard to see how one could even make an argument for it without already assuming it. For this reason it might properly be called a presupposition of reason itself. (Taylor 1992: 87)

Finally, critics have argued that an argument for the application of the Causal Principle to the universe cannot be drawn from inductive experience. Even if the Causal Principle applies to events in the world, we cannot extrapolate from the way the world works to the world as a whole (Mackie 1982: 85). The type of causation we experience in the empirical world is different from the kind of causation proposed to hold between a necessary being and the cosmos (Kant 1787: B638). We have already addressed this objection in Section 5.2).

We will return to the Principle of Causation below in Section 8 with respect to the kalām argument.

5.5 Objection 4: Problems with the Concept of a Necessary Being

Kant argued that the cosmological argument introduced an empirical premise to evade the difficulties of the ontological argument. Although in the ontological argument the perfect being is allegedly determined to exist through its own concept, in fact nothing can be determined to exist in this manner; one has to begin with existence (see the entry on ontological arguments). The cosmological argument, on the other hand, proceeds from an empirical premise about my existence to the existence of an unconditioned, absolutely necessary being, a being whose nonexistence is “impossible”, “absolutely inconceivable” (1787: B621). The cosmological argument has two parts. The first is a posteriori: “If anything exists, an absolutely necessary being exists. Now I, at least exist. Therefore, an absolutely necessary being exists” (B632). But since the concept of a necessary being is indeterminate, a second part that determines the necessary being is required. This concept has the same status as geometrical concepts, which though necessary do not establish the existence of anything corresponding to the concept. What this absolutely necessary being is, what properties it has, can be determined not through experience but only through reason, that is, from a priori concepts alone. Since the only concept that suffices to determine its properties is that of a most real being, the concept of an absolutely necessary being presupposes and can be derived from that concept, for the two are logically equivalent. However, that the most real being necessarily exists is the burden of the ontological argument. Hence, Kant concludes, the cosmological argument depends on the ontological argument to determine the absolutely necessary being. But since the ontological argument is defective for the above and other reasons, the cosmological argument that depends on or invokes it likewise must be defective (1787: B634–35; for an alternative interpretation of Kant’s argument see Proops 2014). For Kant, the cosmological argument rests on dialectical mischievery.

Kant’s contention that the cosmological argument depends on or presupposes the ontological argument fails for several reasons. First, the existence of the necessary being is already established in the first part of the cosmological argument (Smart 1955: 37). The second part of his argument attends to identifying the necessary being, but in contrast to the ontological argument it does not establish its existence. Second, Kant presumes that the necessity predicated of the being in the cosmological argument is what he terms “absolute necessity”, that is, necessity such that what exists cannot not-exist (B632). However, as we will argue shortly, the cosmological argument need not invoke absolute or logical necessity but rather factual necessity. Hence, the cosmological argument does not rely on the ontological proof.

Kant’s view that the necessity found in “necessary being” is logical necessity was common up through the 1960s. J.J.C. Smart wrote,

And by “a necessary being” the cosmological argument means “a logically necessary being”, i.e., “a being whose non-existence is inconceivable in the sort of way that a triangle’s having four sides is inconceivable”.… Now since “necessary” is a word which applies primarily to propositions, we shall have to interpret “God is a necessary being” as “The proposition ‘God exists’ is logically necessary” (1955: 38). [In a later work, Smart broadened his notion of necessity (Smart and Haldane 1996: 41–47).]

It is true that many recent discussions of the cosmological argument, both supporting and critiquing it, interpret the notion of a necessary being as a being that cannot not exist. For example, Gale-Pruss contend that speaking about necessary beings does not differ from speaking of the necessity of propositions (see Section 7). O’Connor writes more subtly that God is absolutely necessary, by which he means that God is “absolutely invulnerable to nonexistence” (2008: 70).

The concept of a necessary being is of one that could not have failed to exist, absolutely speaking. For such a being to be possible, it must be such that it would exist in every possible circumstance, including the actual one. That’s precisely why the question of its existence cannot arise, thereby ending the regress of explanation nonarbitrarily. (O’Connor 2013: 42)

For O’Connor necessary existence is necessarily tied up with a specific nature (otherwise the existence would be contingent) but not derivative from it; God’s existence entails his nature (2008: 88). God’s necessity is not logical (for there is no contradiction in denying that such a being exists) but made possible on explanatory grounds (the cosmological argument). However, we might inquire, if God could not have failed to exist, how does an absolutely necessary being differ from a logically necessary being? O’Connor goes on to argue that God’s absolute necessity does not invoke the ontological argument. He agrees that by modal Axiom S5, if it is possible that a necessary being exists, it necessarily exists, but denies that this invokes the ontological argument, since it “gives no reason to think that the nature in question is genuinely possible and not merely logically consistent” (2008: 71). On the other hand, Gale admits that, given this view of necessity and S5, the ontological argument works although we don’t know how to properly construct it (Gale and Pruss 1999: 462). It would seem that if we understand “necessary being” in this sense, we can dispose of the cosmological argument as irrelevant; rather what is needed is an argument to establish that God’s existence understood as logically necessary is possible.

However, this need not be the sense in which “necessary being” is understood in the cosmological argument. A more adequate notion of necessary being is that the necessity is factual: “sheer, ultimate, unconditioned reality, without beginning or end” (Hick 1960: 730). A factually necessary being is one that if it exists, it neither came into existence nor can cease to exist, and correspondingly, if it does not exist, it cannot come into existence (Reichenbach 1972: 117–20). If the necessary being exists at any time, then necessarily it exists at all times; nothing can bring it into existence or cause it to cease to exist (Swinburne, 2004: 249, 266). It is self-sufficient and self-sustaining. As Hick states, God’s necessity refers to God’s aseity in that God does not depend on anything else for his existence.

God is not one fact amongst others, but is related asymmetrically to all other facts as that which determines them. This is the ultimate given circumstance, which it is not possible to go with either question or explanation. For to explain something means either to assign a cause to it or to show its place within some wider context in relation to which it is no longer puzzling to us. However, the idea of the self-existent Creator of everything other than himself is the idea of a reality which is beyond the scope of these explanatory procedures. (Hick 1960: 733–34)

Mackie replies that if God has mere factual necessity, God’s existence is logically contingent, such that some reason is required for God’s own existence (Mackie 1982: 84). That is, we can ask the question, Why, then, does God exist? In the same vein, O’Connor objects that if the necessary being is logically contingent, it just happens to exist (2008: 70; see White (1979) for further objections). As such, the PSR can be applied to the necessary being.

Some theists, like Swinburne, agree that God, though factually necessary, is a logically contingent being and so could have not-existed (2004: 79, 148). However, this poses no problem, for the PSR addresses factual, not logical, contingency. And one is not required to find a reason for what is factually not contingent. It is not that the necessary being is self-explanatory; rather, a demand for explaining its existence is inappropriate. Hence, the theist concludes, Hawking’s question “Who created God?” (Hawking 1988: 174) is out of place (Davis 1997). As Hick points out, if “just happens to exist” is the opposite of necessarily (in the sense of logical necessity) exists, if the latter is meaningless, so is the former (Hick 1960: 731).

But if God’s existence is contingent, would there not be a possible world in which God does not exist? Yes, but it does not follow that anything else would exist in that world either. If God has ultimate causal power, such that nothing can exist without God’s causal activity, then a possible world where God did not exist would not have any existents at all (Senor 2010: 279).

6. Argument from a Strong Principle of Sufficient Reason

Discussion of Michael Almeida’s (2018) argument from a strong Principle of Sufficient Reason can be found in the supplement: Argument from a Strong Principle of Sufficient Reason.

7. Argument from a Weak Principle of Sufficient Reason

Richard Gale and Alexander Pruss (1999) advanced a modal version of the cosmological argument. They reject the strong version of the PSR, according to which “for every proposition p, if p is true, then there is a proposition, q, that explains p”. In its place they favor using a weak version of the PSR—it is possible that for every true proposition, there is a proposition, q, that explains p—that they believe is less question-begging and more initially acceptable to critics. They phrase the argument in terms of contingent and necessary propositions. A contingent proposition is one that is both possibly true and possibly false (i.e., true in some possible worlds and false in others); a necessarily true proposition is true in every possible world. In its simplest form, the argument is (1) if it is possible that it is necessary that a supernatural being of some sort exists, then it is necessary that a supernatural being of that sort exists. Since (2) it is possible that it is necessary that a supernatural being of some sort exists, (3) it is necessary that this being exists. The being that Gale has in mind is a very powerful and intelligent designer-creator, not the all-perfect God of Anselm, for this perfect God who would exist in all possible worlds would be incompatible with the existence of gratuitous and horrendous evils to be found in some of those possible worlds.

If one grants modal Axiom S5 (if it is possible that it is necessary that p, then it is necessary that p), the critical premise in the argument is the second, and Gale and Pruss proceed to defend it using their weak PSR. They begin with the notion of a Big Conjunctive Fact (BCF), which is the totality of propositions that would be true of any possible world were it actualized. Since all possible worlds would have the same necessary propositions, they are differentiated by their Big Conjunctive Contingent Fact (BCCF), which would contain different contingent propositions. Let p be the BCCF of the actual world W. Suppose, further, that it is possible that p has an explanation, that is, that it is possible that some proposition q explains p. As such, there is a possible world W1 that contains p, q, and the proposition that q explains p. The question now is whether W1 is the actual world, that is, whether there is a proposition q that explains p in the actual world. Gale argues that W1 (which contains q and the proposition that q explains p) is the actual world, for since W1 contains p, there can be no property of p that is not found in W1. Every conjunct of p will be a conjunct of p1 (the BCCF of W1) in W1. Suppose that r is a conjunct of p in W, then not-r cannot be a conjunct of p1 in W1. Since W and W1 have the same properties, W1 is the actual world. Therefore, since these worlds are identical, the actual world contains p, q, and the proposition that q explains p. That is, there is something that explains the BCCF of the actual world. The explanation of the BCCF cannot be scientific, for such would be in terms of law-like propositions and statements about the actual world at a given time, which would be contingent and hence part of the BCCF. Since the only explanations we can conceive of are personal or scientific, q provides a personal explanation of the BCCF in terms of the intentional action of a necessary being who freely brings it about that the world exists. q cannot report the action of a contingent being, for then the being would be part of p and explained by q. However, something cannot explain itself. Hence, although contingent, q reports the action of a necessary being. Gale concludes that although this necessary being exists in every possible world, this tells little about its power, goodness, and other qualities. To make this being palatable to theists, he offers that the argument be supplemented by other arguments, such as the teleological arguments, to suggest that the necessary being is the kind of being that satisfies theistic requirements. Since

the actual world’s universe displays a wondrous complexity due to its law-like unity and simplicity, fine tuning of natural constants, and natural purpose and beauty,…there exists a necessary supernatural being who is very powerful, intelligent, and good and freely creates the actual world’s universe. (1999: 468–69)

(For the detailed 18-step deductive argument, see Gale and Pruss 1999: 462–69.)

Several objections have been raised about the argument from the weak principle of sufficient reason. Almeida and Judisch (2002) construct their objection via two reductio arguments. They note that, according to Gale’s argument, q is a contingent proposition in the actual world that reports the free, intentional action of a necessary being. As such, since the actual world contains the contingent proposition q, non-q is possible. That is, there is a possible world W2 that contains p, non-q, and the proposition that q does not explain p. However, by Gale’s own reasoning, W2 is identical to the actual world. But the actual world cannot contain both q and non-q. Thus, q cannot be a contingent proposition.

On the other hand, assume that q is a contingently necessary proposition, that is, that it is possible that q is necessary and possible that q is not necessary. By Axiom S5, we get that it is necessary that q is necessary, making it impossible that q is not necessary. As a result, it is both possible and not-possible that q is not necessary, which likewise shows that q cannot be a contingently necessary proposition. The only other option is that q is a necessary truth, which would beg the question. Thus, the argument fails by being unable to characterize q. For rebuttals, see Gale and Pruss (2002) and Rutten (2012: 84–87, see Other Internet Resources).

Graham Oppy (2000) similarly argues that suppose p1 is the BCF of some possible world, and p1 has no explanation. Then, given r (namely, that p1 has no explanation) there is a conjunctive fact p1 and r. Since by hypothesis the conjunctive fact p1 and r is true in some world, on Gale’s account it is true in the actual world. Then by the weak PSR there is a world in which this conjunction of p1 and r possibly has an explanation. If there is an explanation for the conjunction of p1 and r, there is an explanation for p1. Thus, we have the contradiction that p1 both has and does not have an explanation, which is absurd. Hence, no world exists where the BCF lacks an explanation, which is the strong principle of sufficient reason that Gale allegedly circumvented. Since accepting the weak PSR would commit the nontheist to the strong PSR and ultimately to a necessary being, the nontheist has no motivation to accept the weak PSR.

Gale and Pruss (2002) subsequently conceded that their weak PSR does entail the strong PSR, but they contend that there still is no reason not to proceed with the weak PSR, which they think the nontheist would accept. The only grounds for rejecting it, they claim, is that it leads to a theistic conclusion, which is not an independent reason for rejecting it. Oppy, however, maintains that appealing to some initial instincts of acceptance is irrelevant. Perhaps the nontheists did not see what granting the weak PSR entailed, that it contradicted other things they had independent reasons to believe, or they did not fully understand the principle. There is a modus tollens reason to reject it, since there are other grounds for thinking that theism is false.

Jerome Gellman argued that the Gale/Pruss conclusion to a being that is not necessarily omnipotent also fails; this being is essentially omnipotent and, if omnipotence entails omniscience, is essentially omniscient. This too Gale and Pruss concede, which means that the necessary being they conclude to is not significantly different from that arrived at by the traditional cosmological argument that appeals to the moderate version of the PSR (that contingent beings need a sufficient reason or explanation for their existence).

8. The Kalām Cosmological Argument

A second type of cosmological argument, contending for a first or beginning cause of the universe, has a venerable history, especially in the Islamic mutakalliman tradition. Although it had numerous defenders through the centuries, it received new life in the recent voluminous writings of William Lane Craig. Craig formulates the kalām cosmological argument this way (Craig and Sinclair 2009; Craig and Smith 1993: chap. 1).

  1. Everything that begins to exist has a cause of its existence.
  2. The universe began to exist.
  3. Therefore, the universe has a cause of its existence.
  4. No scientific explanation (in terms of physical laws and initial conditions of the universe) can provide a causal account of the origin (very beginning) of the universe, since such are part of the universe.
  5. Therefore, the cause must be personal (explanation is given in terms of a non-natural, personal agent).[2]

The kalām argument has been the subject of much recent debate, only some of which can be summarized here. (For greater bibliographic detail, see Craig and Sinclair 2009 and Copan and Craig, eds. 2017 & 2019.)

8.1 The Causal Principle and Quantum Physics

The argument’s first premise is a version of the Causal Principle. Some defenders and critics alike suggest that basing the argument on the Principle of Causation rather than on the more general Principle of Sufficient Reason, as above, is advantageous to the argument, since the causal principle is narrower than the PSR (Morriston 2000: 149).

Craig holds that the first premise is intuitively obvious; no one, he says, seriously denies it (Craig, in Craig and Smith 1993: 57). Although at times Craig suggests that one might treat the principle as an empirical generalization based on our ordinary and scientific experiences (which might not be strong enough for the argument to succeed in a strong sense, although it might be supplemented by an inference to the best explanation argument that what best explains the success of science is that reality operates according to the causal principle), ultimately, he argues, the truth of the Causal Principle rests “upon the metaphysical intuition that something cannot come out of nothing” (Craig, in Craig and Smith 1993: 147). “No one sincerely believes that things, say, a horse or an Eskimo village, can just pop into being without a cause” (Craig and Sinclair 2009: 182). This includes the universe. If universes can come into existence without a cause, then there is no reason to think that other things cannot do likewise. Since nothing has no properties, anything could spring into existence out of nothing. But we simply do not encounter things in everyday experience coming into existence without a cause or from nothing (Craig and Sinclair 2009: 186).

Some critics do not share Craig’s intuitions about the Causal Principle (e.g., Oppy 2002a). Morriston (2000) argues that, for one thing, it does not seem to be an a priori truth, for not only does it lack “a kind of ‘luminosity’ that makes it impossible not to believe it, but closer inspection does not make it clearer that it is true” (2000: 156–59). For another, any appeal to a principle like ex nihilo nihil fit is either tautologous with the first premise or else appears mistakenly to treat nihilo as if it were “a condition of something” (Malpass 2023). It is not that premise 1 is false; it is just that it is neither intuitive nor supported and hence loses its plausibility.

Morriston thinks that premise 1 fares equally poorly if Craig attempts to justify it empirically, for we have many situations where the causes of events have not been discovered, and even if we could find the causes in each individual case, it provides no evidence that causation applies to the totality of cases (the universe). (See our discussion of this argument in Section 5.2 and Section 5.3 above.) Indeed, he argues, the inductive generalization involved in defending the causal principle stands at odds with similar inductive generalizations that conflict with the kalām argument—that something can be made without there being a prior stuff or that causes can bear no temporal relation to their effects.

Morriston points not only to the presence of serious doubters (which he thinks he should not be able to find were it truly an a priori truth), but also to quantum phenomena, and thereby joins those who raise objections to the Causal Principle based on quantum physics (Davies 1984: 200).

On the quantum level, the connection between cause and effect, if not entirely broken, is to some extent loosened. For example, it appears that electrons can pass out of existence at one point and come back into existence elsewhere. One can neither trace their intermediate existence nor determine what causes them to come into existence at one point rather than another. Neither can one precisely determine or predict where they will reappear; their subsequent location is only statistically probable given what we know about their antecedent states. Hence, as Smith argues,

quantum-mechanical considerations show that the causal proposition is limited in its application, if applicable at all, and consequently that a probabilistic argument for a cause of the Big Bang cannot go through. (Smith, in Craig and Smith 1993: 121–23, 182)

Craig responds that appeals to quantum phenomena do not affect the kalām argument. For one thing, quantum events are not completely devoid of causal conditions. Even if one grants that the causal conditions are not jointly sufficient to determine the event, at least some necessary conditions are involved in the quantum event. However, when one considers the beginning of the universe, he notes, there are no prior necessary causal conditions; simply nothing exists (Craig, in Craig and Smith 1993: 146; see Koons 1997: 203). Pruss (2006: 169) contends that in quantum phenomena causal indeterminacy is compatible with the causal principle in that the causes indeterministically bring about the effect.

Morriston is rightly puzzled by Craig’s reply, for, he asks, what

makes a cause out of a bunch of merely necessary conditions. Apparently not that they are jointly sufficient to produce the effect. (2000: 158)

If conditions are not jointly sufficient, is there reason to think that premise 1 is true?

More recently, Craig argues that:

not all physicists agree that subatomic events are uncaused…. Indeed, most of the available interpretations of the mathematical formulation of [Quantum Mechanics] are fully deterministic. Craig and Sinclair 2009: 183.[3]

Elsewhere, Craig argues that a difference exists between predictability and causality. It is true that, given Heisenberg’s principle of uncertainty, we cannot precisely predict individual subatomic events. What is debated is whether this inability to predict is due to the absence of sufficient causal conditions, or whether it is merely a result of the fact that any attempt to precisely measure these events alters their status. The very introduction of the observer into the arena so affects what is observed that it gives the appearance that effects occur without sufficient or determining causes. However, we have no way of knowing what is happening without introducing observers into the situation and the changes they bring. In the above example, we simply are unable to discern the intermediate states of the electron’s existence apart from introducing conditions of observation. When Heisenberg’s indeterminacy is understood as describing not simply the events themselves but these events relative to our knowledge of the events, the Causal Principle can still hold and be applied to the initial singularity, although we cannot expect to achieve any kind of determinate predictability about what occurs in specific cases on the sub-atomic level given the cause.

At the same time, it should be recognized that showing that indeterminacy is a real feature of the world at the quantum level would have significant negative implications for the more general Causal Principle that underlies the deductive cosmological argument. The more this indeterminacy has ontological significance, the weaker is the Causal Principle. This is particularly important for subatomic events, which would characterize the beginning of the universe. However, if the indeterminacy has merely epistemic significance, it scarcely affects the Causal Principle. Quantum accounts allow for additional speculation regarding origins and structures of universes. In effect, whether Craig’s response to the quantum objection succeeds depends upon deeper issues, in particular, the epistemic and ontological status of quantum indeterminacy, the nature of the Big Bang as a quantum phenomenon, the nature and role of indeterminate causation, and whether realist theories about quantum phenomena have serious traction. Quantum physics is murky, as evidenced by Bell’s gedanken experiments, as described by Mermin (1985).

8.2 Impossibility of an Actual Infinite

In defense of premise 2, Craig develops both a priori and a posteriori arguments. His primary a priori argument is

  1. An actual infinite cannot exist.
  2. A beginningless temporal series of events is an actual infinite.
  3. Therefore, a beginningless temporal series of events cannot exist.

Since conclusion 8 follows validly, if premises 6 and 7 are true, the argument is sound. In defense of premise 6, he defines an actual infinite as a determinate totality that occurs when a part of a system can be put into a one-to-one correspondence with the entire system (Craig and Sinclair 2009: 104). Craig argues that if actual infinites that neither increase nor decrease in the number of members they contain really were to exist, absurd consequences would result. For example, imagine a library with an actually infinite number of books. Suppose that the library also contains an infinite number of red and an infinite number of black books, so that for every red book there is a black book, and vice versa. It follows that the library contains as many red books as the total books in its collection and as many red books as red and black books combined. However, this is absurd; in reality the subset cannot be equivalent to the entire set. Likewise, in a real library by removing a certain number of books we reduce the overall collection. However, if infinites are actual, a library with an infinite number of books would not be reduced in size at all by removal of any number of books (short of all of them) (Craig and Smith 1993: 11–16). The absurdities resulting from attempting to apply basic arithmetical operations, functional in the real world, to infinites suggest that although actual infinites can have an ideal existence, they cannot really exist.

Craig’s point is this. Two sets A and B are the same size just in case they can be put into one-to-one correspondence, that is, if and only if every member of A can be correlated with exactly one member of B in such a way that no member of B is left out. In the case of infinite sets, this notion of “same size” yields results like the following: the set of all natural numbers (let this be A) is the same size as the set of squares of natural numbers (B), since every member of A can be correlated with exactly one member of B in a way that leaves out no member of B (correlate 0 ↔ 0, 1↔ 1, 2 ↔ 4, 3↔ 9, 4 ↔16, …). This is a case—recognized in fact as early as Galileo (Dialogues Concerning Two New Sciences)—where two infinite sets have the same size but, intuitively, one of them, as a proper subset, appears to be smaller than the other.

Craig uses a similar, intuitive notion of “smaller than” in his argument concerning the library. It appears that the set B of red books in the library is smaller than the set A of all the books in the library, even though both have the same (infinite) size. Craig concludes that it is absurd to suppose that such a library is possible in actuality, since the set of red books would simultaneously have to be smaller than the set of all books and yet equal in size.

Critics fail to be convinced by these paradoxes of infinity. For example, Rundle (2004: 170) agrees with Craig that the concept of an actual infinite is paradoxical, but this, he argues, provides no grounds for thinking it is incoherent. The logical problems with the actual infinite are not problems of incoherence but arise from the features that are characteristic of infinite sets. When the intuitive notion of “smaller than” is replaced by a precise definition, finite sets and infinite sets just behave somewhat differently, that is all. Cantor and all subsequent set theorists define a set B to be smaller than set A (i.e., has fewer members) just in case B is the same size as a subset of A, but A is not the same size as any subset of B. The application of this definition to finite and infinite sets yields results that Craig finds counter-intuitive but which mathematicians see as our best understanding for comparing the size of sets. They see the fact that an infinite set can be put into one-to-one correspondence with one of its own proper subsets as one of the defining characteristics of an infinite set, not an absurdity. Say that set C is a proper subset of A just in case every element of C is an element of A while A has some element that is not an element of C. In finite sets, but not necessarily in infinite sets, when set B is a proper subset of A, B is smaller than A. However, this does not necessarily hold for infinite sets—as above where B is the set of squares of natural numbers and A is the set of all natural numbers. The proper subset B might be “smaller” than A. What is crucial is that B is not smaller in the sense of having a smaller number of members than A (i.e., a smaller cardinality).

Cantorian mathematicians argue that these results apply to any infinite set, whether in pure mathematics, imaginary libraries, or the real world series of concrete events. Thus, Smith argues that Craig begs the question by wrongly presuming that an intuitive relationship that holds between finite sets and their proper subsets (namely, that a set has more members than its proper subsets), must hold in the case of infinite sets (Smith, in Craig and Smith 1993: 85). So, while Craig thinks that Cantor’s set theoretic definitions yield absurdities when applied to the world of concrete objects, which entails that infinites cannot be actual, set theorists see no problem so long as the proper definitions are maintained. Further discussion is in Oppy 2006: 137–54.

Loke (2017: 55–61; see Craig and Sinclair, 2009: 105–06) replies to the above objections by arguing that what is mathematically possible is not always factually possible. For example, the quadratic equation x2=4) can have two mathematically consistent results for x: 2 or −2, but if the question is “how many people carried the box home”, the answer cannot be −2, for in the concrete world it is factually impossible that −2 people carry a box home. Thus, the conclusion of 2 people rather than −2 people derives not from mathematical equations alone but also from factual considerations. Loke proceeds to argue that concrete infinities violate factually necessary truths concerning causal powers.

Turning to premise 7, why should one think that it is true that a beginningless series, such as the universe up to this point, is an actual rather than a potential infinite? For Craig, an actual infinite is a determinate totality, whereas the potential infinite is not. Since past events can be conceptually collected together and numbered, the series of past events is a determinate totality (1979: 96–97). If the past is beginningless, it is infinite, and thus as determinate would be an actual infinite. If the universe has a starting point, so that events are added to or subtracted from this point, it would be indeterminate, and we would have a potential infinite that increased through time by adding new members.

Bede Rundle rejects that the past is an actual infinite on the grounds that the past and the future are symmetrical. It is not that the past is real and the future is not, for only the present is real. It is only our knowledge of the past and future that is asymmetrical. Any future event lies at a finite temporal distance from the present. Similarly, any past event lies at a finite temporal distance from the present. For each past or future event, beginning from the present, there can always be either a prior past event or a subsequent future event. Hence, for both series an infinity of events is possible, and, as symmetrical, the infinity of both series is the same. Since the series of future events is not an actual but a potential infinite (or, better, an “indefinitely extendible” series, 2004: 168; Craig and Sinclair 2012, 104–5), the series of past events is also indefinitely extendible. It follows that although the future is actually finite, it does not require an end to the universe, for there is always a possible subsequent event (2004: 180). Similarly, although any given past event of the universe is finitely distant in time from now, a beginning or initial event can be ruled out; for any given event there is a possible earlier event. However, since there is a possible prior or possible posterior event in any past or future series respectively, the universe, although finite in time, is temporally unbounded (indefinitely extendible); both beginning and cessation are ruled out. [How Rundle (2004: 176–78) gets from the possibility of a subsequent event to actually ruling out cessation and beginning is unclear.] Since there is no time when the material universe did not exist, it is not contingent but necessary. Hence, although the principle of sufficient reason is still true, it applies only to the components of the material universe and not to the universe itself. No explanation of the universe is possible. The universe, as matter-energy, is neither caused nor destructible, not in the sense that it could have been caused or could cease, but in the sense that “the notions of beginning and ceasing to exist are inapplicable to the universe” (2004: 178).

However, one might wonder, are the past series and future series of events really symmetrical? It is true that one can start from the present and count either forward or backward in time. Rundle thinks that …x5, x4, x3, x2, x1, t0, y1, y2, y3, y4, y5… are all on the same continuum, so that we cannot distinguish ontologically the time dimension of the future and past series. The two series, going into the past and into the future, would be the same in that however far we count from the present t0 remains finite although indefinitely extendible. However, is it true that, as he claims, with regard to the past, “any movement currently terminating can be redescribed as extending back”, that counting backward from the present is the same as counting from the past to the present (2004: 176)?

Craig says no, for in the actual world we do not start from now to arrive at the past; we move from the past to the present. To count backwards, we would start from a particular point in time, the present. From where would we start to count forward were the past indefinitely extendible? Both to count and to move from the past to the present, we cannot start from the indefinitely extendible. Indeed, if the past is indefinitely extendible, no matter where we started, we would have arrived at t0 long before now. One cannot just reverse the temporal sequence of the past, for we do not ontologically engage the sequence from the present to the past. Rundle’s two movements are quite disparate, such that the two sequences—of the past and of the future—are not symmetrical, which leaves intact Craig’s claim that a beginningless past would result in an actual and not a potential infinite.

Morriston (2010) argues that if Craig’s argument 6–8 holds, it also applies to an infinite future, for, contrary to Craig, there is no relevant difference between a beginningless past and a determinate, endless future, such that if one is impossible because of absurdities so is the other, and if one is possible so is the other. He creates a fictional scenario where God commands angels Gabriel and Uriel to praise God alternatively for an eternity.

If you ask, “How many distinct praises will be said?”, the only sensible answer is, “infinitely many”. Each of infinitely many distinct praises will be said, precisely because there will be no future time at which all have been said. (Morriston 2010: 443–44)

Thus, an actually infinite number of future events is not impossible; it can be envisioned and determined by God.

Morriston proceeds to note that puzzles or absurdities parallel to those Craig finds in the concept of an actual infinite of past events also occur in the infinite series of future events. Suppose that

God could instead have determined that Gabriel and Uriel will stop after praise number four. Infinitely many praises would be prevented, and the number of their future praises would be only four. Alternatively, God could have determined that Gabriel be silent during all the celestial minutes between Uriel’s future praises. In this case too, infinitely many praises would be prevented, but the number of future praises would instead be infinite. (Morriston 2010: 444)

Although, Morriston continues, this shows that an infinite future can have inconsistent implications, God could still bring it about that these angels utter distinct praises, one after another, ad infinitum. But then, Morriston concludes, since these inconsistent implications do not count against an actual infinity of future events, the puzzles Craig poses do not count against the possibility of an actual infinity of past events, i.e., a beginningless universe. If an actually infinite future is possible, so is an actually infinite past.

Morriston contends that Craig’s reply that in the one case the events have occurred and in the other they have not, and hence that the number of future praises is indefinite, is a distinction without a difference. God can determine that an infinite number of praises will be sung.

The non-existence of past events does not prevent us from asking how many have occurred. Nor should the non-existence of future events prevent us from asking how many will occur. In neither case will “indefinitely many” do as an answer. (2010: 449)

Craig’s defense is that Morriston has ignored the difference between a potential and an actual infinite. According to Craig, an actual infinite is a collection of definite and discrete members whose number is greater than any natural number, whereas a potential infinite is a collection that is increasing toward but never arriving at infinity as a limit (Craig 2010; Craig and Sinclair 2009: 116).

Morriston objects to Craig’s definition of the potential infinite. For one thing, there is no limit to which the future praises grow. The collection of praises continues to grow as the praises are sung, but it does not approach a limit, for always one more praise can be sung. The series of future praises is actually infinite.

Craig responds that Morriston is really attacking his notion of a potential infinite by claiming that no relevant distinction exists between a potential and an actual infinite. But this, he says, rests on confusing an A-theory with a B-theory of time. An infinite directed toward the future would be actual only on a B-theory of time, but not on an A-theory (Craig 2010: 452–53). On an A-theory of time, a change of tense makes a difference. That something actually has happened differs significantly from what may (even if determined) happen.

Cohen (2015: 177) continues Morriston’s argument, insisting that Craig invokes an unmotivated principle that Cohen terms “The Actuality-Infinity Principle: In order for x to be actually infinite in quantity, x must be actual”. Cohen argues that this begs the question. However, Craig’s principle is different: In order for x to be actually infinite in quantity, x must be or have been actual or actualized (Craig 2010: 455–56). Cohen might respond, “Why not then say that for x to be actually infinite in quantity x must be, have been, or will be actual or actualized?” Cohen argues that Craig’s presentism does not assist him here, since neither the past nor the future events are present and hence do not exist. Craig thinks otherwise (Craig and Sinclair 2009: 126), tacitly defending the principle in that temporal becoming what has not occurred or is not occurring but is future is merely potential, even if determined or foreseen by God.

8.3 Successive Addition Cannot Form an Actual Infinite

Craig’s second argument addresses the question whether one can achieve an actual infinite by successive addition.

  1. The temporal series of events is a collection formed by successive addition.
  2. A collection formed by successive synthesis is not an actual infinite.
  3. Therefore, the temporal series of events cannot be an actual infinite (Craig 1979: 103; Craig and Sinclair 2009, 117).

The collection of historical events is formed by successively adding events, one following another. The events occur over a period of time as the series continues to acquire new members. Even were an actual infinite possible, it could not be realized by successive addition; in adding finite events to the series, no matter how many events are added, even to infinity, the series remains finite and only potentially infinite (Craig and Sinclair 2009: 118).

It might be objected that this sounds very much like Zeno’s paradoxes that prohibit Achilles or anyone from either beginning to cross an area or succeeding in doing so. However, notes Craig, significant disanalogies disallow this conclusion. For one, Zeno’s argument rests on progressively-narrowing, unequal distances that sum to a finite distance, whereas in traversing the past the equal distances continue to the infinity of the future. Second, Zeno’s distances are potential because of divisibility, whereas the distances from the past are actual distances or times to be traversed.

That one cannot arrive at an actual infinite when one starts from now or any given time-point and counts finite events to the future (counting up) seems true. But does it apply to counting from the past (counting down) to a present point? Craig replies that the present event could not arrive were the present event preceded by an infinite number of prior events. To count from the past to the present, there must be a starting point, which is not available in an actually infinite series of past events.

Morriston reframes the successive-addition-from-the-past defense of the kalām as follows (renumbered) (2021: 70).

  1. If the past had no beginning, then there would have been a beginningless series of discrete past events.
  2. Any such series is formed by successive addition in the sense that, as time passes, fresh events are successively added to those that have already occurred.
  3. A beginningless series would be an actual infinite (since its members could be placed in a one-to-one correspondence with the natural numbers).
  4. But no series formed by successive addition can be actually infinite.
  5. Therefore, a beginningless series is impossible. [From 13, 14, and 15]
  6. Therefore, the past had a beginning. [From 12 and 16]

As Morrison (2021: 72–73) points out, premise 15 does not trade on whether an actual infinite is possible. Rather, it trades on whether an actually infinite series can be formed by successive addition, which he, contrary to Craig, believes is possible because each future event can be paired with a natural number that either has been or will have been counted. And the series of natural numbers is infinite. But why is 15 true?

Why couldn’t there have been an infinite series of years in which there was no first year? It’s true that in such a series we never “arrive” at infinity, but surely that is only because infinity is, so to speak, “always already there”. At every point in such a series, infinitely many years have already passed by…. Each event in a beginningless series terminating in the present could have been “added” to the infinitely many prior events. (2003: 290)

His point is that from the contention that “before any event in the series could have occurred, the previous event would have had to occur”, and so on, it does not follow that no event in the series could have occurred if the series is infinite. The argument begs the question (2021: 78–79). In effect, we don’t need a starting point to form an actual infinite by successive addition. Infinity is already present in the series.

Craig responds that we cannot just add “arriving at the present” to an already existing infinite.

Before the present event could occur, the event immediately before it would have to occur; and before that event could occur, the event immediately before it would have to occur; and so on ad infinitum. One gets driven back into the past, making it impossible for any event to occur. Thus, if the series of events were beginningless, the present could not have occurred, which is absurd. (Craig and Sinclair 2009: 118)

Put another way, why is the event happening at this moment rather than another? If the past were an actual infinite, an event that occurs now could just as reasonably have occurred yesterday or last year, “for the number of events that have occurred up to the present is no greater than the number that have occurred at any point in the past” (Craig 1979: 97).

To defend his position, Craig presents Bertrand Russell’s example of Tristram Shandy, who writes his autobiography. It takes him a year to write about one day of his life, so that as his life progresses so does his autobiography in which he gets progressively farther behind. Russell concludes that

if (Shandy) had lived forever, and had not wearied of his task, then, even if his life had continued as eventfully as it began, no part of his biography would have remained unwritten. (1937: 358)

However, Oderberg (2002: 310) claims, Russell seems to have fallaciously moved from (1) For every day, there is a year such that, by the end of that year, Shandy has recorded that day, which is true, to (2) There is a year such that, for every day, by the end of that year Shandy has recorded that day. Proposition (2) is needed for Russell’s conclusion but fails to follow from (1). Shandy’s writing never catches up with his life; indeed, the longer he lives, even if for infinity, his writing will never catch up to his life but progressively will get farther behind. Indeed, if he has been living and writing from infinity, his autobiography is infinitely behind his life. Contrary to Russell, there will be days—an infinite number—about which he will be unable to write. As can be imagined, this example has been greatly contested, modified, and has generated a literature of its own. For samples, see Eells (1988), Oderberg (2002), and Oppy (2002b, 2003). Waters (2013) reformulates the paradox, attempting to avoid problems with earlier formulations.

Alex Malpass (2023) argues that Craig’s and Loke’s (2022: 208–12) argument for the thesis that an infinite countdown is impossible—if one cannot count to infinity, one cannot count down from infinity—will not work because there is no mirroring relation between counting to and counting from infinity. That is, the claim that because “counting every element in x is impossible, and the number of elements in x is equal to the number of elements in y, then counting every element in y is impossible” cannot be supported (Malpass 2023: 47). Though counting to infinity in the future is impossible because there is no terminus, in counting from infinity there is a terminus, viz., now. Craig’s and Loke’s argument presupposes that the two series mirror each other, which they do not.

The question can be raised whether mirroring is a proper approach to addressing the question of whether the two series are the same size. Morriston (2021: 75) contends that the mathematical symmetry between the two series does not warrant the conclusion that the past series could not have been completed by successive addition (though neither does it show that it could have been completed thusly).

Yet, as Malpass admits,

Perhaps the idea is that it is intolerably strange to think that George is finishing an infinite countdown precisely because he never began to do it. And there admittedly is something rather strange about that notion, of always having been counting but never having begun to count. Maybe there is an implicit appeal to a general principle, something like “one cannot complete something unless one started to do it”. However, such a principle seems like it would be begging the question if appealed to at this point in the dialectic. (2023: 49)

Morriston similarly suggests that traversing the infinite is just the way it is. “If the series of past events has no beginning, then each event has been added to the infinitely many that had preceded it, and that is all there is to the ‘traversing’ of an infinite past” (2021: 84). “The past just is the series of events that have already happened” (Morriston 2004: 293). To require a reason for the series of past events arriving at now is to appeal to the principle of sufficient reason, which he deems both suspect and inappropriate for Craig to invoke.

Finally, it is objected that Craig’s argument presupposes an A view of time, where time flows from past to present to future and not all events tenselessly coexist. It seems that Craig’s argument cannot be sustained if time is understood in the B sense, where all members of the series tenselessly coexist, being equally real (Grünbaum 1994). On a B view of time there is no beginning, and it would seem that on this view the argument would collapse. Loke (2022: 212–14) contends that his argument for the impossibility of traversing the infinite works on either view of time.

8.4 The Big Bang Theory of Cosmic Origins

One of Craig and Sinclair’s a posteriori arguments for premise 2 of the kalām argument invokes the Big Bang theory of cosmic origins. Since the universe is expanding as the galaxies recede from each other, if we reverse the direction of our view and look back in time, the farther we look, the denser the universe becomes. If we push backwards far enough, we find that the universe reaches a state of compression where the density and gravitational force are infinite. This unique singularity constitutes the beginning of the universe—of matter, energy, space, time, and all physical laws. They argue that it is not that the universe arose out of some prior state, for there was no prior state. Since time too comes to be, one cannot ask what happened before the initial event. Neither should one think that the universe expanded from some state of infinite density into space; space too came to be in that event. Since the Big Bang initiates the very laws of physics, one cannot expect any scientific or physical explanation of this singularity.

One picture, then, is of the universe beginning in a singular, non-temporal event roughly 13.8 billion years ago. Something, perhaps a quantum vacuum, came into existence. Its tremendous energy caused it, in the first fractions of a second, to expand or inflate and explode, creating the four-dimensional space-time universe that we experience today. How this all happened in the first 10-35 seconds and subsequently is a matter of serious speculation and debate. What advocates of premise 2 maintain is that since the universe and all its material elements originate in the Big Bang, the universe is temporally finite and thus had a beginning. (For a detailed consideration of cosmogenic theories from the kalām perspective, see Craig and Sinclair 2009: 125–182; for the counter discussion see Grünbaum 1991). By itself, of course, this reasoning, even if accurate, leaves it the case that premise 2 and hence conclusion 3 are only probably true, dependent on accepted cosmogenic theories.

Several replies to this argument can be made. First, questions have been raised about the adequacy of the theory of inflation to explain the expansion of the universe. One problem is predictability, for on this view anything that can happen will happen, an infinite number of times (Steinhardt 2011: 42). Further, the argument presupposes that the General Theory of Relativity applies to the beginning of the universe, but some doubt that this is so, given that it cannot adequately account for the quantum gravity involved.

Second, some have suggested that since we cannot “exclude the possibility of a prior phase of existence” (Silk 2001: 63), it is possible that the universe has cycled through oscillations, perhaps infinitely. Big Bangs occurred not once but an infinite number of times in the past and will do so in the future. So-called axions that counteract gravity will eventually weaken, so that the cosmological constant (dark matter) will predominate and draw everything together, perhaps 11–15 billion years from now (Pearson 2025). In effect, the current universe may be a “reboot” of previous universes that have expanded and then contracted (Musser 2004).

The traditional idea of an oscillating universe (“bounce cosmology”) faces significant problems. For one, no set of physical laws accounts for a series of cyclical universe-collapses and re-explosions. That the universe once exploded into existence provides no evidence that the event could reoccur even once, let alone an infinite number of times, should the universe collapse. Second, even an oscillating universe seems to be finite (Smith, in Craig and Smith 1993: 113), and hence the kalām argument against an actually infinite series would apply to it. Third, the cycle of collapses and expansions would not, as was pictured, be periodic (of even duration). Rather, entropy would rise from cycle to cycle, so that even were a series of universe-oscillations possible, they would become progressively longer (Davies 1992: 52; Tolman 1934). If the universe were without beginning, by now that cycle would be infinite in duration, without any hope of contraction.

Responding to these issues, recently proposed cosmologies based on string theory, which holds that the universe is filled with one-dimensional strings rather than particles, have given new life to a cyclic view. For example, Paul Steinhardt and Neil Turok have proposed a cyclic cosmological model where the universe repeatedly transitions from a big bang to a big crunch to a big bang, and so on. They contend that

the Universe is flat, rather than closed. The transition from expansion to contraction is caused by introducing negative potential energy, rather than spatial curvature. Furthermore, the cyclic behavior depends in an essential way on having a period of accelerated expansion after the radiation and matter-dominated phases. During the accelerated expansion phase, the Universe approaches a nearly vacuous state, restoring very nearly identical local conditions as existed in the previous cycle prior to the contraction phase. (Steinhardt and Turok 2002: 2)

Dark energy becomes a key player in all of this. On the kalām view, the amount of dark energy in the universe makes a return to its original state impossible. The universe is not cyclical but will die a cold death. On a cyclic view, dark energy accelerates the expansion of the universe needed “to dilute the entropy, black holes and other debris produced in the previous cycle so that the universe is returned to its original pristine vacuum state before it begins to contract, bounce, and begin a cycle anew” (Steinhardt and Turok 2001: 1436). One problem is that dark energy is a theoretical construct used to account for the rapid expansion of the universe, but since its existence is inferred but has not been empirically confirmed, its existence and roles are disputed. More serious, however, is how the cyclical universe came to be in the first place, and why one should think that the cycles repeat previous configurations.

According to the emergent universe model, the universe existed in a quasi-static state for an infinite amount of time before gradually transitioning into an expansion. There is no singular state or beginning of time from which the universe inflated (Ellis 2004). However, a universe existing in a quasi-static state would not be inconsistent with a kalām argument, since the existence of the universe in this static, low entropy state would still need to be accounted for on the Principle of Causation.

A more recent proposal is that the universe is the product of numerous, unobservable singularities that occur rarely and briefly in time. These localized bursts inject matter and energy into space-time. Hence, there is no Big Bang at an initial moment of infinite density, but rather countless inflationary events that occur spontaneously at high speeds and fine scale and then quickly dissipate (Lieu 2025). These, rather than dark energy, account for the increasing expansion of the universe. Lieu suggests that their origin is unknown, but this does not concern him since the origin of the competing Big Bang likewise is unknown.

Even if this theory bears fruit, the kalām argument would contend that these singularities cannot arise out of nothing. They might seem spontaneous in that no natural law governs their arising, but they still need a cause. If this cause is God, God would be much more involved in continuous creation rather than merely in an initial creation ex nihilo via the Big Bang.

What this shows is that any attempt to support the second premise of the kalām argument by accepting or refuting scientific cosmologies will encounter an ever-changing scene, given the speculative nature of cosmology. Thus, while Craig and Sinclair (2009: 150–74) critically evaluate current contenders as not being viable, changes in and development of these theories and the inevitable development of others make for unending point-counterpoint.

8.5 The Big Bang Is Not an Event

One critical response to the kalām argument from the Big Bang is that, given the General Theory of Relativity, the Big Bang is not an event at all. An event takes place within a space-time context. However, the Big Bang has no space-time context; there is neither time prior to the Big Bang nor a space in which the Big Bang occurs. Hence, the Big Bang cannot be considered as a physical event occurring at a moment of time. As Hawking notes, the finite universe has no space-time boundaries and hence lacks singularity and a beginning (Hawking 1988: 116, 136). Time might be multi-dimensional or imaginary, in which case one asymptotically approaches a beginning singularity but never reaches it. And without a beginning the universe requires no cause. The best one can say is that the universe is finite with respect to the past, not that it was an event with a beginning. (Rundle 2004: chap. 8.)

Grünbaum defends this position by arguing that events can only result from other events.

Since the Big Bang singularity is technically a non-event, and t=0) is not a bona fide time of its occurrence, the singularity cannot be the effect of any cause in the case of either event-causation or agent causation alike…. The singularity t=0 cannot have a cause. (Grünbaum 1994; Rundle 2004: 168, writes, “[T]here is no event—the beginning of the universe—to be explained, events being possible only in time”)

One response to Grünbaum’s objection is to opt for broader notions of “event” and “cause”. We might broaden the notion of “event” by removing the requirement that it must be relational, taking place in a space-time context. In the Big Bang the space-time universe commences and then continues to exist in measurable time subsequent to the initiating singularity (Silk 2001: 456). Thus, one might consider the Big Bang as either the event of the commencing of the universe or else a state in which “any two points in the observable universe were arbitrarily close together” (Silk 2001: 63). As such, one might inquire why this commencing or initial state of the universe existed in the finite past. Likewise, one need not require that causation embody the Humean condition of temporal priority, but may treat causation counter-factually, or perhaps even, as traditionally, a relation of production. Any causal statement about the universe would have to be expressed atemporally, but for the theist this presents no problem provided that God is conceived atemporally (at least prior to creation) and sense can be made of atemporal causation.

Furthermore, suppose Grünbaum is correct that the Big Bang singularity is not an event. Then, by his reasoning that events only arise from other events, subsequent so-called events cannot be the effect of that singularity. If they were, they would not be events either.

Grünbaum (1991) also argues that defenders of the kalām argument cannot make sense of the claim that the universe began to exist.

The question of its beginning is not, “If the universe did have a bounded past of finite duration, what was the cause of its initial event t=0?” There simply did not exist any instants of time before t=0!

One simply cannot ask what happened before t=0; the question makes no sense. And if we cannot ask that question, then we cannot inquire whether the Big Bang was an effect, for nothing temporal preceded it. Questions about creation occur in time in the universe, not outside of it (Hawking 1987: 650–51).

Grünbaum’s contention is that to begin to exist requires a previous time, and that there was no time prior to the Big Bang.

[T]here is no first instant of time at all, just as there is no leftmost point on an infinite Euclidean line that extends in both directions. Since here as elsewhere, the term ‘always’ refers to all actual past instants of time, the non-existence of time before t=0 … allows that matter has always existed, despite the finitude of the age of the universe in both sets of models. (1991)

However, as Craig observes, the series is finite, not infinite, even though it includes all past instants of time. Beginning to exist does not entail that one has a beginning point in time. Craig defines “x begins to exist” as “x exists at t and there is no time immediately prior to t at which x exists” (1992: 238).

Something has a beginning just in case the time during which it has existed is finite.… So understood, deleting the beginning point of a thing’s existence does not imply that the thing no longer begins to exist and therefore came into being uncaused. (Craig and Sinclair 2009: 185)

8.6 Personal Explanation

Finally, something needs to be said about conclusion 5, which asserts that the cause of the universe is personal. Defenders of the cosmological argument suggest two possible kinds of explanation.[4] Natural explanation is provided in terms of precedent events, causal laws, or necessary conditions that invoke natural existents. Personal explanation is given “in terms of the intentional action of a rational agent” (Swinburne 2004: 21; also Gale and Pruss 1999). We have seen that one cannot provide a natural causal explanation for the initial event, for there are no precedent natural events or natural existents to which the laws of physics apply. The line of scientific explanation runs out at the initial singularity, and perhaps even before we arrive at the initial singularity (at 10-35 seconds). If no scientific explanation (in terms of physical laws) can provide a causal account of the origin of the universe (premise 4), the explanation must be personal, that is, in terms of the intentional action of an intelligent, supernatural agent.

Morriston (2000: 163–68) questions whether Craig’s argument for the cause being personal goes through. Craig argues that if the cause were an eternal, nonpersonal, operating set of conditions, then the universe would exist from eternity. Since the universe has not existed from eternity, the cause must be a personal agent who chooses freely to create an effect in time. However, notes Morriston, if the personal cause intended from eternity to create the world, and if the intention alone to create is causally sufficient to bring about the effect, then the universe would also exist from eternity, and there would be no reason to prefer a personal cause of the universe over a nonpersonal cause. For a timeless eternal being before creation, which is Craig’s view, “There can be no temporal gap between the time at which it does the willing and the time at which the thing willed actually happens” (2000, 167). So the distinction in this respect between a personal and a nonpersonal eternal cause disappears. Craig (2002) replies that it is not intention alone that must be present, but the personal agent must also employ or exercise its personal causal power to bring about the world. However, Morriston retorts, exercising personal causal power is an action in time, a view that is unavailable to Craig, for there is no time when God would restrain his causal powers.

Paul Davies argues that one need not appeal to God to account for the Big Bang. Its cause, he suggests, is found within the cosmic system itself. Originally a vacuum lacking space-time dimensions, the universe “found itself in an excited vacuum state”, a “ferment of quantum activity, teeming with virtual particles and full of complex interactions” (Davies 1984: 191–92), which, subject to a cosmic repulsive force, resulted in an immense increase in energy. Subsequent explosions from this collapsing vacuum released the energy in this vacuum, reinvigorating the cosmic inflation and setting the scenario for the subsequent expansion of the universe. However, Craig asks, what is the origin of this increase in energy that eventually made the Big Bang possible? Davies’s response is that the law of conservation of energy (that the total quantity of energy in the universe remains fixed despite transfer from one form to another), which now applies to our universe, did not apply to the initial expansion. Cosmic repulsion in the vacuum caused the energy to increase from zero to an enormous amount. This great explosion released energy, from which all matter emerged. Consequently, he contends, since the conclusion of the kalām argument is false, one of the premises of the argument—in all likelihood the first—is false.

Craig responds that if the vacuum has energy, the question arises concerning the origin of the vacuum and its energy. Merely pushing the question of the beginning of the universe back to some primordial quantum vacuum does not escape the question of what brought this vacuum laden with energy into existence. A quantum vacuum is not nothing (as in Newtonian physics) but

a sea of continually forming and dissolving particles that borrow energy from the vacuum for their brief existence. A quantum vacuum is thus far from nothing, and vacuum fluctuations do not constitute an exception to the principle that whatever beings to exist has a cause. (Craig, in Craig and Smith 1993: 143–44)

Hence, he concludes, the appeal to a vacuum as the initial state is misleading.

Park (2015) argues that the kalām argument works but only to establish the existence of an initial singularity that, though it is the cause of the universe, is nonphysical, uncaused, existing outside of time and the universe. Craig, he claims, fails to see that in the Big Bang Theory, the singularity is not part of the universe, though it is not a supernatural cause. All physical objects need a cause, but Craig cannot generalize from this to claim that abstract objects like the initial singularity need a cause. The strength of this view, he argues, is that it is more parsimonious; it simply has substituted an initial singularity outside of the universe for God. But Park does not tell us how this abstract singularity has causal powers to bring about the Big Bang and the resulting universe. He tells us that the singularity, as abstract and prior to time and space and natural laws, would not violate any physical or causal laws and would not and need not operate according to any physical laws. But what then does it mean to say that the singularity has causal power? In effect, what he has done is to argue for a god (first cause) but depersonalize this god into an abstract concept.

Loke (2022: 87–93) contends that appealing to abstracta to explain the beginning of the universe fails for several reasons. First, what is there about the abstract object that brings about a Big Bang of a certain sort rather than something else? Second, “abstract objects by themselves do not make it the case that things/events happen in one way rather than the other in the concrete world” (2022:88). They must operate in conjunction with concrete entities. God has powers that are not present in mere abstractions.

One might wonder, as Rundle (2004: 75–77) does, how a supernatural agent could bring about the universe, since the agent is not a physical entity. He contends that a personal agent (God) cannot be the cause because intentional agency needs a body and actions occur within space-time. However, acceptance of the cosmological argument does not depend on an explanation of the manner of causation by a necessary or personal being. When we explain that the girl raised her hand because she wanted to ask a question, we can accept that she was the cause of the raised hand without understanding how her wanting to ask a question brought about her raising her hand. As Swinburne notes, an event is “fully explained when we have cited the agent, his intention that the event occur, and his basic powers” that include the ability to bring about events of that sort (2004: 36). Similarly, theists argue, we may never know why and how creation took place. Nevertheless, we may accept it as an explanation in the sense that we can say that God created that initial event, that he had the intention to do so, and that such an event lies within the power of an omniscient and almighty being; not having a body is irrelevant.

The issues raised by the kalām argument concern not only the nature of explanation and when an explanation is necessary, but even whether an explanation of the universe is possible (given the above discussion). Whereas most agree that it makes no sense to ask about what occurs before the Big Bang (since there was no prior time) or about something coming out of nothing, the dispute rests on whether the universe is infinite in time or whether there is a first existent and if so whether there needs to be a cause of it, what the nature of such a cause might be, whether something like the universe can be finite and yet not have a beginning, and crucially the nature of infinites and their connection with reality.

9. An Inductive Cosmological Argument

Richard Swinburne contends that the cosmological argument is not deductively valid; if it were,

it would be incoherent to assert that a complex physical universe exists and that God does not exist. There would be a hidden contradiction buried in such co-assertions…. [A]ttempts to derive obviously incoherent propositions from such co-assertions have failed through commission of some elementary logical error. (2004: 136)

Swinburne is correct that if someone believes that a deductive cosmological argument (proof) for God’s existence is sound, then it would be incoherent for that same person to then deny that God exists. The problem, however, is not with the cosmological argument but with persons’ beliefs about the argument. Whereas propositions are true and deductive arguments are valid independent of anyone’s beliefs that they are true and valid (the proposition that the earth orbits the sun is true regardless of whether anyone believes it), the acceptance of an argument is not independent of those same beliefs. An argument that one person takes as being sound another might believe not to be sound; arguments are person-relative in their persuasive value or assessment of coherence. Swinburne himself notes that arguments of coherence and incoherence are persuasive only to the extent that someone accepts other statements inherent to the proof as coherent or incoherent and that one statement entails another (1993: 39). Elsewhere Swinburne admits to having

some doubt about whether men have enough initial consensus about what is coherent and what entails what, are clever enough and have enough imagination to reach agreed proofs which would settle all disputes about whether a statement is coherent or incoherent. (1993: 45)

As such, Swinburne cannot so easily dismiss deductive cosmological arguments, although he is justified in wondering whether “reasons less strong than compelling proofs can be given for thinking some statements coherent and others incoherent” (1993: 45).

In place of a deductive argument, Swinburne develops an inductive cosmological argument that appeals to the inference to the best explanation. Swinburne distinguishes between two varieties of inductive arguments: those that show that the conclusion is more probable than not (what he terms a correct P-inductive argument) and those that further increase the probability of the conclusion (what he terms a correct C-inductive argument). In The Existence of God (1979) he presents a cosmological argument that he claims falls in the category of C-inductive arguments. However, for him this argument is part of a larger, cumulative case for a P-inductive argument for God’s existence that includes as its evidence the orderliness of the universe, the existence of consciousness, miracle reports, and religious experience.

Swinburne notes that “a cosmological argument argues that the fact that there is a universe needs explaining” (2004: 9–10). However, he emphasizes that his approach differs from those we have already considered in that he rejects the Principle of Sufficient Reason understood as “everything not ‘metaphysically necessary’ has an explanation in something ‘metaphysically necessary’” (2004: 148), for the PSR leads, as it does in Leibniz, to a being that is logically necessary, and such a being cannot explain the logically contingent. From the logically necessary only the logically necessary follows. In place of using the PSR to construct a deductive argument, he employs a “basic theorem of confirmation theory”, Bayes’ Theorem, to construct an inductive argument (2004: 67). (In making this claim about the need for an explanation of the universe, however, it is hard not to see that he invokes some formulation of the PSR.)

Swinburne begins his discussion with the existence of a physical universe that (a) contains odd events that cannot be fitted into the established pattern of scientific explanation (e.g., miracles, the appearance of conscious beings), (b) is too big in that science cannot explain why there are states of affairs at all or why the fundamental natural laws to which science appeals to explain things hold, and (c) is complex (its matter-energy has relevant powers) (2004: 74, 150).

It is not logically necessary that the existence of the universe needs explanation; we could accept this universe as a brute, inexplicable fact, but Swinburne thinks that to do so fails to accord with the example of the sciences, which seek the best explanation for any given phenomena. Since “it is reasonable to suppose” that there is an explanation (2004: 75), the issue, then, is which view is more reasonable: that science can provide a natural explanation for the existence of this universe, or whether the universe and its phenomena exist because of the intentional, causal activity of a personal being whose existence is a brute fact.

To find the explanatory hypothesis most likely to be true, especially about something that might be unobservable, he claims to follow the example of science. Using Bayes’ Theorem, he looks for a hypothesis h such that p(e | h & k) > p(e | k), where p is probability, e is the existence of a complex universe, and k is the background data. A hypothesis is more likely to be true in so far as (1) it has high explanatory power, in that it makes probable the evidence of the observation [this may be predictive but can be postdictive as well (Swinburne 1996: 34, 2001: 80–81)], and insofar as the evidence is very unlikely to occur if the hypothesis is false; and (2) it has a greater prior probability. The prior probability of a hypothesis encompasses three features: (a) how well it fits with our background knowledge (2001: 81). The broader the scope, the less relevant this criterion becomes (2004: 60). Since there are no “neighboring fields of inquiry related to the origin of the universe”, Swinburne treats this condition in the cosmological argument as irrelevant or reducing to the feature of simplicity (1996: 29). (b) The scope of the hypothesis (the extent of its claims)—the broader the scope, the less likely it is to be true. For example, all crows are black is less likely to be true than all crows along the upper Mississippi River are black. Since both scientific naturalism and theism have the same scope—explaining the universe, this does not factor into his calculations for explaining the complex universe (2001: 82); and (c) simplicity, which for Swinburne holds the key (2001: 82–83).

He holds that we are looking for a complete explanation, where

we may reasonably conclude that the criteria for supposing that factors have no further explanation (scientific or personal) in terms of factors acting at the time and so that any explanation is a complete explanation over all (not just a complete explanation within scientific or within personal explanation) are that any attempt to go beyond the factors that we have would result in no gain of explanatory power or prior probability. (Swinburne 2004: 89)

A scientific explanation fails to give a complete explanation. It leaves us not with a simple but with a very complex explanatory hypothesis, in that “ultimate explanation stops at innumerable, different stopping points, many of them … having exactly the same powers and liabilities as each other” (Swinburne 1996: 42). It presents us with the brute fact of the existence of the universe, not an explanation for it. It explains in terms of a full cause the events at any moment, but it cannot provide a complete explanation of the universe, “for there are no physical causes apart from the universe itself and parts thereof” (Swinburne 1984: 144).

On the other hand, a personal explanation, given in terms of the intentional actions of a person, is simpler and no explanatory power is lost. Further, a personal explanation can be understood, as in the case of explaining basic actions, without knowing or understanding any of the natural causal conditions that enable one to bring it about. In the case of the cosmological argument, personal explanation is couched in terms of a being that has beliefs, purposes, and intentions, and possesses both the power to bring about the complex universe and a possible reason for doing so.

Swinburne argues that a personal explanation of the universe satisfies the above probability criteria. It satisfies condition (1) in that appealing to God as an intentional agent has explanatory power. It leads us to have certain expectations about the universe: that it manifests order, is comprehensible, and favors the existence of beings that can comprehend it. It makes probable the existence of the complex universe because God could have reasons for causing such a universe, whereas we would have no reasons at all if all we had was the brute fact of the material universe. Among these reasons is that the universe would be “a theatre for finite agents to develop and make of it what they will” (Swinburne 1979: 131).

Michael Martin objects at this point. Martin contends that if Swinburne is to compare the a priori probability of there being a complex universe given our background knowledge with the a priori probability of a complex universe given our background knowledge and the existence of God, he has to be clear on how he interprets the probability. Martin notes that herein lies crucial ambiguity that disables calculating the a priori probability. If one compares the very many possible complex universes with there being no universe, on the basis of assigning equal probability to all possibilities the probability of there being a complex universe is nearly 1. However, if one compares the probability of there being a complex universe with there being no universe at all, it is 50 percent (Martin 1986: 155). Furthermore, Martin wonders whether complexity is an issue at all. According to Swinburne, as free God can create any kind of world or no world at all. But then the existence of God is compatible with any number of scenarios: the existence of no world, a simpler world than we have, one like ours, or any number of more complex universes. Consequently, the complexity of this world does not matter in constructing an inductive argument for God’s existence (1986: 155). Put another way, adding the existence of God to our background knowledge does not increase the likelihood of there being a complex universe, let alone of there being this particular universe or a universe at all (1986: 158).

In short, Martin does not see how Swinburne can establish an a priori probability for the existence of a complex universe, to be compared with an a priori probability for the existence of God based on simplicity, a feature of Swinburne’s Bayesian argument. This introduces the theme of simplicity, to which Swinburne devotes much attention.

Swinburne goes on to argue that a personal explanation in terms of God satisfies condition (2) because of its simplicity. If one is going to construct an explanatory hypothesis using the criterion of simplicity, God rather than science is more likely to be the focus of the true explanatory hypothesis. God is one and of one kind; polytheism is ruled out. Moreover, God is the simplest kind of person there can be because a person is a being with power (to do intentional actions), knowledge, and freedom (to choose, uncaused, which actions to do), and in God these properties are infinite, and having infinite properties is simpler than having properties with limits, as humans do. “It is always simpler to postulate infinite or zero degrees of some property than a certain precise finite value of it” (Swinburne 1983: 385). Furthermore, God engages in simple causation, that is, causation by simple intention. Swinburne concludes that although the prior likelihood of neither God nor the universe is particularly high, the prior probability of a simple God exceeds that of a complex universe. Hence, if anything is to occur unexplained, it would be God, not the universe.

Consequently, if we are to explain the universe, we must appeal to a personal explanation

in terms of a person who is not part of the universe acting from without. This can be done if we suppose that such a person (God) brings it about at each instant of time, that (the laws of nature) L operate. (Swinburne 1979: 126, 2004: 142)

Although for Swinburne this argument does not make the existence of God more probable than not (it is not a P-inductive argument), it does increase the probability of God’s existence (is a C-inductive argument) because it provides a more reasonable explanation for the universe than merely attributing it to the brute fact of the universe’s existence.

Theism does not make [certain phenomena] very probable; but nothing else makes their occurrence in the least probable, and they cry out for an explanation. A priori, theism is perhaps very unlikely, but it is far more likely than any rival supposition. Hence, our phenomena are substantial evidence for the truth of theism. (Swinburne 1979: 290)

In his critique of Swinburne, J. L. Mackie wonders whether personal explanations are reducible to natural, scientific explanations. To implement intentionality requires an entire system of neurological and macro-biological conditions. Not only does God as nonphysical lack these biological conditions, but these conditions are exceedingly complex, not simple. “Only by ignoring such key features [the role of the body] do we get an analogue of supposed divine action” (Mackie 1982: 100). When we incorporate these features, the simplicity disappears.

Swinburne replies that Mackie has misunderstood his argument. “The simplicity of the relation between intention and its realization has nothing to do with how our will or intentions are realized in practice” (Swinburne 1983: 386). Even if we understand all the neural connections and firings, we may not achieve any better explanation of why persons intended to act as they did than simply asking them why they acted as they did. This indicates that the existence of intermediate physical causal links is not an essential part of personal explanation. In fact, Swinburne argues, since it is easier to understand the function of intention without invoking any physical causal limitations, it makes it easier to understand the case of God who as nonphysical has no need for intermediary physical processes. Thus, he claims, Mackie missed the point about God when he invokes the complexity of physical accounts. The point is that God can will to act on his intentions directly, and this provides a simple account or explanation of why things came to exist.

The critical aspect of Swinburne’s argument is his almost total reliance in his inductive cosmological argument on simplicity as the deciding factor between competing hypotheses regarding the cause of the existence of the universe (2004: 333–34; 2010: 9; Ostrowick). Swinburne has at least six understandings that one hypothesis is simpler than another. (1) It invokes the fewest number of entities (2004: 106; 1983: 386; 2001: 87; 2010: 5). This is a quantitative understanding. (2) It invokes the fewest kinds of entities—a qualitative understanding (1983: 386; 2001: 87). (3) It invokes entities with simple or few properties (1983: 386) Swinburne invokes a subcriterion that explanations are simpler when the properties they invoke are observable (2010: 6). (4) It invokes powers, acquisition of beliefs, and consistency of intentions similar to ours when applied to personal explanation of rational behavior (2004: 61–64). (5) The explanation invokes the simplest organization of the features functioning in the explicans, e.g., laws or variables (2001: 83, 89–90). (6) Simplicity can be found in the explicans in that it does not invoke extraneous features that are not necessary to explain the effect (2001: 81).

Swinburne holds that the appeal to God as an explanation is simpler in all of these ways.[5] Not only is there one entity and that entity is simple, the explanation effectively has no organization of the features. The explanation itself is simple. The appeal to God’s causal activity satisfies understanding or interpretation (6) in that it involves no extraneous entities to do the explaining and requires no intermediaries. God can bring about the effect by himself alone.

Several important questions about simplicity arise. First, is simplicity the criterion we should use to decide between hypotheses? For one thing, simplicity is not always a reliable criterion for determining which hypothesis is true or which hypothesis provides the best explanatory account. The rise of quantum explanations suggests that the simplest account of the universe, for example, that of Newton, is not a complete and fully adequate account. The events in the subatomic realm are far from explained simply. For another, although an explanation in terms of four factors might make an explanation simpler, the reverse might hold: an explanation in terms of ten factors might be simpler than an explanation in terms of four because the relationships that hold between the ten factors are less complex than those that hold between the four, making for a simpler explanation (Ostrowick 2012). In reply, Swinburne might grant this, but argue that in these much more limited cases explanatory power, background knowledge, and scope now come into significant play in a way that they don’t when addressing hypotheses explaining the oddness, bigness, and complexity of the universe.

Second, why think that theism is simpler than naturalism? Oppy argues that whereas both naturalism and theism equally fit the data and have the same scope, naturalism is simpler, for theism is

committed to two kinds of entities (the natural and the supernatural), two kinds of external relations (the natural and the supernatural), two kinds of causation (the natural and the supernatural), two kinds of non-topic-neutral properties (the natural and the supernatural), and so on, whereas naturalism is committed to only one kind in each of these categories. (2013: 52)

In conclusion, Swinburne contends that it is very unlikely that a universe would exist uncaused, but more likely that God would exist uncaused. It is likely that if there is a God, he will make something like the finite and complex universe. The puzzling existence of the universe can be made comprehensible (explicable) if we suppose it is brought about by a personal God with intentional beliefs and the power to bring intentions to fruition (2004: 152). Whether simplicity can bear the weight of his argument is the key matter in question.

10. Significance of the Cosmological Argument

Finally, even if the cosmological argument is sound or cogent, the difficult task remains to show, as part of natural theology, whether the being to which the cosmological argument concludes is the God of religion, and if so, of which religion and what properties it might have. Rowe, like Kant, suggests that the cosmological argument has two parts, one to establish the existence of a first cause or necessary being, the other that this ultimate being is God (or the most real being) (1975: 6). It is unclear, however, whether the second contention is an essential part of the cosmological argument. Although Aquinas was quick to identify God with the first mover or first cause (growing out of his contention that philosophy is the handmaiden of theology, such that in philosophy faith seeks understanding, not confirmation), such identification seems to go beyond the causal reasoning that informs his argument (although one can argue that it is consistent with the larger picture of God and his properties that Aquinas paints in his Summae).

Some philosophers contend that the cosmological argument “has implications that bring it into the neighborhood of God as traditionally conceived” (O’Connor 2008: 67). That is, for example, from the concept of a necessary being flow properties appropriate to a divine being (Siniscalchi 2018: 693; Loke 2022: chap. 6). They develop this second stage by showing how and what properties might follow from the concept of this ultimate being: simplicity, unity, omnipotence, omniscience, goodness, and so on. O’Connor (2004) argues that being a necessary being cannot be a derivative emergent property, otherwise the being would be contingent. Likewise, the connection between the essential properties must be necessary. Hence, the universe cannot be the necessary being since it is a mereological complexity of contingent beings. Similarly, the myriad elementary particles cannot be necessary beings either, for their distinguishing distributions are externally caused and hence contingent. Rather, he contends, a more viable account of the necessary being is as a purposive agent with desires, intentions, and beliefs, whose activity is guided but not determined by its goals, a view consistent with identifying the necessary being as God. Koons (as are Craig and Sinclair 2009: 192–94) is willing to identify the ultimate being as God. He identifies seven corollaries regarding God’s nature that follow from his mereological construction of the cosmological argument (e.g., God as the necessary being is not a mere aggregate or composite; has its basic attributes by necessity; is not essentially located in space or time; etc. (1997).

Oppy (1999: 381–84), on the other hand, in critiquing Koons’s corollaries to establish that the First Cause has properties traditionally attributed to God, expresses significant skepticism about Koons’s arguments and the possibility of such a deductive move to determine its properties.

Others have proposed a method of correlation, where to give any religious substance to the concept of this ultimate being, one conducts a lengthy discussion of the supreme beings found in the diverse religions and carefully correlates the properties of the ultimate being of the cosmological argument with those of a supreme religious being. This is done to discern compatibilities and incompatibilities (Attfield 1975).

Regardless of the connection of this ultimate being or first cause with religion, if one is to hold that the cosmological argument is informative, it is necessary to flesh out the nature of this being. As O’Connor notes, the mere concept of a necessary being is “quite thin”.

Further considerations to discern the relationship between the ultimate being of the cosmological arguments and a religious Ultimate are beyond the scope of our treatment. While some defenders of the cosmological argument point to the relevance and importance of connecting this being with natural theology, critics find themselves freed from such endeavors.

Finally, after all is presented and developed, it is clear that every thesis and argument we have considered, whether in support or critical of the cosmological argument, is seriously contested. Perhaps that is as it should be when trying to answer the difficult questions whether the universe is contingent or necessary, caused or eternal, and if caused, why it exists or what brought it into being. As Oppy (2009: 47) writes,

It is highly plausible to suppose that a reasonable Christian and a reasonable anti-supernaturalist will disagree about a great many things. …They will certainly disagree on the question of the existence of God. …At any rate, we can certainly suppose that there is a set (or class) of propositions P = {pi} that are reasonably believed by the Christian, but that are reasonably not believed by the anti-supernaturalist; and that there is a set (or class) of propositions Q = {qi} that are reasonably believed by the anti-supernaturalist, but that are reasonably not believed by the Christian.

Oppy is correct in assessment and in his assertion that both theists and antithesis should have the opportunity to explain their position and reasoning to opponents. But what then is the proper function of arguments? He contends that it is to “bring about reasonable belief revision” (2002: 37). A good argument is one that “ought to motivate reconsideration on the part of those who hold best worldviews and best big pictures that incorporate the claims that the arguments target” (2019a: 119). That is, a good argument ought to be successful. And to be successful it ought to be persuasive: it “ought to persuade reasonable people like me who are not already persuaded of the conclusion” (2018: 119).

Applying this to the cosmological argument, Oppy writes,“[I]n my opinion, one will also find that, to date, there is no persuasive cosmological argument that has been produced. (That is, there is no cosmological argument which is such that it ought to persuade reasonable people like me who are not already persuaded of the conclusion.)” (Oppy 2009: 33). In short, since it does not persuade certain people to alter their worldview, the cosmological argument is not a good argument (Oppy 2009: 47).

But must an argument to be a good argument about God (or anything) be measured by success in persuasion? If the function is solely persuasion, what would be the magic number of those persuaded (all or most, many, or even a few)? Do we determine good arguments by empirical head-counts of converts? What has to be the believers’ intellectual level to be counted? By these lights, not only are there no successful theistic arguments, there are no successful anti-theistic arguments either. As such, Oppy’s attempt “to convince Christians that it is highly unlikely that there is a [good] cosmological argument” (2009: 6) fails. Indeed, one might wonder whether there are any good arguments, since getting people who have already adopted a position to change their mind is notoriously difficult. As Oppy himself writes,“What one ought to come to believe under the impact of any given evidence depends upon what one already believes” (Oppy 2002: 36). Our individual beliefs are situated within a particular worldview, so that any major revision of beliefs would require significant change to the worldview.

If, as we noted above, arguments are person-relative, are there other functions of arguments, with their own criteria, to determine what constitutes a good argument? What might be other functions of the cosmological or any other theistic argument? Surely, they can be seen as attempts to persuade others, although without the caveat that they have to persuade everyone or even many. But they may have other roles. Anselm and Aquinas present arguments to help themselves and us to understand God. Anselm is not out to convert the Fool (since he is a fool) but rather to help himself see that the Fool’s defeaters can themselves be defeated. Likewise, Aquinas introduces the arguments for God’s existence not out of curiosity but rather with the understanding that all philosophy aims at the human good. Theistic arguments, which belong to philosophy, must be seen in light of human fulfillment. Thus, a purpose of the argument may be faith seeking understanding and extending our knowledge, in that the premises are more known than the conclusion. In extending our knowledge, arguments can function in a justifying role for the person who makes the argument, and maybe for others as well (Reichenbach 2022). At the same time, as Oppy correctly notes, arguments, to be understood and assessed, should not be excised from the larger framework in which they are situated.

Hence, for those already committed to believing in the supernatural, the cosmological argument may provide confirmation or additional understanding of their belief, but it also may not be necessary at all for their belief (as in Reformed Epistemology, where belief in God is properly basic). For those not committed to believing in the supernatural, the theistic arguments may be a subject of philosophical interest, query, and debate but need not lead to change of belief, although one cannot rule out this happening. Either way, the discussion of the role of cosmological arguments leads to the broader discussion of the role and function of argumentation in general, of epistemic warrants, and conditions for paradigm shifts. That people differ in their beliefs need not diminish the justificatory or understanding role of or mere philosophical interest in the cosmological argument.

Bibliography

  • al–Baghdadi, Abu Mansur, [c.1000] 1981, ‘Usul al–din, 3rd edition Beirut: Dar al-kutub al–‘ilmiyya.
  • Almeida, Michael, 2018, Cosmological Arguments, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Almeida, Michael and Neil D. Judisch, 2002, “A New Cosmological Argument Undone”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 51: 55–64. doi:10.1023/a:1012754022592
  • Aquinas, Thomas, 1984, On the Eternity of the World, Cyril Vollert (trans.), Milwaukee: Marquette University Press.
  • –––, Summa Contra Gentiles, Bk. 1. Notre Dame: University of Notre Dame Press, 1975. [Summa Contra Gentiles available online]
  • –––, Summa Theologica, [ST] I, q. 2. [Summa Theologica available online]
  • Arp, Robert, (ed.), 2016, Revisiting Aquinas’ Proofs for the Existence of God, Hague: Brill.
  • Attfield, Robin, 1975, “The God of Religion and the God of Philosophy”, Religious Studies, 9(1): 1–9. doi:10.1017/S0034412500006259
  • Beck, W. David, 2002, “The Cosmological Argument: A Current Bibliographical Appraisal”, Philosophia Christi, 2(2): 283–304. doi:10.5840/pc200002237 [Beck 2002 available online]
  • Bonaventure, 2014, Commentary on the Sentences: Philosophy of God. Works of St. Bonaventure XVI, R.E. Houser and Timothy B. Noone (eds.), St. Bonaventure, NY: Franciscan Institute Press,
  • Bricmont, Jean, 2016, Making Sense of Quantum Mechanics, Cham: Springer Nature.
  • Brown, Patterson, 1966, “Infinite Causal Regression”, Philosophical Review, 75(4): 510–25. doi:10.2307/2183226
  • Burgess, John P., 1999, “Which Modal Logic Is the Right One?”, Notre Dame Journal of Formal Logic, 40(1): 81–93.
  • Cameron, Ross P., 2022, Chains of Being: Infinite Regress, Circularity, and Metaphysical Explanation, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780198854272.003.0001
  • Cohen, Yishai, 2015, “Endless Future: A Persistent Thorn in the Kalām Cosmological Argument”, Philosophical Papers, 44(2): 154–187. doi:10.1080/05568641.2015.1056961
  • Cohoe, Caleb, 2013, “There Must Be a First: Why Thomas Aquinas Rejects Infinite, Essentially Ordered Series”, British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 21(5): 838–56. doi:10.1080/09608788.2013.816934
  • Cook, Ben, 2022, “Powers, Possibility, and the Essential Cosmological Argument”, 58: 745–58. doi: 10.1017/S0034412521000317
  • Copan, Paul, (ed.), 2017, 2019, The Kalām Cosmological Argument (2 vols), New York: Bloomsbury.
  • Copan, Paul and William Lane Craig, 2004, Creation out of Nothing, Grand Rapids: Baker.
  • Craig, William Lane, 1979, The Kalām Cosmological Argument, London: Macmillan.
  • –––, 1980, The Cosmological Argument from Plato to Leibniz, London: Macmillan.
  • –––, 1992, “The Origin and Creation of the Universe: A Reply to Adolf Grünbaum”, British Journal for the Philosophy of Science, 43(2): 233–40. doi:10.1093/bjps/43.2.233
  • –––, 1997, “In Defense of the Kalām Cosmological Argument”, Faith and Philosophy, 14(2): 236–47. doi:10.5840/faithphil19971422 [Craig 1997 available online]
  • –––, 2002, “Must the Beginning of the Universe Have a Personal Cause?: A Rejoinder”, Faith and Philosophy, 19(1): 94–105. doi:10.5840/faithphil20021917
  • –––, 2010, “Taking Tense Time Seriously in Differentiating Past and Future: A Response to Wes Morriston”, Faith and Philosophy, 27(4): 451–56. doi:10.5840/faithphil201027445
  • –––, 2018, “The Kalām Cosmological Argument”, in Jerry Walls and Trent Dougherty (eds.), Two Dozen (or so) Arguments for God, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Craig, William Lane and James P. Moreland (eds.), 2009, The Blackwell Companion to Natural Theology, London: Blackwell,
  • Craig, William Lane and James D. Sinclair, 2009, “The Kalām Cosmological Argument”, in Craig and Moreland, The Blackwell Companion to Natural Theology, 2009: 101–201. [This contains an exhaustive bibliography on the Kalām cosmological argument.] [Craig and Sinclair 2009 preprint available online]
  • Craig, William Lane and Quentin Smith, 1993, Theism, Atheism, and Big Bang Cosmology, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780198263838.001.0001
  • Davey, Kevin and Rob Clifton, 2001, “Insufficient Reason in the ‘New Cosmological Argument’”, Religious Studies, 37(4): 485–490. doi:10.1017/S0034412501005819
  • Davidson, Herbert A., 1969, “John Philoponus as a Source of Medieval Islamic and Jewish Proofs of Creation”, Journal of the American Oriental Society, 89(2) (April–June): 357–91. doi:10.2307/596519
  • Davies, Paul, 1984, Superforce, New York: Simon and Schuster.
  • –––, 1992, The Mind of God, New York: Simon and Schuster.
  • Davis, Stephen, 1997, God, Reason & Theistic Proofs, Grand Rapids: Eerdmans.
  • Deng, Duen-Yen, 2020, “A New Cosmological Argument from Grounding”, Analysis, 80(3): 418–26. doi:10.1093/analys/anz071
  • Dvali, George, 2004, “Out of the Darkness”, Scientific American, 290(2) (Feb.): 68–75.
  • Eells, Ellery, 1988, “Quentin Smith on Infinity and the Past”, Philosophy of Science, 55(3): 453–455. doi:10.1086/289451 [Eells 1988 preprint available online]
  • Ellis, George and Roy Maartens, 2004, “The Emergent University: Inflationary cosmology with no singularity”, Classical and Quantum Gravity, 21(1): 223–232. doi:10.1088%2F0264-9381%F21%2F1%F015
  • Fakry, Majid, 1957, “The Classical Islamic Arguments for the Existence of God”, The Muslim World, 47(2): 133–45. doi:10.1111/j.1478-1913.1957.tb02956.x [Fakry 1957 available online]
  • Fesser, Edward, 2013, The Existence of God, San Francisco: Ignatius Press.
  • Flew, Anthony and Alasdair C. MacIntyre (eds.), 1955, New Essays in Philosophical Theology, London: SCM.
  • Gale, Richard M. (ed.), 1991, On the Nature and Existence of God, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9781316499054
  • Gale, Richard M. and Alexander R. Pruss, 1999, “A New Cosmological Argument”, Religious Studies, 35(4): 461–476. Reprinted in Gale and Pruss 2003: 365–80. [Gale and Pruss 1999 available online]
  • –––, 2002, “A Response to Oppy, and to Davey and Clifton”, Religious Studies, 38(1): 89–99. doi:10.1017/S0034412501005923
  • ––– (eds.), 2003, The Existence of God, Burlington, VT: Ashgate.
  • Gellman, Jerome, 2000, “Prospects for a sound stage 3 of cosmological arguments”, Religious Studies, 36(2): 195–2001. Reprinted in Gale and Pruss (eds.),The Existence of God, 2003: 381–87.
  • Glanz, James, 1998, “Cosmic Motion Revealed”, Science, 282(5397): 2156–2157. doi:10.1126/science.282.5397.2156a
  • Goldschmidt, Tyron (ed.), 2013, The Puzzle of Existence: Why Is There Something Rather than Nothing? New York: Routledge.
  • Grünbaum, Adolf, 1991, “Creation as a Pseudo-Explanation in Current Physical Cosmology”, Erkenntnis, 35(1–3): 233–54. doi:10.1007/BF00388287 [Grünbaum 1991 available online]
  • –––, 1994, “Some Comments on William Craig’s ‘Creation and Big Bang Cosmology’”, Philosophia Naturalis, 31(2): 225–236. [Grünbaum 1994 available online]
  • Harvey, Ramon, 2021, Transcendent God, Rational World, Edinburgh: University of Edinburgh.
  • Hawking, Stephen W., 1987, “Quantum Cosmology”, in Stephen W. Hawking and Werner Israel (eds.), Three Hundred Years of Gravitation, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, pp. 631–51.
  • –––, 1988, A Brief History of Time, New York: Bantam.
  • Heil, John, 2013, “Contingency”, in Goldschmidt, (ed.), The Puzzle of Existence: 167–81.
  • Hick, John, 1960, “God as Necessary Being”, Journal of Philosophy, 57(22/23): 725–33.
  • Hume, David, 1779, Dialogues Concerning Natural Religion, London. Reprinted Indianapolis: Hackett, 1980. [Hume 1779 available online]
  • –––, 1748, An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding, London. Reprinted Indianapolis: Hackett, 1993. [Hume 1748 available online]
  • Kant, Immanuel, 1781/1787, Critique of Pure Reason, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998. [Kant Critique available online]
  • Kenny, Anthony, 1969, The Five Ways, New York: Schocken Books.
  • Kerr, Gaven, 2012, “Esentially Ordered Series Reconsidered”, American Catholic Philosophical Quarterly, 864: 541–55. doi:10.5840/acpq201286445
  • Koons, Robert C., 1997, “A New Look at the Cosmological Argument”, American Philosophical Quarterly, 34(2): 193–211.
  • –––, 2008, “Epistemological Foundations for the Cosmological Argument”, in Jonathan L. Kvanvig, (ed.), Oxford Studies in the Philosophy of Religion, Oxford: Oxford University Press, pp. 105–133.
  • –––, 2014, “A New Kalam Argument: Revenge of the Grim Reaper”, Noûs, 48(2): 256–67. doi:10.1111/j.1468-0068.2012.00858.x
  • Leftow, Brian, 2012, God and Necessity, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199263356.001.0001
  • Leibniz, Gottfried, 1714, The Monadology, Pittsburgh, PA: University of Pittsburgh Press, 1991. [ Leibniz 1714 available online]
  • –––, 1965, On the Ultimate Origination of the Universe, in Monadology and Other Philosophical Essays, Paul Schreker and Anne Schreker, (trans.), Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill,
  • Leslie, John, 1979, Value and Existence, Totowa, NJ: Rowman and Littlefield.
  • Lieu, Richard, 2025, “Are Dark Matter and Dark Energy Omnipresent?”, Classical and Quantum Gravity, 42(7). doi:10.1088/1361-6382/adbed1
  • Loke, Andrew Tea Ern, 2014a, “A Modified Philosophical Argument for the Beginning of the Universe”, Think, 13(36): 71–83. doi:10.1017/S147717561300033X
  • –––, 2014b, “No Heartbreak at Hilbert’s Hotel: a Reply to Landon Hedrick”, Religious Studies, 50(1): 47–50. doi:10.1017/S0034412513000346
  • –––, 2017, God and Ultimate Origins: A Novel Cosmological Argument, New York: Palgrave Macmillan.
  • –––, 2022, The Teleological and Kalam Cosmological Arguments Revisited, New York: Macmillan. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-94403-2
  • –––, 2026, Natural Theology: A Reassessment, New York: Routledge.
  • Mackie, John L., 1982, The Miracle of Theism: Arguments for and against the Existence of God, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Malpass, Alex, 2023, “Andrew Loke’s Indirect Defense of the Successive Addition Argument”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 94(1): 43–61. doi:10.1007/s11153-023-09870-5
  • Martin, Michael, 1990, Atheism: A Philosophical Justification, Philadelphia: Temple University Press.
  • –––, 1991, The Case Against Christianity, Philadelphia: Temple University Press.
  • –––, 1986, “Swinburne’s Inductive Cosmological Argument”, Heythrop Journal, 27(2): 151–162. doi:10.1111/j.1468-2265.1986.tb00085.x
  • Mermin, N. David, 1985, “Is the moon there when nobody looks? Reality and the quantum theory”, Physics Today, 38(4): 38–47. doi:10.1063/1.880968
  • Miethe, Terry L., 1978, “The Cosmological Argument: A Research Bibliography”, New Scholasticism, 52(2): 285–305. doi:10.5840/newscholas197852210
  • Morriston, Wes, 2000, “Does the Beginning of the Universe Have a Personal Cause? A Critical Examination of the Kalam Cosmological Argument”, Faith and Philosophy, 17(2): 149–69. doi:10.5840/faithphil200017215
  • –––, 2002a, “Causes and Beginnings in the Kalam Argument: Reply to Craig”, Faith and Philosophy, 19(2): 233–44. doi:10.5840/faithphil200219218
  • –––, 2002b, “Craig on the Actual Infinite”, Religious Studies, 38: 147–166. doi:10.1017/S0034412502005978
  • –––, 2003, “Must Metaphysical Time Have a Beginning?”, Faith and Philosophy, 20(3): 288–306. doi:10.5840/faithphil200320338
  • –––, 2010, “Beginningless Past, Endless Future, and the Actual Infinite”, Faith and Philosophy, 27(4): 439–50. doi:10.5840/faithphil201027444
  • –––, 2021, “Infinity, Time, and Successive Addition”, Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 100(1): 70–85. doi:10.1080.00048402.2020.1865426
  • Musser, George, 2004, “Four Keys to Cosmology”, Scientific American 290(2) (February): 42–43.
  • Nichols, Shaun and Justin Steinberg, 2025, “Is the Cosmological Argument Intuitive?”, Religious Studies 61: S22–S24 doi:10.1017/S0034412525000046
  • Nowacki, Mark R., 2007, The “Kalām” Cosmological Argument for God, New York: Barnes and Noble.
  • Oberle, Thomas, 2022, “Grounding, Infinite Regress, and the Thomistic Cosmological Argument”, International Journal of Philosophy of Religion, 92: 147–66. doi:10.1007/s11153-022-09840-3
  • –––, 2024, “Metaphysical Explanation and the Cosmological Argument”, Philosophical Studies, 181: 1413–32. doi:10.1007/s11098-024-002148-0
  • O’Connor, Timothy, 2004,“‘And This All Men Call God’”, Faith and Philosophy, 21(4): 417–35. doi:10.5840/faithphil200421436 [O’Connor 2004 available online]
  • –––, 2008, Theism and Ultimate Explanation: The Necessary Shape of Contingency, London: Wiley-Blackwell.
  • –––, 2013, “Could There Be a Complete Explanation of Everything?” in Goldschmidt, (ed.), The Puzzle of Existence New York: Routledge: 22–45.
  • Oderberg, David S., 2002, “Traversal of the Infinite: the ‘Big Bang’, and the Kalam Cosmological Argument”, Philosophia Christi, 4(2): 305–344. doi:5840/pc2pp24236 Oderberg 2002 available online]
  • –––, 2013, “The Cosmological Argument”, in Chad Meister and Paul Copan (eds.), The Routledge Companion to Philosophy of Religion, London: Routledge, pp. 401–10.
  • Oppy, Graham, 1999, “Koons’ Cosmological Argument”, Faith and Philosophy, 16(3): 379–389. doi:10.5840/faithphil199916335
  • –––, 2000, “On ‘A New Cosmological Argument’”, Religious Studies, 36(3): 345–353. doi:10.1017/s0034412500005308
  • –––, 2002a, “Arguing about the Kalam Cosmological Argument”, Philo, 5(1): 34–61. doi:10.5840/philo2002513 [This article contains helpful references tracing the history of the debate between Craig and his critics like Oppy, Grünbaum, Mackie, and Smith.]
  • –––, 2002b,“Tristram Shandy Paradox”, Philosophia Christi, 4(2): 335–49.
  • –––, 2003, “From the Tristram Shandy Paradox to the Christmas Shandy Paradox: A Reply to Oderberg”, Ars Disputandi, 3: 1–24. doi:10.1080/15665399.2003.10819784 [Oppy 2003 available online]
  • –––, 2006, Arguing about Gods, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • –––, 2009, “Cosmological Arguments”, Noûs, 43(1): 31–48. doi:10.1111/j.1468-0068.2008.01694.x
  • –––, 2013, “Ultimate Naturalistic Causal Explanation”, in Goldschmidt, (ed.), The Puzzle of Existence: 46–63.
  • –––, 2015, “Uncaused Beginnings Revisited”, Faith and Philosophy, 32(2): 205–10. doi:5940/faithphil20154932
  • Ostrowick, John, 2012, “Is Theism a Simple, and Hence, Probable, Explanation for the Universe?”, South African Journal of Philosophy, 31(2): 354–68. doi:10.1080/02580136.2012.10751781
  • Park, John J., 2016, “The Kalām Cosmological Argument, the Big Bang, and Atheism”, Acta Analytica, 31: 323–335. doi:10.1007/s12136-015-0273-9
  • Pearson, Ezzy, Nov. 4, 2025, “We Might Finally Know What Came before the Big Bang”, BBC Science Focus, https://www.sciencefocus.com/space/big-bounce-expansion-cosmology. Retrieved Nov. 8, 2025.
  • Plantinga, Alvin, 1967, God and Other Minds, Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Potter, Karl H. (ed.), 1977, Indian Metaphysics and Epistemology: The Tradition of Nyāya-Vaiśeşika up to Gangeśa, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Proops, Ian, 2014, “Kant on the Cosmological Argument”, Philosophers’ Imprint, 14(12): 1–21.
  • Pruss, Alexander R., 1998, “The Hume-Edwards Principle and the Cosmological Argument”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 43: 149–65. doi:10.1023/a:1003167813221
  • –––, 2006, The Principle of Sufficient Reason: A Reassessment, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • –––, 2009, “ Leibnizian Cosmological Argument”, in Craig and Moreland, (eds.), The Blackwell Companion to Natural Theology, 2009: 24–100. [Pruss 2009 available online]
  • –––, 2018, Infinity, Causation, and Paradox, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • –––, and Joshua Rasmussen, 2018, Necessary Existence, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Puryear, Stephen, 2014, “Finitism and the Beginning of the Universe”, Australasian Journal of Philosophy 92: 619–29. doi:10080/00048402.949804
  • Quinn, Philip, 2005, “Cosmological Contingency and Theistic Explanation”, Faith and Philosophy, 22(5): 581–600. doi:10.5840/faithphil200522520
  • Rasmussen, Joshua, 2009, “From a Necessary Being to God”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 66(1): 1–13. doi:10.1007/s11153-008-9191-8
  • –––, 2010, “A New Argument for a Necessary Being”, Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 89(2): 351–56. doi:10.1080.00048402.2010.523706
  • –––, 2023, “Why Does Anything Exist? In Search of the Best Possible Answer”, TheoLogica: 1–14. doi:10.14428/thl.v8i2.77433
  • Reichenbach, Bruce R., 1972, The Cosmological Argument: A Reassessment, Springfield: Charles Thomas.
  • –––, 2004, “Explanation and the Cosmological Argument”, in Michael L. Peterson and Raymond J. VanArragon (eds.), Contemporary Debates in Philosophy of Religion, London: Blackwell, pp. 97–114.
  • –––, 2022, “Are Cosmological Arguments Good Arguments?” International Journal of Philosophy of Religion, 92(3): 129–45. doi:10.1007/s11153-022-09837-y
  • Rowe, William L., 1962, “The Fallacy of Composition”, Mind, 71(281): 87–92. doi:10.1093/mind/LXXI.281.87
  • –––, 1968, “The Cosmological Argument and the Principle of Sufficient Reason”, Man and World, 1(2): 278–92. doi:10.1007/BF01258405
  • –––, 1975, The Cosmological Argument, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • –––, 1997, “Circular Explanations, Cosmological Arguments, and Sufficient Reasons”, Midwest Studies in Philosophy, 21(1): 188–99. doi:10.1111/j.1475-4975.1997.tb00523.x
  • Rundle, Bede, 2004, Why There Is Something Rather than Nothing?, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Russell, Bertrand, 1937, The Principles of Mathematics, second edition (first edition 1903), London: George Allen & Unwin.
  • Russell, Bertrand and Frederick Copleston, 1948, “Debate on the Existence of God”, Reprinted in John Hick (ed.), 1964, The Existence of God, New York: Macmillan, pp. 167–90.
  • Rutten, Gerardus Johannes Emanuel, 2012, Towards a Renewed Case for Theism: A Critical Assessment of Contemporary Cosmological Arguments, Amsterdam: Vrije Universiteit. [Rutten 2012 available online]
  • Schmid, Joseph C. and Alex Malpass, 2023, “Branching Actualism and Cosmological Arguments”, Philosophical Studies, 180: 1951–73. https://doi.org/10.1007/s11098-023-01958-y
  • Scotus, John Duns, [c. 1300] 1964, Ordinatio, in Philosophical Writings: A Selection, Allan Wolter (trans.), Indianapolis: Bobbs-Merrill, 1964.
  • Senor, Thomas D., 2010, “On the Tenability of Brute Naturalism and the Implications of Brute Theism”, Philosophia Christi, 12(2): 273–80. doi:10.5840/pc201012226
  • Silk, Joseph, 2001, The Big Bang, San Francisco: W.H. Freeman.
  • Siniscalchi, Glenn B., 2018, “Contemporary Trends in Atheistic Criticism of Thomistic Natural Theology”, Heythrop Journal, 59: 689–706. doi:10.1111/j.1468-2265.2012.00777.x
  • Sincell, Marc, 2001, “Farthest Supernova Yet Bolsters Dark Energy”, Science, 292(5514): 27–28. doi:10.1126/science.292.5514.27a
  • Small, Robin, 1986, “Tristram Shandy’s Last Page”, British Journal for the Philosophy of Science, 37(2): 213–16. doi:10.1093/bjps/37.2.213
  • Smart, J.J.C., 1955, “The Existence of God”, in Antony Flew and Alasdair MacIntyre, (eds.), New Essays in Philosophical Theology, New York: Macmillan, 28–46.
  • Smart, J.J.C. and J.J. Haldane, 1996, Atheism and Theism, Oxford: Wiley-Blackwell.
  • Sobel, Jordan H., 2004, Logic and Theism: Arguments For and Against Beliefs in God, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press: chaps. 5 & 6.
  • Steinhardt, Paul J., 2011, “The Inflation Debate”, Scientific American, 304(4): 36–45.
  • –––, and Neil Turok, 2001, “A Cyclic Model of the Universe”, Science, 296: 1436–1439.
  • –––, 2002, “Cosmic Evolution in a Cyclic Universe”, Physical Review D, 65(12): 1–53. doi:10.1103/PhyRevD.65.126003
  • Swinburne, Richard, 1977, The Coherence of Theism, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • –––, 1979, The Existence of God, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • –––, 1983, “Mackie, Induction, and God”, Religious Studies, 19(3): 385–91. doi:10.1017/S0034412500015316
  • –––, 1993. The Coherence of Theism, revised edition, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • –––, 1996, Is There a God? Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • –––, 2001, Epistemic Justification, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • –––, 2004, The Existence of God, revised edition, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • –––, 2007, Revelation: From Metaphor to Analogy, 2nd edition, Oxford: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199212460.001.0001
  • –––, 2010, “God as the Simplest Explanation of the Universe”, European Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 2(1): 1–24. doi:10.1017/s135246111000142
  • –––, 2012, “What Kind of Necessary Being Could God Be?”, European Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 4(2), 1–18. doi:10.24204/ejpr.v412.292 2
  • –––, 2016, The Coherence of Theism, 2nd edition, Oxford: Clarendon Press. doi:10.1093/0198240708.001.0001
  • Taylor, Richard, 1992, Metaphysics, Englewood Cliffs: Prentice-Hall.
  • Tolman, Richard C., 1934, Relativity, Thermodynamics, and Cosmology, New York: Dover.
  • Udayana, [c. 900] 1996, Nyāyakusumāñjali, Indian Council of Philosophical Research, New Delhi: Distributed by Munshiram Manoharlal Publishers.
  • van Inwagen, Peter, 1983, An Essay on Free Will, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Waters, Ben, 2013, “Methuselah’s Diary and the Finitude of the Past”, Philosophia Christi, 15(2): 463–69. doi:10.5840/pc201315240
  • White, John D., 1979, “God’s Necessity”, International Journal for Philosophy of Religion, 10(1): 177–87. doi:10.1007/BF00143165

Other Internet Resources

Copyright © 2026 by
Bruce Reichenbach <reichen@augsburg.edu>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free