Argument from a Strong Principle of Sufficient Reason

Michael Almeida (2018) builds on the critical arguments of van Inwagen and others regarding the PSR. He contends that the version of the PSR used by defenders of the cosmological argument is inadequate because it fails to provide the best explanation for the universe. The best explanation, and hence the one required of a sound cosmological argument, is an absolute explanation, where everything is explained completely. There are no brute or contingent facts. He notes that in constructing their respective cosmological arguments, Pruss and Swinburne reject absolute explanation for complete explanations, where the effect is explained fully by the cause operating at a given time but where no explanation of the cause at the time of the occurrence is required. According to him, traditional defenders of the cosmological argument cannot invoke the requirement of an absolute explanation because if they did, given their metaphysic of actualist realism, they would incur a host of problems. Since all is determined on an absolute explanation, they would face the problems of the impossibility of libertarian free will, of indeterministic quantum effects, of modal imagination about lawless worlds where things pop into existence, and the collapse of modal distinctions. These problems, he says, arise not from an absolutist PSR per se but from its conjunction with actualist realism (only the actual is real).

The way around this, he contends, if one is going to defend the cosmological argument, is to opt for a different ontology, namely, genuine modal realism (mere possibilities are also real), which he claims not only can legitimize the cosmological argument but avoids the above problems. According to Almeida, modal realism makes libertarian free will compatible with necessitarianism in that two possible worlds can have the same history H up to time t, but at t, A occurs in one world and not in another world. The two histories do not determine whether A or -A occurs, but all possibilities necessarily occur. To make this work Almeida fudges on the principle of the identity of indiscernibles. Although the two series H and H* up to t are identical, there is not one series H that forks at t. Rather, there are two series, such that at t A can occur in one series and -A can occur in another. The past does not necessitate the future. Similarly, lawless or chaotic worlds, i.e., worlds lacking relations following a causal principle, are possible, so that it is possible and hence necessary that causeless events occur. In such a world the cosmological argument would still hold, he claims, because the principle of sufficient reason, compatible with the falsity of the causal principle, still holds. This analysis, he thinks, frees the defender of the cosmological argument from problems that trouble traditional formulations.

We cannot digress here into modal realism (for discussion of possible worlds, see entries on Possible Worlds and David Lewis: Modal Metaphysics), but turn specifically to Almeida’s cosmological argument. He argues that whereas cosmological arguments in the past commenced with an initial premise that was taken to express a contingent fact known a posteriori, “facts about change, causation, contingency, and objective…becoming are not usefully characterized as a posteriori facts” (2018: 3). He advances a cosmological argument with what he takes is an a priori fact: the pluriverse and everything in it, including all actualia and all possibilia, exist necessarily. This, he claims, is knowable a priori and according to the PSR requires an absolute explanation. Part of his novel approach is his contention that every proposition in the argument expresses a necessary fact known a priori, and that a priori propositions also require an explanation.

Since Almeida does not advance a detailed version of the cosmological argument, we might attempt to reconstruct his view.

1. “Possible worlds are composite concrete objects… [that] necessarily coexist” (2018: 75). This is a central contention of his Lewisian modal realism (75).
2. The pluriverse exists as “the collection of all possible worlds” (7, 75).
3. Everything that exists has an absolute explanation for its existence. Strong PSR
4. “Therefore, there is an absolute explanation for the pluriverse” (75).
5. An absolute explanation is possible “only if there are no contingent facts,” that is, only if everything exists necessarily (78–79).
6. Therefore, there are no brute or contingent facts.
7. This absolute explanation is found in the fact that God necessarily exists (75, 82).

The pluriverse is the necessary, creative manifestation of the necessarily existing God (5).

Although from necessary propositions contingent propositions cannot follow, necessary propositions can follow. That is, from God’s necessary existence we can conclude that the pluriverse necessarily exists. This avoids the van Inwagen objection to the PSR as employed in the cosmological argument. Almeida holds that it also avoids the other problems associated with the cosmological argument in that it allows for contingency within absolute explanation. He contends that contingency is protected by lowering the standards of similarity between worlds; that is, contingency is possible where we do not require exact identity between things held to exist in different worlds. He gives the example of his speaking Finnish, something he cannot do in the actual world. If someone who is identical to Almeida exists in another world, metaphysically he must have identical properties. However, it makes sense to say that in another possible world Almeida could speak Finnish and still be Almeida. We lower the standards of similarity in our everyday consideration of existence in alternate worlds to allow for such possibilities and hence for the contingency of his not speaking Finnish in the actual world.

Several objections might be raised against this version of the cosmological argument. Perhaps most basic is the question why one would accept modal realism. It is, as Almeida and others note, “ontologically extravagant”. Second, whereas necessity characterizes the metaphysical world, for Almeida contingency appears to be a subjective, epistemic contribution. That is, metaphysically, everything necessarily is what it is, has all its properties essentially, and is not something else. Epistemically, we can lower the standards of similarity, so that two things with somewhat differing essential properties can be named the same, although strictly or metaphysically speaking, they are not the same. Similarity is an epistemically expansive concept to allow for contingency, but it does not allow for metaphysical contingency. Third, he contends that there are no brute facts on his theory. However, if there must be an absolute explanation for everything, what is the explanation for God’s existence? He gives God as an absolute explanation for the necessary existence of the pluriverse, but no absolute sufficient reason for God’s existence. He might reply that God’s existence is explained by being metaphysically necessary. However, if this explains God’s existence, since every component of the pluriverse and the pluriverse itself necessarily exist, why could not their metaphysical necessity be a sufficient reason or absolute explanation for their existence? Could they, like God, simply be necessary?