The Meaning of Life

First published Tue May 15, 2007; substantive revision Fri Jun 26, 2026

Many major historical figures in philosophy have provided an answer to the question of what, if anything, makes life meaningful, although they typically have not put it in these terms (with such talk having arisen only in the past 250 years or so, on which see Landau 1997; Cassedy 2022). Consider, for instance, Aristotle on the human function, Aquinas on the beatific vision, and Kant on the highest good. Relatedly, think about Koheleth, the presumed author of the Biblical book Ecclesiastes, describing life as “futility” (or “vanity”) and akin to “the pursuit of wind”, Marx on alienation, Nietzsche on nihilism, as well as Schopenhauer when he remarks that whenever we reach a goal we have longed for we discover “how vain and empty it is.” While these concepts have some bearing on happiness (qua subjective well-being) and virtue (or their opposites), they are straightforwardly construed as accounts of which highly ranked purposes a person ought to realize that would make her life matter (if any would).

Despite the venerable pedigree, it is only since the 1980s or so that a distinct field of the meaning of life has been established in Anglo-American-Australasian, and specifically analytic, philosophy, which this survey exclusively addresses, and it is only in the past 25 years or so that debate with real depth and intricacy has appeared. The initial, 2007 entry on “The Meaning of Life” in this encyclopedia cited nearly all the analytic literature on the topic, but such is no longer possible. Analytic philosophy of life’s meaning has become vibrant, to the point where there are now way too many texts to be able to cite comprehensively in this version of the entry.

To obtain focus, it tends to discuss books, influential essays, and more recent texts that are squarely works of analytic philosophy appearing in the Anglo-American-Australasian tradition. In addition to leaving aside out of print books and older essays in that vein, it does not take up contributions from other philosophical traditions such as the phenomenological (e.g., Morioka 2025) or the altogether non-Western (for some references, see “Books on Life’s Meaning in Non-Western Traditions” below). Still more, it does not engage with works from cognate fields such as theology (e.g., Mittleman 2023), the history of ideas (e.g., Keefer 2022), the social sciences (e.g., Baumeister 1991), psychiatry (Stein 2021), or psychology (Schnell 2025). This entry’s central aim is to acquaint the reader with current analytic philosophical approaches to life’s meaning, sketching major concepts, positions, and debates as well as pointing out neglected topics that merit further consideration.

When the topic of the meaning of life comes up, people tend to pose one of three questions: “What are you talking about?”, “What is the meaning of (my) life?”, and “Is (my) life in fact meaningful?”. The literature on life's meaning composed by those working in the analytic tradition can be usefully organized according to which question it seeks to answer. This entry starts off with recent work that addresses the first, abstract (or “meta”) question regarding the sense of talk of “life’s meaning”, i.e., that aims to clarify what we have in mind when inquiring into the meaning of life (section 1).

Afterward, it considers texts that provide answers to the more substantive question about the nature of meaningfulness (sections 2–3). This entry focuses on normative-theoretical approaches to life’s meaning, that is, attempts to capture in a single, general principle all the variegated conditions that could confer meaning on life, or at least “mid-level” principles that would potentially apply to a large range of contexts (even if not all of them). It will accordingly do no more than mention work in the growing sub-field of applied meaning that parallels applied ethics, in which meaningfulness, and often theories of it, are considered in the context of particular cases or specific themes. Examples include downshifting (Levy 2005), implementing genetic enhancements (Agar 2013), handling a midlife crisis (Setiya 2014), shaping the workplace (Yeoman 2014), achieving things (Bradford 2015), getting an education (Schinkel et al. 2015), engaging with research participants (Olson 2016), automating labor (Danaher 2017), creating children (Ferracioli 2018), spending time in a virtual reality (Chalmers 2022), (over)using smartphones (Roholt 2022), interacting with artificial intelligence (Nyholm and Rüther 2023), dealing with a hypothetical “superintelligence” (Bostrom 2024), and being affected by cinema (Pamerleau 2025).

Finally, this entry also examines live arguments for the nihilist view that the conditions necessary for a meaningful life do not obtain for any of us, i.e., that all our lives are meaningless (section 4).

1. The Meaning of “Meaning” and of “Life”

One of the field's aims consists of the systematic attempt to identify what people essentially (or at least characteristically) have in mind when they think about the topic of life’s meaning. For many in the field, terms such as “importance” and “significance” are synonyms of “meaningfulness” and so are insufficiently revealing. However, there are those who elect to draw a distinction between meaningfulness as a psychological orientation on the one hand and significance on the other (Singer 1996, 112–18; Belliotti 2019, 145–50, 186) as well as between meaningfulness and importance relative to the value of other beings in the universe (Kahane 2014; Benatar 2017, 50). There is also debate about how the concept of a meaningless life relates to the ideas of a life that is absurd (Nagel 1970, 1986, 214–23; Feinberg 1980; Belliotti 2019), futile (Trisel 2002), and not worth living (Landau 2017, 12–15; Matheson 2017).

A useful way to begin to get clear about what thinking about life’s meaning normally involves (at least for analytic philosophers) is to specify the bearer. What does the inquirer have in mind by “life”? A standard distinction to draw is between the meaning “in” life, where the human person is what can exhibit meaning, and the meaning “of” life in a sense more specific than that of the title of this entry, where only the human species as a whole is what can be meaningful or not. Under the latter heading one can also find discussions of whether the universe has a point or why there is something rather than nothing (e.g., Munitz 1986; Parfit 1998), but this entry sets them aside for the sake of focus.

One might be tempted to think that, if one is interested in the question of whether, and, if so, how the human race as a whole could be meaningful, it in principle could be answered only by appeal to God having created it for a purpose. However, some non-theist accounts of humanity’s significance have been advanced (e.g., Mulgan 2015, 321–22, 330; Trisel 2016; Metz in Metz and Seachris 2024, 115–19).

A large majority of contemporary analytic philosophers have been interested in meaning in life, that is, in the meaningfulness that a person’s life could exhibit, with comparatively few these days addressing the meaning of life in the specific sense of querying the point of humanity as such. Even those who believe that God is or would be central to life’s meaning have lately addressed how an individual’s life might be meaningful in virtue of God more often than how the human race might be. There are some who argue that the meaningfulness of human life in general as such merits inquiry to no less a degree (Seachris 2013), if not more (Tartaglia 2015), than the meaning in a particular life, but most have instead been ultimately interested in whether their lives as individual persons (and the lives of those they do or should care about) are meaningful and how they could become more so. This entry follows suit in respect to the literature it addresses.

Addressing solely meaning in life now, there has been recent consideration of whether non-persons such as animals or human infants and rudimentary persons such as toddlers can have meaning in their lives, with probably most having rejected that possibility over the years (e.g., Wong 2008, 131, 147; Kauppinen 2012, 365; Fischer 2019, 1–24), but some lately making a case for it (Purves and Delon 2018; Thomas 2018; Stevenson 2024, 592; Hauskeller 2025, 149–71; Kipke 2025a). Even if some meaning is on offer to a being that is not a person, it would be worth considering whether the sort and degree of meaning available to it is comparable to what is on offer to a person.

Quite under-explored is the issue of whether groups smaller than the human race can be bearers of meaning in life, and, if so, under what conditions. Can a people, nation, or organization be meaningful, where the meaning would not merely be an aggregate of whatever meaning its individual members have?

Continuing to focus on meaning in life, it is quite common to maintain that it is conceptually something good for its own sake or, relatedly, something that provides a basic reason for action (on which see Visak 2017). There are a few who have recently suggested otherwise, maintaining that there can be neutral or even undesirable kinds of meaning in a person’s life (e.g., Mawson 2016, 90, 193; Thomas 2018, 291, 294). However, these are outliers, with most analytic philosophers, and presumably laypeople, instead wanting to know when an individual’s life exhibits a certain kind of final value (or acts according to a non-instrumental reason for action).

Another claim about which there is substantial consensus is that meaningfulness is not all or nothing and instead comes in degrees, such that some periods of life are more meaningful than others and that some lives as a whole (at least as a sum of meaningful parts) are more meaningful than others. Note that one can coherently hold the view that some people’s lives are less meaningful (or even in a certain sense less “important”) than others, or are even meaningless (unimportant), and still maintain that people have an equal standing from a moral point of view. Consider a consequentialist moral principle according to which each individual counts for one in virtue of having a capacity for a meaningful life, or a Kantian approach according to which all people have a dignity in virtue of their capacity for autonomous decision-making that is constitutive of meaning (Nozick 1974, 48–51). For both moral outlooks, we could be required to help people with relatively meaningless lives.

Yet another relatively uncontroversial element of the concept of meaningfulness in respect of individual persons is that it is logically distinct from happiness or rightness (emphasized in Wolf 2010, 2016). First, to ask whether someone’s life is meaningful is not one and the same as asking whether her life is pleasant or she is otherwise subjectively well off. A life in the hypothetical “experience machine” could surely be a happy one, but very few take it to be a prima facie candidate for meaningfulness (Nozick 1974, 42–45). This thought experiment targets subjective well-being but some contend that it is objective well-being talk to which meaning can be reduced (e.g., Hammerton 2022). That is also a minority view these days, particularly since subjectivism about meaning is not logically contradictory. In addition, focusing squarely on objective properties, posthumous meaning is intuitively possible (consider the reception of Van Gogh’s artworks) where the category of well-being seems aptly restricted to the state of a living organism, and, still more, it appears logically possible to obtain meaning by making a net sacrifice of one’s objective well-being, e.g., by helping others at the expense of one’s self-interest in the way Mother Teresa is stereotypically imagined to have done. Second, asking whether a person’s existence over time is meaningful is not identical to considering whether she has been morally upright; there are intuitively ways to enhance meaning that have nothing to do with right action or moral virtue, such as making a scientific discovery or becoming an excellent dancer.

Now, one might argue that a life would be meaningless if, or even because, it were unhappy or immoral, but that would be to posit a synthetic, substantive relationship between the concepts, far from indicating that speaking of “meaningfulness” is analytically a matter of connoting ideas regarding happiness or rightness. The question of what (if anything) makes a person’s life meaningful is conceptually distinct from the questions of what makes a life happy or moral, even if it could turn out that the best answer to the former question appeals to an answer to one of the latter questions.

Supposing, then, that talk of “meaning in life” connotes something good for its own sake that can come in degrees and that is not analytically equivalent to happiness or rightness, what else does it involve? What more can we say about this final value, by definition?

As above, most contemporary analytic philosophers would say that the relevant value is absent from spending time in the experience machine (but see Goetz 2012 for a different view) or, one can add, living akin to Sisyphus, the mythic figure doomed by the Greek gods to roll a stone up a hill for eternity (famously discussed by Albert Camus; see also Taylor 1970). In addition, many would say that the relevant value is typified by the classic triad of “the good, the true, and the beautiful”. These terms are not to be taken literally or comprehensively but instead are rough catchwords for beneficent relationships (love, friendship, morality), intellectual reflection of certain kinds (wisdom, education, discovery), and creativity (particularly the arts, but also potentially things like humor, fashion, or gardening).

Pressing further, is there something that the values of the good, the true, the beautiful, and any other logically possible sources of meaning involve and that is absent from the experience machine and Sisyphus thought experiments? There is as yet no consensus in the field. One salient view is that the concept of meaning in life is a cluster or amalgam of overlapping ideas, such as fulfilling higher-order purposes, meriting substantial esteem or admiration, having a noteworthy impact, transcending one’s animal nature, making sense, or exhibiting a compelling life-story (Markus 2004, 138–60; Metz 2013, 24–35; Seachris 2013, 3–4, 2016; Mawson 2016; Metz and Seachris 2024). However, there are philosophers who maintain that something much more monistic is true of the concept, so that (nearly) all thought about meaningfulness in a person’s life is essentially about a single property. Suggestions from the literature include being devoted to or in awe of qualitatively superior goods (Taylor 1989, 3–24), transcending one’s limits (Levy 2005), or making a contribution (Martela 2017).

There has been something of an “interpretive turn” in the field, one instance of which is the strong view that meaning-talk is logically about whether and how a life is intelligible within a wider frame of reference (Goldman 2018, 116–29; Seachris 2019; Thomas 2019; Weber-Guskar 2023; cf. Repp 2018). According to this approach, inquiring into life’s meaning is nothing other than seeking out sense-making information, perhaps a narrative about life or an explanation of its source and destiny. This analysis has the advantage of promising to unify a wide array of uses of the term “meaning.” However, it has the disadvantages of being unable to capture the intuitions that meaning in life is essentially good for its own sake (Landau 2017, 12–15), that it is not logically contradictory to maintain that an ineffable condition is what confers meaning on life (as per Nozick 1981, 600–10; Cooper 2003, 126–42; Bennett-Hunter 2014; Waghorn 2014), and that often human actions themselves (as distinct from an interpretation of them), such as rescuing a child from a burning building, are what bear meaning. Debate continues about how to construe the meaning of “meaning in life”.

Some thinkers have suggested that a complete analysis of the concept of life’s meaning should include what has been called “anti-matter” (Metz 2013, 63–65, 71–73) or “anti-meaning” (Campbell and Nyholm 2015; Egerstrom 2015), i.e., conditions that reduce the meaningfulness of a life. The thought is that meaning is well represented by a bipolar scale, where there is a dimension of not merely positive conditions, but also negative ones. Gratuitous cruelty or destructiveness are prima facie candidates for actions that do not merely fail to add meaning and so score a zero on the scale, but also subtract from any meaning one’s life might have had.

Despite ongoing contestation about how to analyze the concept of life’s meaning (or articulate the definition of the phrase “meaning in life”), the field remains in a good position to make progress on the other key questions posed above, viz., of what would make a life meaningful and whether any lives are in fact meaningful. A certain amount of common ground is provided by the point that meaningfulness at least involves a gradient final value in a person’s life that is conceptually distinct from happiness and rightness, with exemplars of it being the good, the true, and the beautiful. The rest of this discussion addresses philosophical attempts to capture the nature of this value theoretically and to ascertain whether it exists in at least some of our lives.

2. Supernaturalism

Most analytic philosophers writing on meaning in life have been trying to develop and evaluate theories, i.e., fundamental and general principles, that are meant to capture all the particular ways that a life could obtain meaning. As in moral philosophy, there are recognizable “anti-theorists”, i.e., those who maintain that there is too much pluralism among meaning conditions to be able to unify them in the form of a principle (e.g., Kekes 2000; Hosseini 2015). Arguably, though, the systematic search for unity is too nascent to be able to draw a firm conclusion about whether it is available.

The theories are standardly divided on a metaphysical basis, that is, in terms of which kinds of properties are held to constitute the meaning. Supernaturalist theories are views according to which a spiritual realm is central to meaning in life, that is, necessary for it or for some particularly valuable kind of it. Most Western philosophers have conceived of the spiritual in terms of God or a soul as commonly understood in the Abrahamic faiths (but see Mulgan 2015 for discussion of meaning in the context of a God uninterested in us). In contrast, naturalist theories are views that the physical world as known particularly well by the scientific method is sufficient for life’s meaning.

There is logical space for a non-naturalist theory, according to which essential to meaning is an abstract property that is neither spiritual nor physical. However, only scant attention has been paid to this possibility in the recent Anglo-American-Australasian literature (Audi 2005 is an exception), and this entry now sets it aside.

It is important to note that supernaturalism, a claim that God (or a soul) would confer meaning on a life, is logically distinct from theism, the claim that God (or a soul) exists. Although most who hold supernaturalism also hold theism, one could accept the former without the latter (as Camus did), committing one to the view that life is meaningless or at least lacks substantial meaning. Similarly, while most naturalists are atheists, it is not contradictory to maintain that God exists but has nothing to do with meaning in life (or perhaps even detracts from it). Although these combinations of positions are logically possible, some of them might be substantively implausible. The field could benefit from discussion of the comparative attractiveness of various combinations of evaluative claims about what would make life meaningful and metaphysical claims about whether spiritual conditions exist.

Two different types of supernaturalism have become distinguished on a regular basis (critically surveyed in Metz 2019). That is true, not only in the literature on life’s meaning, but also in that on the related pro-theism/anti-theism debate, about whether it would be desirable for God or a soul to exist (e.g., Kahane 2011; Kraay 2018; Lougheed 2020). On the one hand, there is extreme supernaturalism, according to which spiritual conditions are necessary for any meaning in life. If neither God nor a soul exists, then, by this view, everyone’s life is meaningless. On the other hand, there is moderate supernaturalism, according to which spiritual conditions are necessary for a great or ultimate meaning in life, although not meaning in life as such. If neither God nor a soul exists, then, by this view, everyone’s life could be meaningful, but no one’s life could exhibit the most desirable meaning. For a moderate supernaturalist, God or a soul would substantially enhance meaningfulness or be a major contributory condition for it.

There are a variety of ways that great or ultimate meaning has been described, sometimes quantitatively as “infinite” (Mawson 2016), qualitatively as “deeper” (Swinburne 2016), relationally as “unlimited” (Nozick 1981, 618–19), temporally as “eternal” (Cottingham 2016), and perspectivally as “from the point of view of the universe” (Benatar 2017). There has been no reflection as yet on the crucial question of how these distinctions might bear on each another, for instance, on whether some are more basic than others or some are more valuable than others.

Cross-cutting the extreme/moderate distinction is one between God-centered theories and soul-centered ones. According to the former, some kind of connection with God (understood to be a spiritual person who is all-knowing, all-good, and all-powerful and who is the ground of the physical universe) constitutes meaning in life, even if one lacks a soul (construed as an immortal, spiritual substance that is or contains one’s identity). In contrast, by the latter, having a soul and putting it into a certain state is what makes life meaningful, even if God does not exist. Many supernaturalists of course believe that God and a soul are jointly necessary for a (greatly) meaningful existence. However, the simpler view, that only one of them is necessary, is common, and sometimes arguments proffered for the complex view fail to support it any more than the simpler one.

2.1 God-centered Views

The most influential God-based account of meaning in life, and the one that is the oldest in the Western tradition, has been the extreme view that one’s existence is significant if and only if one fulfills a purpose God has assigned. The familiar idea is that God has a plan for the universe and that one’s life is meaningful just to the degree that one helps God realize this plan, perhaps in a particular way that God wants one to do so. If a person failed to do what God intends her to do with her life or of course if God does not even exist, then, on the current view, her life would be utterly meaningless.

Thinkers differ over what it is about God’s purpose that might make it uniquely able to confer meaning on human lives, but probably the most influential argument has been that only God’s purpose could be the source of invariant moral rules (Moreland 1987, 124–29; Craig 1994/2013, 161–67) or of objective values more generally (Markus 2004, 259–65, 380–87; Cottingham 2005, 37–57; Seachris in Metz and Seachris 2024), where a lack of such would render our lives nonsensical. According to this argument, lower goods such as animal pleasure or desire satisfaction could exist without God, but higher ones pertaining to meaning in life, particularly living up to a universally binding moral code, could not.

Critics might initially point to many intuitive non-moral sources of meaning in life (e.g., Kekes 2000; Wolf 2010), but God-based theorists reply that those surely involve some notion of objective value that also logically depends on God. So, the real nub of the debate is how to answer the question “Where does objective value come from?”, supposing it exists. There are a variety of naturalist and non-naturalist accounts of a universal morality, and of objective value more generally, that are on offer these days (realist, rationalist, intuitionist, etc.), and so it is far from clear that it could come only from the supernatural source of God’s will. In addition, some maintain that the old Euthyphro problem facing Divine Command Theories still has not been resolved, particularly in the context of the philosophy of life’s meaning (Koons 2022).

One recurrent objection to the idea that God’s purpose (not necessarily God as such) could make life meaningful is that if God had created us with a purpose in mind, then God would have degraded us thereby. What is supposed to follow from that claim is unclear, but it could be that God, being morally perfect, would therefore not assign us a purpose in the first place or that, if God were to do so, we could not obtain meaning by fulfilling it. The objection harks back to Jean-Paul Sartre, but in the analytic literature Kurt Baier was the first to articulate it (1957/2000, 118–20; see also Singer 1996, 29; Kahane 2011; Lougheed 2020, 121–41). Sometimes the concern is the threat of punishment God would make so that we do God’s bidding, but more common are these rationales: the source of meaning would be constrictive and not up to us; our dignity would be maligned simply by having been created with a certain end in mind; we would be expected to defer to the aims of a superior being (for some replies to such concerns, see Cottingham 2005, 37–57; Lougheed 2020, 111–21). These objections to God qua purposive leave open the possibility that God could confer meaning on our lives in some way other than assigning us a purpose that we are expected to fulfill.

There is indeed a different argument for an extreme God-based view that focuses less on God as purposive and more on God as infinite, unlimited, or ineffable, which Robert Nozick first articulated with care (Nozick 1981, 594–618; for sophisticated developments, see Bennett-Hunter 2014; Waghorn 2014). The core idea is that for a finite condition to be meaningful, it must obtain its meaning from another condition that has meaning. So, if one’s life is meaningful, it might be so in virtue of being married to a person, who is important. Being finite, the spouse must obtain his or her importance from elsewhere, perhaps from the sort of work he or she does. This work also must obtain its meaning by being related to something else that is meaningful, and so on. A regress on meaningful conditions is present, and the suggestion is that the regress can terminate only in something so all-encompassing that it need not (indeed, cannot) go beyond itself to obtain meaning from anything else. And that is God.

The standard objection to this relational rationale is that a finite condition could be meaningful without obtaining its meaning from another meaningful condition. Perhaps it could be meaningful in itself, without being connected to something beyond it, or, as Nozick himself came to hold, maybe it could obtain its meaning by being related to something else that is beautiful or otherwise valuable for its own sake but not meaningful (Nozick 1989, 167–68).

A serious concern for any extreme God-based view is the existence of apparent counterexamples. If we think of the lives of Albert Einstein, Nelson Mandela, and Pablo Picasso, they seem meaningful to a notable degree even if we suppose there is no all-knowing, all-powerful, and all-good spiritual person who is the ground of the physical world (e.g., Wielenberg 2005, 31–37, 49–50; Landau 2017). Even religiously inclined philosophers have lately found this point hard to deny (Quinn 2000, 58; Audi 2005; Mawson 2016, 5; Williams 2020, 132–34).

Largely for that reason, contemporary supernaturalists have tended to opt for moderation, that is, to maintain that God would greatly enhance the meaning in our lives, even if some meaning would be possible in a world without God. One approach is to invoke the relational argument to show that God is necessary, not for any meaning whatsoever, but rather for an ultimate meaning. “Limited transcendence, the transcending of our limits so as to connect with a wider context of value which itself is limited, does give our lives meaning––but a limited one. We may thirst for more” (Nozick 1981, 618). Another angle is to appeal to playing a role in God’s plan, again to claim, not that it is essential for meaning as such, but rather for “a cosmic significance….instead of a significance very limited in time and space” (Swinburne 2016, 154; see also Quinn 2000; Cottingham 2016, 131). Another rationale is that by fulfilling God’s purpose, we would meaningfully please God, a perfect person, as well as be remembered favorably by God forever (Cottingham 2016, 135; Williams 2020, 21–22, 29, 101, 108), which would be extra sources of meaning beyond what we could have obtained by performing the same actions in an atheist world.

In reply to such rationales for a moderate supernaturalism, there has been the suggestion that, with the opportunity for greater meaning from God would also come that for greater anti-meaning, so that it is not clear that a world with God would offer a net gain in respect of meaning (Metz 2019, 34–35). For example, if pleasing God would greatly enhance meaning in our lives, then presumably displeasing God would greatly reduce it and to a comparable degree. In addition, and more frequently, there are fresh arguments for extreme naturalism (or its “anti-theist” cousin) discussed below, according to which, even if God would alone make possible a greater sort of meaning, God’s existence would also occlude other sorts (sub-section 3.3).

2.2 Soul-centered Views

Notice that none of the above arguments for supernaturalism appeals to the prospect of eternal life (at least not explicitly). Arguments that do make such an appeal are soul-centered, holding that meaning in life comes from having an immortal, spiritual substance that is contiguous with one’s body when it is alive and that will forever outlive its death. Some think of the afterlife in terms of one’s soul permanently entering a transcendent, spiritual realm (Heaven), while others conceive of one’s soul getting reincarnated into another body on Earth or otherwise in the universe. According to the extreme version, if one has a soul but fails to put it in the right state or if one lacks a soul altogether, then one’s life is meaningless.

There are four prominent arguments for an extreme soul-based perspective, some of which have been prominent for centuries. One argument, made famous by Leo Tolstoy, is the suggestion that for life to be meaningful something must be worth doing, that something is worth doing only if it will make a permanent difference to the world, and that making a permanent difference requires being immortal (see also Morris 1992, 26, 197–99; Craig 1994).

Critics most often appeal to counterexamples, suggesting for instance that it is surely worth your time and effort to help prevent people from suffering, even if you and they are mortal. Indeed, some have gone on the offensive and argued that helping people is worth the sacrifice only if and because they are mortal, for otherwise they could invariably be compensated in an afterlife (e.g., Wielenberg 2005, 91–94). Another criticism is that the major motivations for the claim that nothing matters now if one day it will end are incoherent (Greene 2021).

A second argument for the view that life would be meaningless without a soul is that it is necessary for justice to be done, which, in turn, is necessary for a meaningful life. Life seems nonsensical when the wicked flourish and the righteous suffer, at least supposing there is no other world in which these injustices will be rectified, whether by God or a Karmic force. Something like this argument can be found in Ecclesiastes, and it continues to be defended (e.g., Craig 1994, 2009).

However, even granting that an afterlife is required for perfectly just outcomes, it is far from obvious that an eternal afterlife is necessary for them. Why deny that 1000 years would suffice for justice to be done to the wicked and the righteous? There is also the suggestion that some lives, such as Mandela’s, have been meaningful precisely in virtue of encountering injustice and fighting it.

A third argument for thinking that having a soul is essential for any meaning is that it is required to have the sort of free will without which our lives would be meaningless. Immanuel Kant is known for having maintained that if we were merely physical beings, subjected to the laws of nature like everything else in the material world, then we could not act for moral reasons and specifically could not reach the “highest good” of perfecting our virtue and receiving happiness proportionate to that. Kant himself thought that was some evidence that (from a practical point of view) we must believe that we have a soul in order for life to be meaningful. One theologian has eloquently put the point in religious terms: “The moral spirit finds the meaning of life in choice. It finds it in that which proceeds from man and remains with him as his inner essence rather than in the accidents of circumstances and turns of external fortune….(W)henever a human being rubs the lamp of his moral conscience, a Spirit does appear. This Spirit is God….It is in the ‘Thou must’ of God and man’s ‘I can’ that the divine image of God in human life is contained” (Swenson 1949/2000, 27–28). Notice that, even if moral norms did not spring from God’s commands, the logic of the present argument entails that one’s life could be meaningful only so long as one had the inherent ability to make the morally correct choice in any situation, which, in turn, seems to require something non-physical about one’s self, so as to be able to overcome whichever physical laws and forces one might confront.

A common objection to this reasoning is to advance compatibilism about having a determined physical nature and being able to act for moral reasons (e.g., Arpaly 2006; Fischer 2009, 145–77). It is also worth wondering whether, even if one did have to have a spiritual essence in order to make free, moral choices, it would have to be one that never perished, even in order to reach an ideal.

A fourth rationale for thinking that a soul is necessary for meaning is that human nature craves an eternal realization of one’s potentials. Although the natural world can satisfy an array of “surface” desires that we might have, certain “deep” or “fundamental” aspirations for completeness could be satisfied only in the context of a spiritual realm (Markus 2004, 387–90; Haught 2006). Implicit is the idea that meaning in life is a matter of realizing the deepest parts of our being.

One reply (which also bears on the other rationales) is to query why a soul should be thought necessary for the relevant sort of eternity. We can imagine a life that never ends in an ever-expanding universe, after all. Although it is true that our lives appear to be finite in this world, we can readily conceive of another, purely physical one in which they are not, which threatens the claim to necessity on the part of the soul-centered theorist. Another reply is to point out how parochial the so-called “deep” aspirations are; they are characteristic of many in the Judeo-Christian-Islamic traditions but are much rarer to encounter among those brought up in Confucian, Hindu, or traditional African ones (for both replies, see Metz in Metz and Seachris 2024).

Like God-centered theorists, many soul-centered theorists these days advance a moderate view, accepting that some meaning in life would be possible without immortality, but arguing that a much greater meaning would be possible with it. Again granting that Einstein, Mandela, Picasso, and the like had somewhat meaningful lives despite not having survived the deaths of their bodies (as per, e.g., Trisel 2004; Wolf 2015, 89–140; Landau 2017), some think there nonetheless remains a powerful thought: more would be better. If a finite life with the good, the true, and the beautiful has meaning in it to some degree, then surely it would have all the more meaning if it exhibited such higher values––including a relationship with God––for an eternity (Goetz 2012, 44, 47; Cottingham 2016, 132–35, 2024; Mawson 2016, 2019, 52–53; Williams 2020, 112–34; Seachris in Metz and Seachris 2024, 39–41, 56–57, 65–68, 203–6; cf. Benatar 2017, 35–63).

One objection to this reasoning is that the infinity of meaning that would be possible with a soul would be “too big”, rendering it difficult for the moderate supernaturalist to make sense of the intution that a finite life such as Einstein’s can indeed count as meaningful by comparison (Metz 2019, 30–31; cf. Mawson 2019, 53–54). More common, though, is the objection that an eternal life would include unwelcome aspects such as boredom and repetition, discussed below in the context of extreme naturalism (sub-section 3.3).

3. Naturalism

Recall that naturalism is the view that a physical life (and perhaps what supervenes on it) is sufficient for life’s meaning, i.e., that even if there is no spiritual realm, a substantially meaningful life is possible in a spatio-temporal world composed of sub-atomic particles and known particularly well by the various sciences that include not just physics and chemistry, but also biology, psychology, and sociology. The term “naturalism” in contemporary debate about life’s meaning, as distinguished from non-naturalism, connotes a kind of physicalism, the view that meaning is constituted by the physical (or perhaps what supervenes on it), which is not to suggest that only the language or concepts of physics can tell us about what is meaningful. Hence what is called “naturalism” is consistent with the reality of, for instance, minds and social groups, on the plausible supposition that these are at bottom determined by, even if not identical to, configurations of physical properties that the specific science of physics does not apprehend well at all.

Like supernaturalism, contemporary naturalism admits of two distinguishable variants, moderate and extreme. The moderate version is that, while a genuinely meaningful life could be had in a purely physical universe as known well by the sciences, a more meaningful life would be possible if a spiritual realm also existed. God or a soul could enhance meaning in life, although they would not be major contributors. The extreme version of naturalism, which has come to fruition only in the past 15 years, is the view that it would be better in respect of life’s meaning if there were no spiritual realm (and if instead some physical world other than ours obtained). From this perspective, God or a soul would be anti-matter, i.e., would detract from the meaning available to us, making a purely physical world (even if not the actual one) preferable.

Cross-cutting the moderate/extreme distinction is that between subjectivism and objectivism, which are theoretical accounts of the nature of meaningfulness insofar as it is physical. They differ in terms of the extent to which the human mind constitutes meaning and whether there are conditions of meaning that are invariant among human beings. Subjectivists believe that there are no invariant standards of meaning because meaning is relative to the subject, i.e., depends on an individual’s pro-attitudes such as her particular ends, which are not shared by everyone. Roughly, something is meaningful for a person if she intends to seek it out and she gets it. Objectivists maintain, in contrast, that there are some invariant standards for meaning because meaning is at least partly mind-independent, i.e., obtains not merely in virtue of being the object of anyone’s mental states. Here, something is meaningful (partially) because of its intrinsic nature, in the sense of being independent of whether it is intended, wanted, or the like; meaning is instead (to some extent) the sort of thing that merits these reactions.

There is logical space for an orthogonal view, according to which there are invariant standards of meaningfulness constituted by what all human beings would converge on from a certain standpoint. However, it has not been much of a player in the field (Darwall 1983, 164–66 is an exception).

The subjective/objective distinction is reminiscent of the main division in contemporary debate about well-being, but the specific subjective or objective properties will often differ depending on the value category. For example, whereas subjective well-being is normally construed as desire satisfaction or pleasant experiences, subjective meaning is typically cashed out in terms of goal attainment or choices.

3.1 Subjectivism

According to this version of naturalism, meaning in life varies from person to person, depending on each one’s variable pro-attitudes. Common instances are views that one’s life is more meaningful, the more one achieves one’s highly ranked goals, does what one believes to be really important, or acts on agent-relative reasons (e.g., Trisel 2002; Hooker 2008; Svensson 2017; Calhoun 2018; Attoe 2023, 101–24; Hauskeller 2025). One influential subjectivist has maintained that the relevant mental state is caring or loving, so that life is meaningful just to the extent that one cares about or loves something (Frankfurt 1988, 80–94, 2004). Another proposal is that meaningfulness consists of “an active engagement and affirmation that vivifies the person who has freely created or accepted and now promotes and nurtures the projects of her highest concern” (Belliotti 2019, 183).

Subjectivism was dominant in the middle of the twentieth century, when positivism, noncognitivism, existentialism, and Humeanism were influential (Ayer 1947; Hare 1957; Barnes 1967; Taylor 1970; Williams 1976). However, in the last quarter of the twentieth century, inference to the best explanation and reflective equilibrium became accepted forms of normative argumentation and were frequently used to defend claims about the existence and nature of objective value (or of “external reasons”, ones obtaining independently of one’s extant attitudes). As a result, subjectivism about meaning lost its dominance. Those who continue to hold subjectivism often remain suspicious of attempts to justify the reality of objective value (e.g., Trisel 2002, 73, 79, 2004, 378–79; Frankfurt 2004, 47–48, 55–57; Wong 2008, 138–39; Evers 2017, 32, 36; Svensson 2017, 54; Hauskeller 2025). Theorists are drawn to subjectivism typically because the alternatives are unpalatable; they are confident that meaning in life obtains for some people, but do not see how it could be grounded on something independent of the mind, whether it be the natural or the supernatural (or the non-natural). In contrast to these possibilities, it appears straightforward to account for what is meaningful in terms of what people find meaningful or what people want out of their lives. Wide-ranging meta-ethical debates in epistemology, metaphysics, and the philosophy of language are necessary to address this major rationale for subjectivism.

There are however other, more circumscribed arguments for subjectivism about meaning in life, according to which subjectivist theories best explain certain intuitive features of it. For one, subjectivism about meaning in life seems plausible since it is reasonable to think that a meaningful life is an authentic one (Frankfurt 1988, 80–94; cf. Taylor 1992). If a person’s life is significant insofar as she is true to herself or her deepest nature, then we have some reason to believe that meaning simply is a function of those matters for which the person cares. For another, it is uncontroversial that often meaning comes from losing oneself, i.e., in becoming absorbed in an activity or experience, as opposed to being bored by it or finding it frustrating (Frankfurt 1988, 80–94; Belliotti 2019, 162–70). Work that concentrates the mind and relationships that are engrossing seem central to meaning and to be so because of the subjective elements involved. For a third, meaning is often taken to be something that makes life worth continuing for a specific person, i.e., that gives her a reason to get out of bed in the morning, which subjectivism is thought to account for best (Williams 1976; Svensson 2017; Calhoun 2018).

Critics maintain that these arguments are vulnerable to a common objection: they neglect the role of objective value (or an external reason) in realizing oneself, losing oneself, and having a reason to live (Taylor 1989, 1992; Wolf 2010, 2015, 89–140). One is not really being true to oneself, losing oneself in a meaningful way, or having a genuine reason to live insofar as one, say, successfully maintains 3,732 hairs on one’s head (Taylor 1992, 36), cultivates one’s prowess at long-distance spitting (Wolf 2010, 104), collects a big ball of string (Wolf 2010, 104), or, well, eats one’s own excrement (Wielenberg 2005, 22). The counterexamples suggest that subjective conditions are insufficient to ground meaning in life; there seem to be certain actions, relationships, and states that are objectively valuable (but see Evers 2017, 30–32) and toward which one’s pro-attitudes ought to be oriented, if meaning is to accrue. In addition, some objectivists explicitly accept the relevance of individuality or uniqueness for meaning in life and try to explain how mind-independent meaningfulness could provide different reasons for action for various people (e.g., Kipke 2025b).

Subjectivists usually seek to avoid the above counterexamples, lest they have to bite the bullet of accepting the meaningfulness of maintaining 3,732 hairs on one’s head and all the rest (for some who do, see Svensson 2017, 54–55; Belliotti 2019, 181–83). As in parallel debates pertaining to well-being, one common strategy is to suggest that subjectivism can evade counterintuitive implications by appealing to the right sort of pro-attitude. Instead of whatever an individual happens to want, perhaps the relevant mental state is an emotional-perceptual one of seeing-as (Alexis 2011; cf. Hosseini 2015, 47–66), a “categorical” desire, that is, an intrinsic desire constitutive of one’s identity that one takes to make life worth continuing (Svensson 2017), or a judgment that one has a good reason to value something highly for its own sake (Calhoun 2018). Even here, though, objectivists argue that it might “appear that whatever the will chooses to treat as a good reason to engage itself is, for the will, a good reason. But the will itself….craves objective reasons; and often it could not go forward unless it thought it had them” (Wiggins 1988, 136). And without any appeal to objectivity, it is likely that counterexamples would resurface.

Another subjectivist strategy by which to deal with the counterexamples is the attempt to ground meaningfulness, not on the pro-attitudes of an individual valuer, but on those of a group (Darwall 1983, 164–66; Brogaard and Smith 2005; Wong 2008). Does such an intersubjective move avoid (more of) the counterexamples? If so, does it do so as well as an objective theory?

3.2 Objectivism

Objective naturalists believe that meaning in life is constituted at least in part by something physical beyond merely the fact that what a certain pro-attitude is about has been obtained. A person realizing the object of her emotion, desire, or judgment is not sufficient for meaningfulness, on this view. Instead, for the objectivist, there are certain conditions of the material world that could confer meaning on life, not merely because they are viewed as meaningful, wanted for their own sake, or believed to be choiceworthy, but instead (at least partially) because they are inherently worthwhile or valuable in themselves.

In at least the modern Western tradition, morality (the good), enquiry (the true), and creativity (the beautiful) are widely held instances of activities that confer meaning on life, while trimming toenails and eating snow––along with the counterexamples to subjectivism above––are not. Objectivism is widely thought to be a powerful general explanation of these particular judgments: the former are meaningful not merely because some agent (whether it is an individual or her society) cares about them or judges them to be worth doing, while the latter simply lack significance and cannot obtain it even if some agent does care about them or judge them to be worth doing. From an objective perspective, it is possible for an individual to care about the wrong thing or to be mistaken that something is worthwhile, and not merely because of something she cares about all the more or judges to be still more choiceworthy. Of course, meta-ethical debates about the existence and nature of value are again relevant to appraising this rationale.

Some objectivists think that being the object of a person’s mental states plays no constitutive role in making that person’s life meaningful, although they of course contend that it often plays an instrumental role––chances are high that liking a certain activity will motivate one to do it. Relatively few objectivists are “pure” in that way, although consequentialists do stand out as clear instances (e.g., Singer 1995; Smuts 2018, 75–99; Stevenson 2024). Most objectivists instead try to account for the above intuitions driving subjectivism by holding that a life is more meaningful, not merely because of objective factors, but also in part because of propositional attitudes such as cognition, conation, and emotion. Quite influential has been Susan Wolf’s “hybrid” view, captured by this pithy slogan: “Meaning arises when subjective attraction meets objective attractiveness” (Wolf 2015, 112; see also Kekes 1986, 2000; Wiggins 1988; Raz 2001, 10–40; Mintoff 2008; Wolf 2010, 2016; Fischer 2019, 9–23; Belshaw 2021, 160–81). This theory implies that no meaning accrues to one’s life if one believes in, is satisfied by, or cares about a project that is not truly worthwhile, or alternately if one takes up a truly worthwhile project but fails to judge it important, be satisfied by it, or care about it.

A related approach is that, while subjective attraction is not necessary for meaning, it could enhance it (e.g., Audi 2005, 344; Metz 2013, 183–84, 196–98, 220–25). For instance, a stereotypical Mother Teresa who is bored by and alienated from her substantial charity work might have a somewhat significant existence because it is objectively attractive, even if she would have an even more significant existence if she felt pride in it or identified with it.

There have been several attempts to capture theoretically what all objectively attractive, inherently worthwhile, or finally valuable conditions have in common insofar as they bear on meaning in a person’s life. Over the past few decades, one encounters the proposals from Western philosophers that objectively meaningful conditions are just those that involve: positively connecting with organic unity beyond oneself (Nozick 1981, 594–619); being creative (Taylor 1987; Matheson 2018); living in accord with emotional judgments (Solomon 1993; cf. Williams 2020, 56–78); promoting good consequences, such as improving the quality of life of oneself and others (Singer 1995; Audi 2005; Smuts 2018, 75–99; Stevenson 2024); exercising rational nature in exceptional ways (Smith 1997, 179–221; Gewirth 1998, 177–82; Metz 2013, 222–36, Metz in Metz and Seachris 2024, 87–101); progressing toward ends that can never be fully realized because one’s knowledge of them changes as one approaches them (Levy 2005); realizing goals that are transcendent for being long-lasting in duration and broad in scope (Mintoff 2008); living virtuously (May 2015, 61–138; McPherson 2020); fulfilling the non-theistic purpose of the universe (Mulgan 2015; Goff 2023); acting out of love for what is worth loving (Wolf 2016); and doing what is likely to foster the good, the true, and the beautiful (Rüther 2024). There is as yet no convergence in the field on one, or even a small cluster, of these accounts.

One salient feature of these objective theories is that they characteristically maintain that meaning is strictly a function of the exercise of agency of some kind. One has to be doing something for meaning to accrue, where the doing is normally a matter of making certain choices but could also be a matter of deliberating or seeing-as in certain ways. Recently some have questioned that assumption, with some contending that being loved, as opposed to loving, can confer some meaning on a life (e.g., Attoe 2024; Seachris in Metz and Seachris 2024, 160–65) and another maintaining that mere rest can be a source of meaning (Scripter 2025).

A large majority of the naturalist debates in the contemporary Anglo-American-Australasian literature abstract away from considerations of race and gender. However, one can find Africana accounts of meaning in life (Gordon 2000) as well as a feminist one (Noddings 2013), and it is worth thinking further about how social categorization might bear on normative theorization.

Another feature of the above naturalist theories, as expounded so far, is that they are aggregative or additive, objectionably treating a life as a mere “container” of bits of life that are meaningful considered in isolation from other bits (Brännmark 2003, 330). It has become increasingly common for philosophers of life’s meaning, especially objectivists, to hold that life as a whole, or at least long stretches of it, can substantially affect its meaningfulness beyond the amount of meaning (if any) in its parts. There is parallel discussion of whole-life considerations in contemporary debate about well-being (e.g., Velleman 2015, 141–73) but it is worth considering whether they would be better placed under the heading of “meaning” as a distinct dimension of a desirable life.

For instance, a life that has lots of beneficence and otherwise intuitively meaning-conferring conditions but that is also extremely repetitive (à la the movie Groundhog Day) is less than maximally meaningful (Taylor 1987; Blumenfeld 2009). Furthermore, a life that not only avoids repetition but also ends with a substantial amount of meaningful (or otherwise desirable) parts seems to have more meaning overall than one that has the same amount of meaningful (desirable) parts but ends with few or none of them (Kamm 2013, 18–22; Dorsey 2015). Still more, a life in which its meaningless (or otherwise undesirable parts) cause its meaningful (desirable) parts to come about through a process of personal growth seems meaningful in virtue of this redemptive pattern, “good life-story”, or narrative self-expression (Taylor 1989, 48–51; Wong 2008; Fischer 2009, 145–77; Kauppinen 2012; May 2015, 61–138; Velleman 2015, 141–73). These three cases suggest that meaning can inhere in life as a whole, that is, in the relationships between its parts, and not merely in the parts considered in isolation.

However, some maintain that it is, strictly speaking, the story that is or could be told of a life that matters, not so much the life-story qua relations between events themselves (de Bres 2018). Others deny that narrativity of any sort is relevant to meaning (e.g., Strawson 2018), with consequentialists directing our attention towards positive impact on the world instead.

There are pure or extreme versions of holism present in the literature, according to which the only possible bearer of meaning in life is a person’s life as a whole, not any isolated activities, relationships, or states (Taylor 1989, 48–51; Tabensky 2003; Levinson 2004). A salient argument for this position is that judgments of the meaningfulness of a part of someone’s life are merely provisional, open to revision upon considering how they fit into a wider perspective. So, for example, it would initially appear that taking an ax away from a madman and thereby protecting innocent parties confers some meaning on one’s life, but one might well revise that judgment upon learning that the intention behind it was merely to steal an ax, not to save lives, or that the madman then took out a machine gun, causing much more harm than his ax would have. It is worth considering how far this sort of case is generalizable, and, if it can be to a substantial extent, whether that provides strong evidence that only life as a whole can exhibit meaningfulness.

In reply, some have recently argued that it is precisely life as a whole that can in principle never be meaningful, despite there clearly being meaning in its parts. One argument for this conclusion is that, while particular activities can have a point, life considered as the sum of them all cannot. “We can't possibly have a point to leading a life because valued ends are external to the efforts toward which they are directed….When we question the point of an effort or enterprise, the question is aimed at its end – it is not itself the end; the end is external to it or separate from it. But your life encompasses your entire life and all that you value in it” (Weinberg 2026, 5, 6; for a different rationale, see Attoe 2023, 127–60).

Perhaps most objectivists would, at least upon reflection, accept that both the parts of a life and the whole-life relationships among the parts can exhibit meaning. Supposing there are two bearers of meaning in a life, important questions arise. One is whether a certain narrative can be meaningful even if its parts are not, while a second is whether the meaningfulness of a part increases if it is an aspect of a meaningful whole (on which see Brännmark 2003), and a third is whether there is anything revealing to say about how to make tradeoffs between the parts and whole in cases where one must choose between them (Blumenfeld 2009 appears to assign lexical priority to the whole).

Another important distinction between types of objective naturalism, and one that has arisen recently in the field, is the extent to which the meaning of our lives depends on the existence of future generations of human persons and perhaps specifically on whether their lives would be meaningful. Samuel Scheffler (2013) maintains that very little meaning in our lives would remain if the human race were to go extinct soon (see also Mulgan 2024). Others contend that much meaning would still be available in the present under that condition, even if more meaning would be on offer were humanity to continue into the foreseeable future. There are also important disagreements about precisely why the future might make such a difference, with considerations of impact, narrative, and identity looming large.

3.3 Rejecting God and a Soul

Naturalists until recently had been largely concerned to show that meaning in life is possible without God or a soul; they had not spent much time considering how such spiritual conditions might enhance meaning (an exception is Hooker 2008). Lately, however, an extreme form of naturalism has arisen, according to which our lives would probably, if not unavoidably, have less meaning in a world with God or a soul than in one without. Although such an approach was voiced early on by Baier (1957), it is really in the past 15 years that this “anti-theist” position has become widely and intricately discussed.

One rationale, mentioned above as an objection to the view that God’s purpose constitutes meaning in life, has also been deployed to argue that the existence of God as such would necessarily reduce meaning, that is, would consist of anti-matter. It is the idea that master/servant and parent/child analogies so prominent in the monotheist religious traditions reveal something about our status in a world where there is a qualitatively higher being who has created us with certain ends in mind: our independence or dignity as adult persons would be violated (e.g., Baier 1957/2000, 118–20; Kahane 2011, 681–85; Lougheed 2020, 121–41).

One objection to this reasoning has been to accept that God’s existence is necessarily incompatible with the sort of meaning that would come (roughly stated) from being one’s own boss, but to argue that God would also make greater sorts of meaning available, offering a net gain to us (Mawson 2016, 110–58). Basically, Heaven is worth the price of having to “bend the knee”.

Another salient argument for thinking that God would detract from meaning in life appeals to the value of privacy (Kahane 2011, 681–85; Lougheed 2020, 55–110). God’s omniscience would make it impossible for us to control another person’s access to the most intimate details about ourselves, which, for some, amounts to a less meaningful life than one with such control.

Beyond questioning the value of our privacy in relation to a benevolent God, one interesting criticism has been to suggest that, if a lack of privacy would indeed substantially reduce meaning in our lives, then God, qua morally perfect person, would simply avoid knowing everything about us (Tooley 2018). Lacking complete knowledge of our mental states would be compatible with describing God as “omniscient”, so the criticism goes, insofar as that is plausibly understood as having as much knowledge as is morally permissible.

Turn, now, to major arguments for thinking that having a soul would reduce life’s meaning, so that if one wants a maximally meaningful life, one should prefer a purely physical world, or at least one in which people are mortal. First and foremost, there has been the argument that an immortal life could not avoid becoming boring (Williams 1973; recent statements include Maitzen 2022, 170–71; Attoe 2023, 143–44, 156–57), rendering life pointless according to many subjective and objective theories.

The literature on this topic has become enormous, with the central reply being that immortality need not get boring (for a handful of discussions, see Fischer 2009, 79–101, 2019, 117–42; Mawson 2019, 51–52; Williams 2020, 30–41, 123–29; Belshaw 2021, 182–97). However, it might also be worth questioning whether long-term boredom is sufficient for meaninglessness. Suppose, for instance, that one volunteers to be bored so that many others will not be bored; perhaps this would be a meaningful sacrifice to make. Being bored for an eternity would not be blissful or even satisfying, to be sure, but if it served the function of preventing others from being bored for an eternity, would it be meaningful (at least to some degree)? If, as is commonly held, sacrificing one’s life could be meaningful, why not also sacrificing one’s liveliness?

Another reason given to reject eternal life is that it would become repetitive, which would substantially drain it of meaning (Scarre 2007, 54–55; May 2009, 46–47, 64–65, 71; Smuts 2011, 142–44; cf. Blumenfeld 2009). If, as it appears, there are only a finite number of actions one could perform, relationships one could have, and states one could be in during an eternity, one would have to end up doing the same things again (even if not for the first time). Even though one’s activities might be more valuable than rolling a stone up a hill forever à la Sisyphus, the prospect of doing them over and over again forever is disheartening for many.

To be sure, one might not remember having done them before and hence could avoid boredom, but for some philosophers that would make it all the worse, akin to having dementia and forgetting that one has told the same stories (Maitzen 2022, 170). Others, however, still find some meaning in such a life (e.g., Belshaw 2021, 197, 205n41).

A third meaning-based argument against immortality invokes considerations of narrative. If the pattern of one’s life as a whole substantially matters, and if a proper pattern would include a beginning, a middle, and an end, then it appears that a life that never ends would lack the relevant narrative structure. “Because it would drag on endlessly, it would, sooner or later, just be a string of events lacking all form….With immortality, the novel never ends….How meaningful can such a novel be?” (May 2009, 68, 72; see also Scarre 2007, 58–60). Notice that this objection is distinct from considerations of boredom and repetition, which concern novelty; even if one were stimulated and active, and even if one found a way not to repeat one’s life in the course of eternity, an immortal life would appear to lack shape.

In reply, some reject the idea that a meaningful life must be akin to a novel, and intead opt for narrativity in the form of something like a string of short stories that build on each other (Fischer 2009, 145–77, 2019, 101–16). Others, though, have sought to show that eternity could still be novel-like, deeming the sort of ending that matters to be a function of what the content is and how it relates to the content that came before (Seachris 2011; Williams 2020, 112–19).

There have been additional objections to immortality as undercutting meaningfulness, but they are prima facie less powerful than the previous three in that, if sound, they arguably show that an eternal life would have a cost, but probably not one that would utterly occlude the prospect of meaning in it. For example, there have been the suggestions that eternal lives would lack a sense of preciousness and urgency (Nussbaum 1989, 339; Kass 2002, 266–67; Hägglund 2019; Horsthemke 2024), could not exemplify virtues such as courageously risking one’s life for others (Kass 2002, 267–68; Wielenberg 2005, 91–94), and could not obtain meaning from sustaining or saving others’ lives (Nussbaum 1989, 338; Wielenberg 2005, 91–94).

Note that at least the first two rationales turn substantially on the belief in immortality, not immortality itself: if one were immortal but forgot that one is or did not know that at all, then one could appreciate life and obtain much of the virtue of courage. Conversely, if one were not immortal, but thought that one is, then, by the logic of these arguments, one would fail to appreciate limits and be unable to exemplify courage.

4. Nihilism

The previous two sections addressed theoretical accounts of what would confer meaning on a human person’s life. Although these theories do not imply that some people’s lives are in fact meaningful, that has been the presumption of a very large majority of those who have advanced them. Much of the procedure has been to suppose that many lives have had meaning in them and then to consider in virtue of what they have or otherwise could. However, there are perspectives that question this supposition. According to nihilism (as understood in the philosophy of life’s meaning), what would make a life meaningful in principle cannot obtain for any of us.

One straightforward rationale for nihilism is the combination of extreme supernaturalism about what makes life meaningful and atheism about whether a spiritual realm exists. If you believe that God or a soul is necessary for meaning in life, and if you believe that neither is real, then you are committed to nihilism, to the denial that life can have any meaning. Athough this rationale for nihilism was prominent in the modern era (it was Camus’ position and also Tolstoy’s prior to acquiring faith), it has been on the wane in analytic philosophical circles, as extreme supernaturalism has been eclipsed by the moderate variety; few now believe spiritual conditions are essential for any meaning at all.

The most common rationales for nihilism these days do not appeal to supernaturalism or at least not explicitly. One cluster of ideas appeals to what meta-ethicists call “error theory”, the view that evaluative claims (in this case about meaning in life or about morality qua necessary for meaning) characteristically posit objectively real values, but that such values do not exist. According to one version, value judgments often analytically include a claim to objectivity but there is no reason to think that objective values exist, as they “would be entities or qualities or relations of a very strange sort, utterly different from anything else in the universe” (Mackie 1977/1990, 38). According to a second version, we hold certain beliefs about the objectivity of morality and related values such as meaning because they were evolutionarily advantageous to our ancestors, not because they are true. Humans have been “deceived by their genes into thinking that there is a distinterested, objective morality binding upon them, which all should obey” (Ruse and Wilson 1986, 179; cf. Street 2015). One must draw on the intricate work in meta-ethics that has been underway for the past several decades to appraise these arguments.

In contrast to error-theoretic arguments for nihilism, there are rationales for it accepting that objective values exist but denying that our lives can ever exhibit or promote them so as to obtain meaning. One version of this approach maintains that, for our lives to matter, we must be able to add objective value to the world, which we are not since the objective value of the world is already infinite (Smith 2003). The key premises for this view are that every bit of space-time (or at least the stars in the physical universe) have some positive value, that these values can be added up, and that space is infinite. If the physical world at present contains an infinite degree of value, nothing we do can make a difference in terms of meaning, for infinity plus any amount of value remains infinity.

One way to question this argument is naturally to doubt the non-instrumental value of space-time or stars. Another is to suggest that, even if one cannot add to the amount of value in the universe, meaning plausibly comes from being the source of value (see also Mulgan 2015, 209, 319–20, 385–86).

A second rationale for nihilism that accepts the existence of objective value is David Benatar’s (2006, 18–59) intriguing “asymmetry argument” for anti-natalism, the view that it is immoral to bring new people into existence because doing so would always be on balance bad for them. For Benatar, the bads of existing (e.g., pains) are real disadvantages relative to not existing, while the goods of existing (pleasures) are not real advantages relative to not existing, since there is in the latter state no one to be deprived of them. If indeed the state of not existing is no worse than that of experiencing the benefits of existence, then, since existing invariably brings harm in its wake, it follows that existing is always worse compared to not existing. Although this argument is illustrated with experiential goods and bads, it seems generalizable to non-experiential ones, including meaning in life and anti-matter. The literature on this argument has become large (for just one collection, see Hauskeller and Hallich 2022).

Benatar (2006, 60–92, 2017, 35–63) has advanced an additional argument for a certain strain of nihilism, one that appeals to Thomas Nagel’s (1986, 208–32) widely discussed analysis of the extremely external standpoint that human persons can take on their lives. There exists, to use Henry Sidgwick’s influential phrase, the “point of view of the universe”, that is, the standpoint that considers a human being’s life in relation to all times and all places. When one takes up this most external standpoint and views one’s puny impact on the world, little of one’s life appears to matter. What one does in a certain society on Earth over 75 years or so just does not amount to much, when considering the billions of temporal years and billions of light-years that make up space-time. Although this reasoning grants limited kinds of meaning to human beings, viz., from a personal, social, or human perspective, Benatar denies that the greatest sort of meaning––a cosmic one––is available to them, hence the “nihilist” tag.

Some have objected that our lives could in fact have a cosmic significance, say, if they played a role in God’s plan (Quinn 2000, 65–6; Swinburne 2016, 154), were the sole ones with a dignity in the universe (Kahane 2014), or engaged in valuable activities that could be appreciated by anyone anywhere anytime (Wolf 2016, 261–62). Others naturally maintain that cosmic significance is irrelevant to appraising a human life, with some denying that it would be a genuine source of meaning (Landau 2017, 93–99), and others accepting that it would be but maintaining that the absence of this good would not count as a bad or merit regret (discussed in Benatar 2017, 56–62; Williams 2020, 108–11). Stronger still are the views that not being able to make a cosmic difference has important advantages (Smilansky 2026, 177–88) and that the concept of cosmic meaning is incoherent (Maitzen 2022, 160–65).

Another distinguishable source of nihilism concerns the ontological, as distinct from axiological, preconditions for meaning in life. Perhaps most radically, there are those who deny that we have selves. Do we indeed lack selves, and, if we do, is a meaningful life impossible for us (see essays in Caruso and Flanagan 2018; Le Bihan 2019)? Somewhat less radically, there are those who grant that we have selves, but deny that they are in charge in the relevant way. That is, some have argued that we lack self-governance or free will of the sort that is essential for meaning in life, at least if determinism is true (Pisciotta 2013; essays in Caruso and Flanagan 2018). Summing up the concern, non-quantum events, including human decisions, appear to be necessitated by a prior state of the world, such that none could have been otherwise, and many of our decisions are a product of unconscious neurological mechanisms (while quantum events are of course utterly beyond our control). If none of our conscious choices could have been avoided and all were ultimately necessited by something external to them, the suggestion is that they are insufficient to merit pride or admiration or to constitute narrative authorship of a life.

In reply, some maintain that compatibilism between determinism and moral responsibility applies with comparable force to meaning in life (e.g., Arpaly 2006; Fischer 2009, 145–77; Maitzen 2022, 160–73). Others contend that incompatibilism is true of moral responsibility but not of meaning, on the ground that the former requires one to have ultimate control over one’s decisions but the latter, insofar as it includes loving relationships, does not (Pereboom 2014).

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Classic Texts

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  • Wittgenstein, L., 1929, Lecture on Ethics, E. Zamuner et al. (eds.), Malden, MA: John Wiley & Sons, Inc., 2014.

Meaning in the Work of Specific Philosophers

  • Berk, K., 2021, “Beauvoir’s Philosophy of Meaning in Life”, Journal of Philosophy of Life, 11: 60–77.
  • Braman, B., 2008, Meaning and Authenticity: Bernard Lonergan and Charles Taylor on the Drama of Authentic Human Existence, Toronto: University of Toronto Press Incorporated.
  • Church, J., 2022, Kant, Liberalism, and the Meaning of Life, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Colebrook, C., 2010, Deleuze and the Meaning of Life, London: Bloomsbury.
  • Furtak, R.A., 2025, Kierkegaard, Socrates, and the Meaning of Life, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Hauskeller, M., 2020, The Meaning of Life and Death: Ten Classic Thinkers on the Ultimate Question, London: Bloomsbury.
  • Hosseini, R., 2015, Wittgenstein and Meaning in Life, New York: Palgrave Macmillan.
  • Jareño-Alarcón, J. (ed.), 2023, Ludwig Wittgenstein: The Meaning of Life, Hoboken, NJ: John Wiley & Sons, Inc.
  • Leach, S. and Tartaglia, J. (eds.), 2018, The Meaning of Life and the Great Philosophers, London: Routledge.
  • Millgram, E., 2022, John Stuart Mill and the Meaning of Life, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Morris, T., 1992, Making Sense of It All: Pascal and the Meaning of Life, Grand Rapids, MI: Willliam B. Eerdmans Publishing Company.
  • Peterson, J., 2025, Qoheleth and the Philosophy of Value, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Vogler, C., 2018, “The Place of Virtue in a Meaningful Life”, in Self-Transcendence and Virtue, J. Frey and C. Vogler (eds.), London: Routledge: 84–92 [addresses Aquinas].

Collections

  • Benatar, D. (ed.), 2016, Life, Death & Meaning, 3rd ed., Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield Publishers, Inc.
  • Caruso, G. and Flanagan, O. (eds.), 2018, Neuroexistentialism: Meaning, Morals, and Purpose in an Age of Neuroscience, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Cottingham, J. (ed.), 2021, Western Philosophy: An Anthology, 3rd Ed., Oxford: Blackwell: pt. 12.
  • Garcia, R. and King, N. (eds.), 2009, Is Goodness Without God Good Enough? Lanham, MD: Rowman and Littlefield.
  • Himmelmann, B. (ed.), 2013, On Meaning in Life, Berlin: Walter de Gruyter, Inc.
  • Klemke, E. D. and Cahn, S. M. (eds.), 2018, The Meaning of Life: A Reader, 4th ed., New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Kraay, K. (ed.), 2018, Does God Matter? Essays on the Axiological Consequences of Theism, New York: Routledge.
  • Landau, I. (ed.), 2022, The Oxford Handbook of Meaning in Life, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Seachris, J. (ed.), 2013, Exploring the Meaning of Life: An Anthology and Guide, Oxford: Wiley-Blackwell.
  • Seachris, J. and Goetz, S. (eds.), 2016, God and Meaning: New Essays, New York: Bloombsury Academic.

Books on Life’s Meaning in Non-Western Traditions

  • Agarwal, N., 2015, Meaning and Purpose of Life: Perspectives from Indian Philosophy and Mainstream Economics, Columbia, MD: Sterling Publishers.
  • Attoe, A. (ed.), 2024, African Perspectives to the Question of Life’s Meaning, London: Routledge.
  • Kalmanson, L., 2021, Cross-Cultural Existentialism: On the Meaning of Life in Asian and Western Thought, London: Bloomsbury.
  • Leach, S. and Tartaglia, J. (eds.), 2018, The Meaning of Life and the Great Philosophers, London: Routledge.
  • Ross, F., 2008, The Meaning of Life in Hinduism and Buddhism, New York: Routledge.
  • Runzo, J. and Martin, N. (eds.), 2000, The Meaning of Life in the World’s Religions, Oxford: Oneworld Publications.
  • Sweet, W. and Huang, C. (eds.), 2016, Care of Self and Meaning of Life: Asian and Christian Reflections, Washington, D.C.: The Council for Research in Values and Philosophy.

Books Recommended Especially for the Student or General Reader

  • Baggini, J., 2004, What’s It All About?: Philosophy and the Meaning of Life, London: Granta Books.
  • Benatar, D. and Metz, T., 2021, Conversations About the Meaning of Life, J. Werbeloff and M. Oppenheimer (eds.), Johannesburg: Obsidian Worlds Publishing.
  • Belliotti, R., 2001, What Is the Meaning of Life? Amsterdam: Rodopi.
  • Belshaw, C., 2005, 10 Good Questions About Life and Death, Malden, MA: Blackwell.
  • Cottingham, J., 2003, On the Meaning of Life, London: Routledge.
  • Eagleton, T., 2007, The Meaning of Life: A Very Short Introduction, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Fischer, J. M., 2019, Death, Immortality, and Meaning in Life, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Ford, D., 2007, The Search for Meaning: A Short History, Berkeley: University of California Press.
  • Froese, P., 2016, On Purpose: How We Create the Meaning of Life, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Goetz, S. and Seachris, J., 2020, What Is This Thing Called the Meaning of Life? London: Routledge.
  • Goff, P., 2023, Why?: The Purpose of the Universe, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Hauskeller, M., 2020, The Meaning of Life and Death: Ten Classic Thinkers on the Ultimate Question, London: Bloomsbury Academic.
  • James, A., 2017, Surfing with Sartre: An Aquatic Inquiry into a Life of Meaning, New York: Doubleday.
  • Kass, L. R., 2017, Leading a Worthy Life: Finding Meaning in Modern Times, New York: Encounter Books.
  • Martela, F., 2020, It’s a Wonderful Life: Insights on Finding a Meaningful Existence, New York: HarperCollins.
  • Martin, M., 2002, Atheism, Morality, and Meaning, Amherst, NY: Prometheus Books.
  • Messerly, J., 2012, The Meaning of Life: Religious, Philosophical, Transhumanist, and Scientific Approaches, Seattle: Darwin and Hume Publishers.
  • Nagel, T., 1987, What Does It All Mean?: A Very Short Introduction to Philosophy, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Ruse, M., 2019, A Meaning to Life, New York: Oxford University Press.
  • Young, J., 2003, The Death of God and the Meaning of Life, New York: Routledge.

Other Internet Resources

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