Informal Logic

For centuries, the study of logic has inspired the idea that its methods might be harnessed in efforts to understand and improve thinking, reasoning, and argument as they occur in real life contexts: in public discussion and debate; in education and intellectual exchange; in interpersonal relations; and in law, medicine and other professions. Informal logic is the attempt to build a logic suited to this purpose. It combines the study of argument, evidence, proof and justification with an instrumental outlook which emphasizes its usefulness in the analysis of real life arguing.

Informal logic is usually understood narrowly, as a contemporary field of study which emerged in the last half century, when many philosophers and logicians turned their attention to the analysis, evaluation and improvement of real life argument. This contemporary endeavor can be understood much more broadly, as the continuation of many older attempts by philosophers and others who have (since ancient times) proposed methods for understanding and assessing actual (“real life,” “everyday”) arguments.

Contributions to informal logic often address specific aspects of scientific, legal, and other specialized instances of reasoning, but the overriding aim has been a general account of argument that can be used to explain and evaluate it in contexts of reflection, inquiry, social and political discussion, news, blogs and editorials, advertising, corporate and institutional communication, and interpersonal exchange.

In developing an account of argument, informal logicians have studied inference and a broad range of other relevant topics. The latter include, to take only a few examples: competing accounts of the nature of argument; criteria for argument evaluation; argument schemes; fallacies; deductive, inductive, and conductive models of inference; rhetorical and dialectical approaches to argument; onus and burden of proof; the empirical study of argument; argument diagramming (or “mapping”); cognitive biases; the history of argument analysis; the role of emotion in argument; and the rules that govern argumentative exchange in different communicative contexts.

Hansen 2011 provides a survey of the methods of informal logic which emphasizes different approaches to the study and evaluation of inference in informal argument. Blair 2015 identifies two key tasks for informal logic: the attempt to develop ways to identify (and “extract”) arguments from natural language discourse and the attempt to develop methods and guidelines for assessing their cogency.

• 1. History
• 2. What is an argument?
• 3. Dressing Arguments
• 4. Assessing Arguments
• 5. Other Topics
• 6. The Components of Informal Logic
• 7. Informal Logic and Philosophy
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. History

The pedagogical and practical interests that characterize informal logic are already evident in ancient times. The First Sophistic is a movement motivated by the notion that one can teach the art of logos in a way that can be useful in public discussion and debate. Aristotle’s rhetorical and logical works are especially notable for their systematic attempts to understand and teach the principles of real life arguing. Within informal logic and argumentation theory, his views and general outlook remain relevant today.

Significant attempts to develop a systematic approach to informal arguments emerge in early modern times. The Port Royal Logic (Arnauld & Nicole 1662), initially titled Logic or the Art of Thinking, was first published in French in 1662. It quickly established itself as an often celebrated and sometimes disdained introduction to the art of argument. Since its first publication, it has enjoyed more than fifty French editions and five popular English translations. Describing logic as “the art of directing reason aright, in obtaining the knowledge of things, for the instruction both of ourselves and others” (25), it provides a practical account of good and poor argument. Its account of logical methods discusses fallacies, syllogisms, definitions, deductive and probable reasoning, among other topics, emphasizing the discussion of real rather than concocted examples of arguing (see Finocchiaro 1997).

One finds other analogues of today’s approaches to informal reasoning in nineteenth century textbooks which aim to improve everyday reasoning via public education that emphasizes logical and rhetorical concerns. Richard Whatley is of special note in this regard. He began his career as a professor of political economy at Oxford and was then appointed Archbishop of Dublin for the Church of Ireland. During his time in office, he attempted to establish a national and non-sectarian system of education, writing texts on reasoning that could serve this purpose. In many ways, his Elements of Logic and Elements of Rhetoric (Whately 1826, 1830) are rough analogues of contemporary textbooks of informal logic and argumentation theory.

The trends that give rise to informal logic as a unique discipline of study coalesce in North America in the late 1960s. This was a time when social upheaval and protests against the War in Vietnam popularized calls for an education that was relevant to the issues of the day. In universities and colleges, this stimulated an interest in the logic of everyday argument. One question this raised was the extent to which informal arguments could be studied and analyzed using the methods of formal logic: propositional logic, truth tables, syllogisms, and the predicate calculus. Many of those teaching everyday arguments criticized treatments like the ones found in Irving Copi’s popular (1953) Introduction to Logic (see Johnson 1996 and Blair 2015).

In Logic and Contemporary Rhetoric: The Use of Reason in Everyday Life, Kahane 1971 embraced real life argument in a broad way, including a wide range of examples of real life arguing taken from newspapers, the mass media, advertisements, books and political campaigns. In comparison with Copi’s many concocted examples, other authors did a better job melding classical formal logic with everyday arguments. Harrison 1969 is a notable example. Pospesel published a number of texts which illustrate how the patterns of inference that characterize propositional and syllogistic logic appear in real life contexts (see Pospesel and Marans 1978, Rodes and Pospesel 1991, and Pospesel 2002). Little 1980 developed a critical thinking methodology for everyday argument analysis and decision making which included propositional and syllogistic reasoning as critical components.

In part because they wanted a much broader account of naturally occurring argument that they found in classical logic, Toulmin’s The Uses of Argument (1958) and Hamblin’s Fallacies (1970) moved in new directions, developing alternative accounts of argument. Hamblin attempted to reinvigorate fallacies as an approach to understanding ordinary argument. In the development of informal logic, their views have become theoretical touchstones for many seeking to develop an informal logic.

One important catalyst for a systematic approach to informal argument was the Critical Thinking Movement (described in Siegel 1988, Ennis 2011). It argued that the critical scrutiny of our beliefs and assumptions should be a fundamental goal of education. What this means has been variously interpreted (sometimes in ways that imply problem solving, so called “lateral thinking”, and/or information literacy), but a recurring theme is the importance of understanding argument and argument assessment. In 1980, a California State University Executive Order required post secondary institutions in the state include formal instruction in critical thinking in their curriculum. According to the order: “Instruction in critical thinking is to be designed to achieve an understanding of the relationship of language to logic, which should lead to the ability to analyze, criticize, and advocate ideas, to reason inductively and deductively and to reach factual or judgmental conclusions based on sound inferences drawn from unambiguous statements of knowledge or belief” (Dumke 1980, Executive Order 338).

The idea that the analysis of ordinary arguing could best be furthered by creating an “informal logic” originated in the work of Johnson and Blair at the University of Windsor. Their textbook, Logical Self-Defense (1977), was an attempt to provide a systematic approach to the study and teaching of informal argument. The Informal Logic Newsletter they conceived and edited (now the journal Informal Logic) successfully established informal logic as a field for discussion, development and research. Forty years later, the result is an established body of literature and a standard (but evolving) set of topics, problems, and issues.

Other journals that have played a role in the rise of informal logic include Argumentation, Philosophy and Rhetoric, Argumentation and Advocacy (formerly the Journal of the American Forensic Association), Teaching Philosophy, Inquiry: Critical Thinking Across the Disciplines and, more recently, Cogency and Argument and Computation. The journals ProtoSociology (1999) and Studies in Logic, Grammar, and Rhetoric (2009) have published special issues devoted to topics in informal logic.

Since its inception, the development of informal logic has been intertwined with pedagogical attempts to improve the ways in which students are taught to reason well. These attempts have given rise to hundreds (possibly thousands) of textbooks used to teach argumentation skills to university and college students in Canada, the United States, the United Kingdom, and a growing number of other countries. The available texts take many different approaches to the subject and offer many theoretical as well as pedagogical innovations. Currently popular texts include Govier 2014 (7th ed.); Groarke & Tindale 2013 (5th ed.); Bowell and Kemp, 2010 (3rd ed.); Browne & Keeley 2010 (10th ed.); Fisher 2011 (2nd ed.); Seay & Nuccetelli 2012 (2nd ed.); Battersby 2016 (2nd ed.); Weston 2009 (4th edition); and Hughes, Lavery & Doran 2014 (7th ed.).

Outside of the English speaking world, the goals of informal logic have been pursued in the Polish tradition of “pragmatic logic”, which promotes the tools of logic as a component of general education which can ensure that students think more clearly and consistently; express their thoughts and ideas systematically and precisely; and justify their claims with proper inferences (see Koszowy 2010 and Ajdukiewicz, K. 1974).

Increasingly, the development of informal logic incorporates approaches to discourse and argumentation found in cognate disciplines and fields like Formal Logic, Speech Communication, Rhetoric, Linguistics, Artificial Intelligence, Semiotics, Cognitive Psychology, and Computational Modelling. Considered from this perspective, informal logic is one component of a much broader multi-disciplinary attempt to develop an argumentation theory that can provide a comprehensive account of real life reasoning.

In the course of their development, both informal logic and argumentation theory have been nurtured and highlighted at a number of international conferences. They include eleven Windsor conferences hosted by the Ontario Society for the Study of Argumentation (OSSA); seven Amsterdam conferences hosted at four-year intervals by the International Society for the Study of Argumentation (ISSA); five Tokyo Conferences on Argumentation hosted by the Japanese Debate Association; seven COMMA conferences on computational models of argument; four Chilean conferences on Argumentation, Psychology of Reasoning and Critical Thinking; and a Polish series of “ArgDiaP” workshops (dealing with argumentation, critical thinking, dialogue and persuasion).

1.1 Formal and Informal Logic

The relationship between formal and informal logic is complex, and in some ways controversial. As it is practiced today, informal logic is an offshoot of classical logic which shares a premise and conclusion conception of argument, many theoretical notions, and a similar conception of the elements of good argument. The relationship is too complex to be discussed in detail here, though some general comments may help situate it and the controversies it sometimes gives rise to.

Historically, some key informal logicians have suggested it as a theoretical alternative to formal logic. In his list of features that characterize informal logic, Johnson 1996 [2014] (p. 11) lists “dissatisfaction with formal logic as the vehicle for teaching skill in argument evaluation and argument formation” and “A desire to provide a complete theory of reasoning that goes beyond formal deductive and inductive logic.”

One might take a different view. Informal logic is “informal” insofar as it studies arguments as they occur in natural language discourse rather than formal languages of the sort that characterize propositional logic, the predicate calculus, modal logic, etc. (languages which have rigorously specified syntax, semantics and grammar, and clearly defined proof procedures). This is an important point but it does not negate informal logic’s connections to formal logic, especially as there is no consensus on the question how to best pursue the study of such arguments and informal logicians sometimes deploy formal methods of analysis (or mix formal and informal methods).

Certainly there are aspects of everyday reasoning and argument which can usefully be analyzed and studied using formal methods. Syllogistic logic is one of the first formal approaches to argument and is, historically and today, frequently used to analyze everyday argumentation. Within informal logic, the general idea that logic should focus on the logical form of an argument rather than its specific content manifests itself in the common notion that informal logic should assess ordinary arguments by treating them as instances of different argument schemes (schemes that include standard deductive forms of argument like modus ponens, modus tollens and disjunctive syllogism).

The broader theoretical question posed by those who see formal and informal logic as competing approaches to informal argument may be put as the question: “Does Informal Logic deal with the issues of the analysis and assessment of informal argument better than Formal Logic by avoiding translation to artificial formal languages and the use of mathematics?” This is a question which raises complex issues which lie beyond the scope of the present article, but it may help to say that the proper answer to it varies depending on at least three variables: one’s purpose in studying informal argument; the kinds of informal arguments one considers; and the kinds of formal systems in question.

The purpose of informal logic is a broadly disseminated understanding of the difference between strong and weak argument which focuses on teaching and on argument in public discourse and interpersonal interactions. Formal methods can play a role in this regard, especially in cases in which they provide a more precise account of particular kinds of argument (e.g., deductive arguments, arguments in dialogue, and probabilistic arguments). But even in these cases, the ultimate aim of informal logic is ordinary language argument characterized by careful language and the principles of good reasoning.

There are many informal arguments which are difficult to translate into formal languages like those that characterize classical logic, but the possibility of formally studying and analyzing such arguments grows as formal logic develops formal frameworks that include defeasible (non-monotonic) logic and probability theory (which is emerging as one theoretical approach to informal reasoning -- see Zenker 2013). Some of the issues that this raises are evident in informal logic’s interaction with AI and computational modeling, which depend for their development on ways in which ordinary language arguing can be understood within formal systems. Some now common aspects of informal logic’s approach to argument (for example, argumentation schemes) have already influenced their attempts to account for ordinary reasoning.

1.2 Informal Logic within Argumentation Theory

The broader interdisciplinary study of real life argument is often called “argumentation theory.” Above and beyond the study of arguments, it studies the broader contexts in which arguments are embedded and the conditions (institutional, psychological, educational, etc.) which give rise to disagreement, arguing and argument. In addition to informal logic, argumentation theory incorporates studies and insights from the fields of formal logic, cognitive psychology, rhetoric, dialectics, computational modeling, semiotics, communication studies, Artificial Intelligence and other related disciplines. In the study of actual argument, these various fields frequently intersect and influence one another.

Already in ancient times, the broader study of argument encompassed logic, rhetoric, and dialectics. Each approached argument from a particular point of view and gave rise to a distinct tradition within argumentation theory. Rhetoric continues to see arguing as a vehicle for persuasion; dialectic understands arguing as an exchange between two or more arguers; and logic emphasizes the probative or epistemic merit of an argument, making a good argument an argument which justifies the point of view that it proposes.

Though it emphasizes the epistemic merit of an argument, informal logic has evolved in a way that incorporates elements of rhetoric and/or dialectics. The move in this direction has been motivated by the same goal that motivates informal logic in the first place, i.e. the desire to have an adequate theory of real life arguing. This requires some account of the rhetorical and dialectical features of argument, for they can be key components of an argument’s success.

In real life arguing, most arguments function as a response to disagreement. Arguers aim to justify the standpoint they defend in a way that convinces an intended audience or interlocutor. As rhetoric emphasizes, the former is more readily accomplished when one recognizes and responds to the beliefs and attitudes of the audience one addresses. As dialectics holds, successful arguments consider (as Johnson 2000 emphasizes) and respond to the likely objections to their point of view. For this and other reasons, informal logic is a field of argumentation theory which borrows from, and intersects with, rhetoric, dialectics, and with many other argumentation disciplines (Bermejo Luque 2011 proposes a theory of argument that usefully illustrates the intersection of these various fields).

In view of its pedagogical goals, informal logic has additional ties to educational movements which aim to make arguing and reasoning a central component (or the very cornerstone) of education. This has made informal logic a key element of the Critical Thinking Movement, which promotes models of education which emphasize reasoning skills, critical self-reflection and the scrutiny of students’ assumptions, beliefs and decisions.

One might compare North American approaches to informal logic to pragmatic logic as it has been developed in the Polish logical tradition (Koszowy 2010), where it is one component of the Polish School of Argumentation. The latter brings together a multitude of formal and informal approaches to argument. It has outlined its research program in a Polish Manifesto (Budzynska et al. 2014). One might easily describe informal logic as it has developed in North America and pragmatic logic as it has developed in Poland as two distinct (but in many ways, similar) attempts to create a satisfactory informal logic.

2.What is an argument?

Blair 2015 divides the work of informal logic in two, comprising the interpretive task of recognizing arguments (and “extracting” them from the discourse in which they are embedded), and the evaluative task of assessing them. Both tasks assume some account of what counts as argument.

In ordinary discourse, the word “argue” often means “to disagree” (usually it carries the implication that someone does so insistently or aggressively). In argumentation theory, argument in the sense of disagreement is often called “argument-2” (see Goodwin 2001). Like other logics, informal logic focuses on arguing in a narrower sense, understanding an argument as an attempt to provide evidence in favour of some point of view. This can usefully be called an evidentiary account of argument. It makes arguing an intentional act (a speech or communication act) which is usually embedded in argument in the broader sense, functioning as an attempt to resolve the disagreement this implies.

Informal logic understands arguments in the evidentiary sense as collections of premises and conclusions. The premises provide the evidence that supports the conclusion. Hitchcock 2007 defines an argument as “a claim-reason complex” consisting of (1) an act of concluding, (2) one or more acts of premising (which assert propositions in favour of the conclusion), and (3) a stated or implicit inference word that indicates that the conclusion follows from the premises. This makes arguments intentional acts that incorporate (1), (2) and (3).

A simple example that illustrates what this means in practice is the following excerpt from an opinion article in the Western Courier (25/10/08), which criticized conservative groups unwilling to support any kind of embryonic research.

EXAMPLE 1: This [opposition to embryonic research] is shortsighted and stubborn. The fact is, fetuses are being aborted whether conservatives like it or not. Post-abortion, the embryos are literally being thrown away when they could be used in lifesaving medical research. It has become a matter of religious and personal beliefs, and misguided ones at that. Lives could be saved and vastly improved if only scientists were allowed to use embryos that are otherwise being tossed in the garbage.

We may analyze this argument as the following claim-reason complex.

Premise: Fetuses are being aborted anyway.
Premise: Lives could be saved and vastly improved if scientists were allowed to use embryos that are otherwise being tossed in the garbage.
Inference Indicator: (implicit, unstated): (...hence...)
Conclusion: The conservative opposition to embryonic research is shortsighted and stubborn.

The following two examples are simple arguments that illustrate some of the issues that arise when we try to identify and extract arguments from their naturally occurring contexts. Both are (slightly amended) reports of arguments taken from a front page article in the New Hampshire Rockingham News (30/8/2002) which discusses a court case which sent the organizer of a series of dog fights to jail for cruelty to animals.

EXAMPLE 2: The attorney for the defendant asserted that the sentence handed down by Judge Abrahamson did not fit the crime because it was unprecedented in length.

EXAMPLE 3: A co-ordinator for the Humane Society supported a prison sentence, claiming that the minor penalties normally associated with misdemeanour convictions are not a sufficient deterrent in this case.

In the first case (EXAMPLE 2) we can summarize the reported argument as follows.

Premise: The sentence (handed down by Judge Abrahamson) was unprecedented in length.
Inference Indicator: ...because...
Conclusion: The sentence handed down did not fit the crime.

Here the word “because” functions as an inference indicator, more precisely a premise indicator, which indicates premises in support of a conclusion. One sign of argument in ordinary discourse is an inference indicator (a word like “so,” “hence,” “therefore,” “because,” “thus,” etc.), but indicator words are used in other ways as well. Words like “because” may, for example, signal an explanation rather than an argument, a causal connection, emphasis of some sort, a temporal order, and so on. In the process of recognizing many arguments, this means that a theory of argument needs to distinguish the different uses of indicator words.

In other cases (as in EXAMPLE 1 and EXAMPLE 3) arguments are communicated without using inference indicators. In ordinary discourse, a list of statements may be understood as a series of claims or as an attempt to justify one of the statements with the others. The statements “Small businesses are major contributors to the economy. They account for over two-thirds of employment opportunities.” (EXAMPLE 4) are from a Chamber of Commerce statement on small business. They can be understood as two of a series of claims that someone is making about small businesses or, alternatively, as a conclusion followed by a premise that supports it. In deciding when we have an instance of argument, we must usually rely on context to determine which interpretation is correct.

Still other issues arise because important aspects of an argument may be implicit or unclear in ordinary discourse. Statements may be conveyed by (rhetorical) questions like: “Can anyone seriously believe...?” “Are you joking?” “Could the defendant have been in two places at once?” Often, the components of an argument are interspersed with digressions and repetitious remarks that are not relevant to it or its assessment. In the process of extracting an argument from its context, this may mean that we must recognize what is implicit but relevant to the argument at the same time that we discard what is explicit but redundant or irrelevant.

In examples 2 and 3, arguments depend on implicit claims which need to be considered when assessing the arguments. In the process of identifying the components of an argument, such claims are standardly identified as “implicit” premises (or conclusions). In our two examples, this means that we can identify the components of the arguments as:

EXAMPLE 2:
Premise: The sentence (handed down by Judge Abrahamson) was unprecedented in length.
Implicit Premise: Sentences for crimes should not be of unprecedented length.
Inference Indicator: ...because...
Conclusion: The sentence handed down did not fit the crime.

EXAMPLE 3:
Premise: The minor penalties normally associated with misdemeanour convictions are not a sufficient deterrent in this case.
Implicit Premise: Penalties for crimes should have a deterrent effect.
Inference Indicator: (implicit: (...therefore...)
Conclusion: The prison sentence is appropriate.

It is important to recognize implicit premises and conclusions because they are elements of argument that need to be analyzed and assessed in any attempt to evaluate the arguments that contain them. In EXAMPLE 3, for example, the question whether punishments should be assigned by considering their deterrent effects is a key issue that needs to be considered in deciding whether the argument provides convincing evidence for its conclusion. In cases in which implicit premises or conclusions play a role in arguments, a comprehensive theory of argument must tell us how to choose between the competing alternatives that might be proposed (by, e.g., postulating implicit premises with a broader or narrower scope).

2.1 A Broader Account of Argument

Hitchcock’s account of argument is purposely broad, in a way that highlights an expansion of the notion of argument that has characterized the evolution of informal logic. Originally, paradigm examples of argument were taken to be arguments which attempt to establish some conclusion as plausibly true. As does the following argument for plate techtonics: “South America and Africa probably began as a single continent, for the Eastern and Western contours are remarkably symmetrical.” It can still be said that arguments that provide evidence for the truth of their conclusions are an important subset of real life arguments, but the study of actual arguing has underscored the point that arguments are used in many other ways.

Arguments are, for example, often used in situations of negotiation (in collective bargaining, e.g.), in which the aim of arguers is not truth so much as agreement (and the promotion of their own interests). In other cases arguing may be an attempt to establish consensus, to instill fear or hope or some other emotional state, or to incite people to behave in a certain way (to take up arms against a foe, or to support social change). Hoffman 2016 emphasizes the role that argument plays in stimulating reflection and raising questions about one’s own reasoning.

Hitchcock’s account of argument accommodates most of these uses, subsuming the possibility that premises and conclusions may be speech acts of different sorts. In particular, it allows a premise to be forwarded by any communication act which asserts a proposition (including, e.g., suggesting, hypothesizing, insulting and boasting); and allows a conclusion to be a request for information (“You were there, so what was it like?”); a request to do something (“The children are shivering, so please close the door.”); a commissive (“I know it matters to you, so I promise to go tomorrow.”), an expressive (“What we did was inexcusable, so we apologize.”) or a declarative (“The evidence shows that you committed an assault, so I find you guilty as charged.”). This broadening of the notion of argument is an essential way to recognize and distinguish the diverse roles that argument and inference actually play in real life contexts.

2.2 Visual Argument

In a different way, the conception of argument informal logic assumes has been broadened even further as informal logicians expand its scope to include the frequent instances of argument that utilize non-verbal elements. Kjeldsen 2015 provides a comprehensive overview of the study of visual arguments – arguments which employ non-verbal visuals (which may include photographs, film, art, cartoons, graphs, diagrams, and architecture). As Hitchcock notes, “a poster with a giant photograph of a starving emaciated child and the words ‘make poverty history’ can reasonably be construed as an argument”. Drawings in a geometric proof, diagrams and documentary film provide many other examples of visual argument. One might compare the expansion of informal logic to account for such arguments to the attempt to expand formal logic to allow visual deductions (see Barwise and Etchemendy 1998).

Considered from the point of view of the evidentiary account of argument, visual arguments are common, for visuals are often invoked in order to provide evidence for some conclusion (that someone is guilty of a crime, that a particular house is worth buying, or that a work of art is a masterpiece). Consider the following two photographs, taken by the NASA Mars rover Curiosity, which were heralded as the first proof that the planet Mars has water.

The first photo shows the results of an initial dig by the rover, the second provides a view of the same dig four Mars days (sols) later. The sequence shows white areas of the surface receding or (in the bottom left hand corner) entirely disappearing, an observation which was taken to show that these surfaces are water in the form of ice (ice which begins to evaporate when the dig exposes it to the sun).

Like most visual arguments, this example mixes visual and verbal cues (i.e. visuals and verbal claims). We might identify the key components of one elaboration of the argument (presented in a news exchange) as follows.

EXAMPLE 5:
(Visual) Premise: First photograph of the dig.
(Visual) Premise: Second photograph of the dig.
(Verbal) Premise: “The most plausible way to explain the changes we see in the the photographs is by postulating the evaporation of water ice.”
Inference Indicator: “We can conclude that...”
Conclusion: “...there is water on the planet Mars.”

In a case like this, the arguing is inherently visual because our looking at the photographs is an essential element of the reasoning. It is this looking (combined with the attendant explanation) which is supposed to convince us of the conclusion.

The use of visual images in arguments suggests that the traditional assumption that arguments are sets of sentences -- or the propositions that sentences refer to -- is too limiting. More deeply, it raises the fundamental question whether arguments are best understood as collections of propositions (the bearers of truth-value that declarative sentences refer to). One way to maintain this account is by understanding the images in visual arguments as another way to forward propositions or sets of propositions. However one understands visual arguments, there is no easy way to reduce them to sets of sentences, for there is no exact way to translate what we see into words (in part because it is difficult to choose between the many different ways in which we can describe most visual images).

Like verbal arguments, visual arguments may take many different forms. A further example is the advertisement below (EXAMPLE 5). In this case, the title “Just Add Vodka” is superimposed over a bottle of vodka spilling its contents onto a hamlet below. Outside the splash of vodka, the time of day (dusk), the inactivity, and the darkness suggest a sleepy hamlet where there is nothing to do at night. This contrasts sharply with the bustling city scape that springs life in the places where the vodka splashes to the ground — a cityscape that boasts a nightlife with skyscrapers and activity: lights, people, nightclubs, bars, and restaurants.

If we try to understand this image as a literal depiction of reality, it makes no sense: bottles of vodka are not so absurdly large, they do not pour their contents on sleepy hamlets, and would not create Manhattan streetscapes if they did. This tells us that the image is a visual metaphor, another common way to use visuals in arguing. In this case the metaphor is readily understood as one of transformation, the vodka being featured as a liquid catalyst for change.

We might summarize the argument as follows.

EXAMPLE 6:
Premise: Image [of the vodka transforming a sleepy life into one of cosmopolitan excitement].
Inference Indicator (implicit): ...therefore...
Conclusion: You should “Just Add Vodka” to your life.

One might add to this summary of the argument the implicit premise that a life of cosmopolitan excitement is desirable, for this is a key claim the argument assumes: and one that would need to be discussed in an assessment of the argument. As with many visuals, one could analyze the meaning of the image in much greater detail by discussing the semiotic aspects of visuals (one might, for example, discuss the image’s apparent sexual innuendo). Once one recognizes the advertisement (and many other advertisements) as an attempt to provide a reason for buying something, we can analyze and assessed it using standard techniques developed by informal logic.

Informal logicians have extended their account of argument to include visual arguments for the same reason they have tried to extend logical methods to the analysis of ordinary argument: because their goal is an account of the kinds of arguing that play an important role in real life arguing. Visual arguments are especially important at a time in which digital communication makes it so much easier to create and transmit images. In the world of real life arguing, this is ushering in an era in which arguments increasing employ photographs, videos, political cartoons, 3D modeling and other visuals to prove matters in courts, in social and political debate, in medical diagnosis, and so on.

2.3 Modes of Arguing

Studies of visual argument are increasingly tied to discussions of “multimodal” arguing. Multimodality is a key notion in social semiotics, which suggests that there are many different modes of communication which can be used to make meaning. In argumentation theory, multimodality has emerged as the idea that there are different modes that can be employed in constructing arguments. Within informal logic, Gilbert 1997 was the first to suggest that there are different modes of arguing that need to be distinguished in a theoretical analysis of argument (his modes are discussed below).

Maintaining informal logic’s standard focus on arguments in the premise and conclusion sense, Groarke 2015 expands the realm of argument to include, not only visuals, but tastes, smells, musical notes and other non-verbal phenomenon. On this account, these non-verbal entities may be key components of an argument (typically as premises). An argument constructed using a particular mode employs constituents in that mode (which may be words, non-verbal sounds, visuals, tastes, and so on). On battlefields, for example, doctors have traditionally diagnosed infections using a mode of arguing that can be described as “argument by smell.” In such cases, the scent they smell functions as evidence (as an olfactory premise) for the conclusion that the infection is (or is not) anaerobic.

EXAMPLE 7 describes a different instance of multimodal argument which employs arguing “by taste.”

EXAMPLE 7:
A friend tries to convince you that “Frogs Leap PS 2015” is an exceptional Petite Syrah by quoting high praise in a wine guide and by handing you a glass with the comment “Taste it and you will see.”

One strand of this argument is a standard appeal to authority (the authority of the wine guide) which is composed of words. The other is an argument by taste which uses taste to support the proposed conclusion -- that Frogs Leap PS 2015 is an exceptional Petite Syrah. We can summarize this second strand of argument as:

EXAMPLE 7:
Premise: Tasting of the wine
Inference Indicator: ...Taste it and see...
Conclusion: Frogs Leap PS 2015 is an exceptional Petite Syrah.

An approach to informal argument that recognizes different modes of arguing further expands the realm of argument, in a way that makes the analysis of argument bear on a much broader range of reasoning. Modes are typically defined in a manner which highlights and draws attention to the different kinds of components which may be used in building arguments. Some have suggested that it is important to distinguish between modes of spoken and written arguing because the sound of a speakers voice is a key ingredient of the former which has no exact equivalent in the latter. Making this distinction is one way to recognize the important role that an accent, a scream, a sobbing tone, or other prosodic elements may (as Kišiček forthcoming shows) play in argument.

The idea that there are different modes of arguing is one way to account for new forms of argument that the development of communication technology makes possible. Virtual reality is, for example, emerging as a powerful vehicle for political argument. One of the first VR productions by the New York Times is “Kiya,” which recreates an incidence of domestic abuse in order to demonstrate the need to address the issue of domestic violence. Its producer describes it as an attempt to use “the immersive power of virtual reality: its ability to generate intense empathy on the part of the viewer; to wring from the audience the intense emotional connection that these stories deserve” (NYT, Jan 21, 2016). In constructing arguments, this kind of emotional connection can be a key element of the attempt to successfully convince an audience of some conclusion.

2.4 Coalescent Argument

Extending the notion of argument so that it encompasses different modes of arguing can be done without giving up the evidentiary notion of argument or the idea that evidence is presented in a set of premises that support some conclusion. One finds a more radical approach to the definition of argument in the work of Gilbert 1997, 2014 (cf. Carozza 2007). According to his account, arguing occurs when clusters of attitudes, beliefs, feelings and intuitions produce disagreement. An argument is an attempt to identify the points of agreement that characterize different arguers, in a way that brings together (the “coalescence” of) their different points of view. This approach expands the scope of argument to include whatever can be used to bring about the coalescence that is the aim of argument. This allows the substance of argument to be, not only reasons in the traditional sense, but also emotional or physical or other means of coalescence.

Gilbert develops his account by recognizing argument as it is traditionally conceived as the “logical” mode of argument, and by adding to it “emotional,” intuitive (“kisceral”), and physical (“visceral”) modes of argument. According to this account, a hug, a forlorn look, or tears may count as argument. In real life situations, this underscores the point that they may be a more effective method of resolving disagreement than premises as they have been traditionally conceived.

3. Dressing Arguments

When we analyze real life arguments, our first task is the identification of its component parts. Following Woods 1995b, doing so is sometimes called the “dressing” of an argument. This invokes a comparison with the butcher’s craft, where one takes animals “on the hoof” and dresses them to produce meat for consumption. In the case of arguments, arguments on the hoof are arguments as they appear in their real life contexts. One dresses them to identify and isolate their key components in a way that prepares the way for argument evaluation. Depending on the circumstances, and how extensive an analysis one wants to carry out, the following are key aspects of an argument that may need to be identified in the process of dressing it.

3.1 Premises and Conclusions

The most obvious task in dressing an argument is the identification of its premises and conclusion. Whether one analyzes an argument from a formal or an informal point of view, this is the starting point for argument evaluation. Like formal logic, informal logic understands premises and conclusions as the core components of an argument. In simple cases, they are clearly and explicitly indicated and easily identified.

Dressing arguments is a key aspect of the analysis of arguments that occur in ordinary discourse because such arguments are frequently unclear or open to interpretation. In isolating their premises and conclusions this means that we may have to:

• discard irrelevant digressions and off hand remarks (“noise”);
• eliminate rhetorical questions and other stylistic devices that obscure their meaning;
• pick between alternative ways of expressing them;
• settle the issues raised by incomplete, vague or ambiguous claims and utterances; and
• (to the extent that one recognizes different modes of arguing) identify visual, auditory, olfactory and other kinds of premises that provide evidence for a conclusion.

The analysis of examples in this article illustrates how this can be done in a wide variety of cases.

3.2 Implicit Premises and Conclusions

The possibility of implicit (sometimes called “hidden”) premises or conclusions is already recognized in ancient times, most notably in the discussion of enthymemes. Some examples have already been noted. Another is the following argument, by then American Vice-President Dick Cheney, defending the decision by the Bush administration to try foreigners charged with terrorism offenses in tribunals located outside the United States -- locations not encumbered by protections of the accused guaranteed in American courts.

EXAMPLE 8 (from a report in the New York Times, 15/11/2001):
“The basic proposition here is that somebody who comes into the United States of America illegally ... is not a lawful combatant.... They don’t deserve to be treated as a prisoner of war.”

We can plausibly summarize this argument as:

EXAMPLE 8:
Premise: Somebody who comes into the United States of America illegally ... is not a lawful combatant.
Implicit Premise: Someone who is not a lawful combatant doesn’t deserve to be treated as a prisoner of war.
Inference (Premise) Indicator: “The basic proposition...”
Conclusion: They don’t deserve to be treated as a prisoner of war.

Here the implicit premise identifies the link that ties the explicit premise to the conclusion. In dressing the argument it needs to be made explicit because it needs to be assessed in any attempt to evaluate the argument. Recognizing it raises the question how a “lawful combatant” should be defined, especially as combatants who illegally enter a country for the purpose of war (in undertaking surveillance or going behind enemy lines, for example) are widely recognized as prisoners of war.

The task of identifying implicit premises or conclusions raises theoretical questions because there are many circumstances in which different implicit premises or conclusions can be attributed to an argument. One common principle used in such circumstances is the “Principle of Charity,” which directs us to look for an implicit component premise that makes the argument as strong as possible. An alternative approach ascribes an argument the “logical minimum” -- i.e. the weakest premise necessary in order to connect the argument’s premises to its conclusion.

3.3 Audiences

A full account of the components of an argument must recognize aspects of their external as well as their internal components. In ordinary discourse, arguments often function as a way to convince a specific audience of some point of view, making audience a key feature of the argument.

A successful argument for the conclusion that the United Nations should be supported will, for example, need to address different issues when it is directed at a Chinese, Norwegian, or Swiss audience. As successful arguers have always known (and as rhetoric emphasizes) successful arguers address the beliefs, attitudes and values of their intended audience (they in this sense‘speak’ to it). In the world of actual argument, this frequently means that true premises and a valid inference are not sufficient for successful argument. This is why Tindale (1999, 2004, 2010) and others advocate an approach to informal logic that incorporates the analysis of audience.

The simplest way to build audience into the analysis and assessment of informal argument is in the way Aristotle suggests in his Rhetoric. Taking his approach, we must evaluate an argument not only by considering its logical strength (its logos, but also the pathos of the audience to whom an argument is addressed, and the character (the ethos) of the arguer as it impresses itself on the audience. The latter because, as Aristotle says, an audience will be more easily convinced by someone who they perceive to be a good person.

3.4 Kinds of Dialogue

Another external component of arguments is the kind of dialogue in which they are embedded. In a dialogue of inquiry, arguments are used as tools in an attempt to establish what is true. So understood, arguments must adhere to strict standards that determine what counts as evidence and counter-evidence for some point of view. In negotiation dialogue, arguments function in a different way. Here the aim is an agreed settlement between two parties who have conflicting interests and different, possibly irreconcilable, points of view. One can summarize these differences by saying that the expectations, norms and procedures for arguing depend on the kind of dialogue in which an argument is proposed.

Walton 2007 understands a dialogue as an exchange made up of an opening stage, an argumentation stage, and a closing stage. In the opening stage, the arguers in the dialogue agree to participate. The rules for the dialogue define what types of moves are allowed, what kinds of questions and responses are permitted, and what norms must be adhered to. The seven basic types of dialogue he distinguishes can be summarized as follows.

Within these general categories, more specific kinds of dialogue may be governed by strict rules. One subspecies of negotiation dialogue is, for example, collective bargaining, which legally prohibits “bargaining in bad faith” -- i.e. bargaining which takes place outside the bargaining table. In this kind of negotiation, the use of threats (to strike or lock employees out) are a key part of the process. In sharp contrast, threats are not acceptable in critical inquiry, where they are classed as instances of the fallacy ad bacculum.

The question whether there are other kinds of dialogue which need to be recognized remains open, as does the question whether there are types of argumentation which cannot be categorized in terms of any of the standard forms of dialogue (because they are a hybrid of different kinds of dialogue, or some new form of dialogue which is not clearly defined). Recognizing a dialogue in which an argument is embedded is an important part of dressing when this imposes standards for argumentative exchange which arguers may not have properly adhered to.

3.5 Dialectical Objections

Dialectics highlights the extent to which argumentation is an exchange between (real or imagined) interlocutors who argue for opposing points of view. It positions argument within the broader scope of dispute and debate. In argumentation theory, this approach to argument has been highlighted in pragma-dialectics, a theory which originates in Van Eemeren and Grootendorst 1992. It has been elaborated by “the Amsterdam School”, which has extended the different aspects of their theoretical perspective (see Feteris et al. 2011). It understands argumentation as a means of resolving differences of opinion according to the rules of critical discussion (a particular kind of dialogue that aims at the rational resolution of differences of opinion).

Within informal logic, the dialectical aspects of argument are manifest in the notion that arguers have “dialectical obligations” which are an essential component of proper argument (see Johnson 2000). As arguers, this suggests that our fundamental dialectical obligation is an obligation to respond to (and, where possible, anticipate) alternative points of view. In particular, we must respond to objections to our own views that are likely to be raised by our opponents in the dispute in which we are engaged.

To emphasize this point, Johnson distinguishes between the “illative” core of an argument and its “dialectical” tier. The illative core is the set of premises offered in support of the conclusion; the dialectical tier consists of alternative points of view, likely objections to the conclusion, and the premises and whatever assumptions characterize debate about the conclusion. According to Johnson, all genuine arguments are dialectical and all arguers are obligated to discharge dialectical obligations. This suggests that the standard account of argument assumed in the history of logic — a giving of reasons for some conclusion — can, without such elaboration, be classified only as a “proto-argument.”

Whether or not one goes as far as Johnson, one of the external components of argument that needs to be taken into account in dressing many real life arguments is the extent to which it is dialectical and the objections of interlocutors (real or potential) who have different points of view. This is another aspect of argument which may need to be noted in preparing it for assessment.

3.6 From Dressing to Assessment

Dressing arguments is a precursor to argument evaluation. It aims to identify and isolate their premises and conclusions, the inferences they contain, and other components which may be relevant to their assessment. Dressing can be a complex endeavour which requires the discarding of irrelevant aspects of communication, an interpretation of a situation in which premises and conclusions are not clearly demarcated, the identification of implicit premises or conclusions; and/or a recognition of multimodal premises or conclusions. In many cases, it requires a recognition that it is embedded in a particular kind of dialogue, is part of an exchange with some identifiable argumentative opponent, or is addressed to a specific audience an arguer is trying to convince. In this way, a full dressing of an argument requires a detailed account of its internal and external features.

4. Assessing Arguments

As Blair 2015 has emphasized, the ultimate goal of informal logic is normative. Its aim is an account of argument that can be used to decide when arguments are strong and weak; good and bad; and plausible and implausible. Informal logicians dress arguments to prepare them for evaluation. In view of this much of informal logic is an attempt to develop standards, criteria and processes for judging arguments. Particular arguments may be assessed in terms of general criteria for good argument; or as an instance of a fallacy or a particular scheme of argument.

One way to assess arguments in ordinary discourse is by translating them into a formal language and assessing them accordingly. This is a method which informal logicians sometimes use, especially in discussions of artificial intelligence, game theoretic approaches to dialogue, and formal accounts of various kinds of reasoning. More informal methods have been emphasized in the teaching of arguments and reasoning. in the use of informal logic in public discourse (to argue for or against, or in the analysis of particular points of view) and in the study of arguments which are not easily accommodated by formal methods.

4.1 AV and ARS criteria

In classical logic, an argument is (deductively) valid if its conclusion follows from its premises -- if it is impossible for its premises to be true and its conclusion false. The ultimate aim of arguing is a “sound” argument: a valid argument with true premises. Many issues arise if one tries to apply these criteria to informal arguments without adapting them in a number of ways, but they usefully make the point that the strength of an argument is a function of two things: (i) the viability of its premises, and (ii) the strength of the inference from these premises to its conclusion.

Within informal logic the simplest criteria for judging arguments is an informal analogue of soundness. It requires that an argument’s premises be acceptable and that its conclusion follow from these premises. We may call the latter “informal” validity (leaving open the question how it is best understood) and these two criteria the “AV” (Acceptability, Validity) criteria for assessing arguments.

Following Johnson & Blair (1977, 1994) many informal logicians understand informal validity in terms of relevance and sufficiency, making the criteria for good argument acceptability, relevance and sufficiency (the “ARS” criteria). The premises of an argument count as relevant to its conclusion when they provide some support for the conclusion and sufficient when they provide enough support to establish it as plausible. Relevance can be contrasted with irrelevance, which occurs in various instances of non sequitur, as occurs in the case of “straw man” and “red herring” arguments, which are common in ordinary discourse.

In contrast with classical logic, both the AV and ARS criteria assess premises as acceptable or unacceptable rather than true or false. Informal logic evaluates premises in this way for many reasons. As Pinto 2001 points out, the aim of many arguments does not appear to be assent to the truth of a proposition but the withholding of assent (or full assent) or a particular attitude or emotional state. An argument may, for example, function as a means of instilling fear or hope or disapprobation. In order to leave room for these kinds of examples, he defines an argument as “an invitation to inference” (68–69) which need not have as its aim justifying the truth of some proposition.

Informal logic favors acceptability over truth as a criteria for judging premises for other reasons as well. Because real life arguing tends to take place in contexts characterized by uncertainty which make it difficult to make judgments of truth or falsity. Because such arguments frequently revolve around ethical and aesthetic judgments which are not easily categorized as true or false. Because there are contexts (e.g., bargaining) in which good arguments do not depend on premises that can clearly be categorized as true or false. Because there are other contexts (in dealing with specific audiences, e.g.) in which truth may not, in itself, make a premise acceptable for informal argument. And, more generally, because philosophical discussions of truth which have raised many questions about what counts as true and false.

Understanding argument strength in terms of truth is also problematic in case of multimodal arguments which employ images and other non-verbal kinds of evidence. In these kinds of cases, it is not difficult to understand multimodal elements (photographs, diagrams, etc.) as misleading or not (and hence acceptable or unacceptable) though they are not naturally described as true or false.

4.2 Natural Language Deductivism

Within argument evaluation, one of the key questions raised by informal logic is the question how we should understand the informal validity which is a key component of strong arguments. Though informal logicians commonly distinguish between deductive and various alternative kinds of validity, some have (as Govier 1987 points out) assumed an alternative view, which she calls “Natural Language Deductivism” (NLD). It maintains that all informal arguments can best be interpreted as attempts to create deductively valid inferences, and should be analyzed and assessed accordingly.

To understand how NLD operates, we must see past the traditional use of deductive proof in logical and mathematical reasoning, which has encouraged the common misconception that deductive arguments are arguments with certain or necessary conclusions (like those traditionally associated with logical and mathematical reasoning). In general, a deductive conclusion is as certain as the premises it is founded on. This is an important point in informal contexts, where arguments rely on premises which are reasonable or plausible rather than certain. In such contexts, deductive arguments yield conclusions which are not certain, but reasonable or plausible.

The following example is taken from a radio commentary on population growth.

EXAMPLE 9:
The population of the world will grow from 6 to 9 billion in the next fifteen years so we will, if we are to provide sufficient food for everyone, need a way to provide for an additional 3 billion people.

This is an obviously deductive argument but one which depends on a premise which is not certain, but reasonable (because it is backed by other reasoning that extrapolates from established population trends). The argument is deductively valid, but it follows that its conclusion is reasonable rather than certain.

In dealing with arguments which are not explicitly deductive, the NLD approach interprets an argument as a deductive argument by attributing it implicit premises that make it so. The following argument is a frequently criticized pattern of popular reasoning which appeals to the authority of the television personality Dr. Oz, who provides nutritional and lifestyle advice.

EXAMPLE 10:
Dr. Oz Says It, So It Must Be True

If one judges only by the explicit premise (“Dr. Oz Says It”) this is not a deductively valid argument for the premise could be true and the conclusion false (Dr. Oz could be wrong). NLD circumvents this issue by ascribing the argument an implicit premise which renders it deductive. So understood the argument can be summarized as:

EXAMPLE 10:
Premise: Dr. Oz Says It.
Implicit Premise: If Dr. Oz says it, it must be true.
Inference Indicator: “So” (conclusion indicator)
Conclusion: It must be true.

This is a plausible reconstruction of the argument. For we cannot draw the conclusion from the stated premise without accepting the implicit premise. Once it is explicit, the argument is clearly deductive. This does not make it a good argument and instead suggests that we must evaluate its strength, not by evaluating its validity, but by evaluating the plausibility of its premises. Because the implicit premise is implausible -- as could be shown by citing many examples where Dr. Oz’s advice can be shown to be questionable -- an NLD analysis entails the (correct) conclusion that the argument is weak.

Because NLD reconstructs informal arguments as deductively valid arguments, Govier describes it as a theory of “reconstructive” deductivism. It makes argument assessment a two step process which (i) reconstructs an argument (by adding implicit premises) to make it a clearly deductive inference, and (ii) then evaluates the argument by assessing the strength of its (explicit and implicit) premises. The pragma-dialectical account of indirect speech acts (Eemeren and Grootendorst 2002, Groarke 1999) is well suited to the first of these two tasks. Deductive reconstruction always seems possible because one can always assign the claim that an argument’s conclusion follows from its explicit premises as an implicit premise that renders the inference deductively valid.

The following inductive generalization can serve to show how NLD deals with what would otherwise be thought to be paradigm examples of informal arguments which are not deductively valid.

EXAMPLE 11:
The French are fastidious about their appearance. I have met many of them in the course of my work there and this was true of all of them.

Taking an NLD approach, this argument can be understood as a deductively valid argument which can be dressed as:

EXAMPLE 11:
Premise:I have met many French in the course of my work there and all of them were fastidious about their appearance.
Implicit Premise: The French have the attitude I witnessed in the many French I have met.
Inference Indicator: therefore (implicit)
Conclusion: The French are fastidious about their appearance.

When the argument is analyzed in this way, its strength can be evaluated by assessing the strength of its explicit and implicit premise. This is a productive approach to evaluation because the fundamental issue the argument raises is whether the French the arguer has met are a representative sample of the French in general (rather than, say, those in their own profession), i.e. the question raised when one assesses the proposed implicit premise.

Deductivist reconstruction is an approach to argument assessment which makes explicit some of the key claims and assumptions that individual arguments depend on. Because it analyzes all arguments as instances of one well understood form of inference it eliminates the need to distinguish between arguments which are deductive, inductive, conductive, abductive, etc. -- a distinction which can be difficult to make in dealing with informal arguments which can be interpreted in different ways. Aristotle is a key figure who adopts a deductivist approach (see Groarke 2009).

Those who reject deductivism argue that it is an artificial theory which forces informal arguments to adhere to an overly restrictive model of inference that is too narrow to account for the richness of ordinary reasoning (see Johnson 2000 and Godden 2004).

4.3 Informal Validity in Other Guises

Other approaches to informal logic understand informal validity in a variety of ways. They see deductive reasoning as one variant of such validity, but distinguish other ways in which premises may entail conclusions. In doing so, they assess the strength of an argument by assessing the acceptability of its premises and the strength of the link between its premises and its conclusion. The ARS criteria provide one basic way to distinguish between arguments that provide no, some and strong support for their conclusions.

Many treatments of informal arguments assume the distinction between deductive and inductive arguments, a distinction which Govier 1987 dubs “the great divide,” emphasizing the latter over the former. Sometimes inductive arguments are understood narrowly, as inductive generalizations, but they are more commonly said to be arguments in which the premises of the argument are only probable or plausible, leaving open the possibility that the premises are false.

In their categorization of basic forms of inference, informal logic also countenances other forms of validity: notably “conductive” and “abductive” arguments. Conductive arguments accumulate non-decisive reasons in favour of a conclusion. Different pieces of evidence may merely suggest (and not prove) that someone charged with murder is guilty. But accumulated (the witness said he pulled the trigger, the ballistics report shows that the bullet came from a gun he owned, he was overheard saying he would “get” the victim, etc.) these different reasons may provide a strong, though not conclusive, conductive argument for the conclusion that the accused is guilty.

Abductive arguments are inferences to the best explanation. They typically recognize some facts, point out that they are entailed by some hypothesis, and conclude that the hypothesis is true. Taken at face value, abductive arguments appear to be instances of the deductive fallacy “affirming the consequent,” and might on these grounds be dismissed, but it is clear that they play a central role in medical, scientific and legal reasoning (see Walton 2004).

4.4 Fallacy Theory

In its search for more nuanced ways to deal with informal logic, informal logic initially turned to fallacy theory. In its treatment of the fallacies, it revives a tradition which can be traced to Aristotle. In the history of logic and philosophy, its significance is reflected in the writings of Locke, Whately, and Mill. Today, this tradition manifests itself in textbooks and websites which attempt to teach good informal reasoning by teaching students how to detect the standard fallacies. One can find a detailed discussion in the article on fallacies in this encyclopedia.

Theoretical discussions of fallacies have not produced an agreed-upon taxonomy, but there is a common set of fallacies which are frequently used in the analysis of informal arguments. They include formal fallacies like affirming the consequent and denying the antecedent; and informal fallacies like ad hominem (“against the person”), slippery slope, ad bacculum (“appeal to force”), ad misericordiam (“appeal to pity”), “hasty generalization,” and “two wrongs” (as in “two wrongs don’t make a right”). In informal logic textbooks, authors may devise their own nomenclature to highlight the properties of particular instances of fallacious argument (“misleading vividness” designates the misuse of vivid anecdotal evidence, and so on.)

In the research literature, Woods and Walton have discussed the definition, analysis and assessment of a variety of fallacies in a series of articles and books, first as co-authors and then individually (see Woods and Walton 1989, Walton 1989, Woods 1995, Walton 2000). Van Eemeren and Grootendorst 1992 have proposed a “pragma-dialectical” theory which analyses fallacies as violations of the rules of critical discussion dialogues. A representative collection of classical and contemporary essays on the fallacies is found in Hansen and Pinto 1995.

Fallacy theory has been criticized on the grounds that there is no agreed way to define what a fallacy is; because there is considerable disagreement over the definition of particular fallacies; and because one may evaluate most arguments without having to rely on an account of fallacies (see, e.g., Feldman 2009). Approaches to ordinary argument that do focus on fallacies emphasize examples of poor reasoning rather than good argument. Hitchcock (1995, 324), e.g., writes that the idea that we should teach reasoning by fallacies is “like saying that the best way to teach somebody to play tennis without making the common mistakes … is to demonstrate these faults in action and get him to label and respond to them.”

The issues with fallacy theory are compounded by many instances of traditional fallacies which seem to have some merit real life argument. The following are examples:

EXAMPLE 12:
A remark from a Danish television debate over the question whether the Danish church should be separated from the Danish state (Jorgensen 1995, 369): “You should not listen to my opponent. He wants to sever the Danish church from the state for his own personal sake.” This appears to be a classic example of ad hominem, Kahane 1995 (p. 65), describing it as a fallacy that occurs when an arguer attacks “his opponent rather than his opponent’s evidence and arguments.” In this case the issue raised is the speaker’s motivation for his position rather than the position itself. But if there is good reason to believe that he wants to sever the church from the state for his own personal gain, this may be a legitimate reason not to take his arguments seriously (because he has a conflict of interest).

EXAMPLE 13:
Martin Luther King Jr., influenced by Gandhi, argued that we can justifiably break laws if our goal is just change. Such arguments play a central role in the civil rights movement. They are not obviously fallacious, but they seem to be a clear case of “two wrongs make a right” suggesting that we can justifiably do something wrong (break a law) because it is a response to another wrong.

EXAMPLE 14:
The argument that “the attempt to use military might to put an end to terrorism is wrong because it will take us down a slippery slope that will end in improper interference in the affairs of independent states” cannot be dismissed by saying that it is an instance of the fallacy slippery slope. If the slippery slope is plausible, then the argument has some merit.

EXAMPLE 15:
The argument “No one with a history of heart disease should take up running, for running is a strenuous form of exercise, and no one with a history of heart disease should engage in strenuous exercise” is deductively valid. One cannot accept the premises without accepting the conclusion. But this suggests that all deductive arguments commit the fallacy begging the question, which occurs when an argument assumes what it attempts to prove.

In the wake of many examples and discussions of this sort, careful accounts of fallacies increasingly recognize that there can be reasonable arguments which have the form of traditional fallacies.

One way to deal with the issues such examples raise is by distinguishing fallacies which do and do not have non-fallacious instances. Equivocation, post hoc ergo propter hoc, false dilemma, non sequitor and hasty generalization are, for example, patterns of argument that are inherently mistaken. In contrast, fallacies like ad hominem, two wrongs reasoning, guilt by association, and appeal to pity are fallacies which appear to have legitimate uses in real life reasoning.

If one analyzes ad hominem as a particular kind of move in dialectical exchange, for example, then one may recognize rules of dialogue which distinguish circumstances in which such moves are and are not acceptable.

Though some of the issues with the traditional fallacies have diminished their significance in the theory of argument, they continue to be a popular way to analyze everyday reasoning and argument, introductions to fallacies sometimes listing hundreds of variants (Dowden 2016 (Other Internet Resources), Bennett 2013, Paul and Elder 2012). Battersby and Bailin 2011 have suggested that fallacies be understood as argument patterns “whose persuasive (rhetorical) power greatly exceeds its probative value (i.e., evidential worth),” making fallacies errors in reasoning that are rooted in their rhetorical appeal.

4.5 Argument Schemes

Argument schemes are recurring patterns of argument. Once identified they can be used to evaluate an instance of arguing, or as recipes which tell us how to construct strong arguments. Walton, Reed & Macagno 2008 provide a significant compendium of 96 schemes. Within informal argument, commonly used schemes include Argument by Sign, Argument by Analogy, Argument by Example, and Slippery Slope Argument.

One standard approach to argument schemes combines a particular pattern of argument with a set of “critical questions” that it raises. Consider the scheme “Appeal to Authority” (also called “Appeal to Expert Opinion”), which might be summarized as follows.

A is an authority in domain D.
A says that T is true.
T is within D.
(Therefore) T is true.

Critical questions:
1. How credible is A?
2. Is A an authority in domain D?
3. What did A assert that implies T?
4. Is A someone who can be trusted?
5. Is T consistent with what other experts assert?
6. Is A’s assertion of T based on evidence?

The following student comment is an example of an argument from authority.

EXAMPLE 16:
We should not stockpile nuclear weapons. We need to heel Einstein’s warning, after the bombing of Hiroshima, that the proliferation of the atom bomb would inevitably lead “to destruction even more terrible than the present destruction of life.”

We can summarize this as an instance of the argument from authority scheme, where A=Einstein, D=politics (of nuclear weapons), T=The proliferation of nuclear weapons will lead to terrible destruction. We can then assess the argument by asking whether there are satisfactory answers to the critical questions the argument raises. In this case, questions of particular importance are question 2 (“Is Einstein an authority on the politics of nuclear weapons?”) and question 5 (“Is the claim that the proliferation of nuclear weapons will lead to terrible destruction with what other experts on the politics of nuclear weapons assert?”). Because it is not clear that either question has a positive answer, example 16 is a weak argument.

One way to understand schemes is as moves in argument which are backed by the warrants implied by the critical questions that accompany them. Alternatively, one may understand a scheme as a kind of inference rule (see Prakken 2010b), some critical questions ensuring the truth of the premises, others ensuring that the context of the inference is appropriate. Deductive schemes are commonly codified in standard rules of inference like modus ponens (“Affirming the Antecedent”), double negation, modus tollens, etc.

Groarke & Tindale 2013 use traditional fallacies as a basis for a set of schemes, treating ad hominem, guilt by association, appeals to ignorance, two wrongs reasoning, etc. not as fallacies, but as legitimate patterns of reasoning. If an arguer has, for example, repeatedly shown poor judgment, bias or clearly lacks the requisite knowledge to make reasonable judgments about some issue, then this is a plausible reason to dismiss their point of view on ad hominem grounds. This is especially true in informal contexts, in which arguers frequently do not have the time or ability to investigate and assess all the arguments behind the various positions directed at them. On this account of schemes, fallacies turn out to be deviations from an inherently correct norm.

4.6 Multimodal Argument

Much remains to be said about the assessment of multimodal arguments that include non-verbal elements. That said, the different techniques informal logic uses to assess informal arguments can in many cases be applied to visual and other multimodal arguments. Even when the premises of an argument are not verbal, one can judge them as acceptable or not. A photograph or an image presented as evidence for a conclusion may be unacceptable because it presents a situation in a misleading way -- because it cuts out essential context, because it has been tampered with, and so on. In advertising, many photographs are purposely ‘doctored’ to present things in ways that do not accurately reflect what is photographed.

In evaluating multimodal argument, the AV and RSA criteria for good argument can be applied. In an election campaign, a political cartoon which depicts a politician as a liar may invite the inference that voters should not vote for him/her. In assessing the argument presented, we may ask whether this portrayal fairly or unfairly characterizes the politician in question, and whether the suggested conclusion that one should not vote for them follows (possibly not if other candidates have more serious shortcomings).

In many instances, multimodal arguments are instances of fallacies of particular argument schemes. Visuals used in argumentation are, for example, often instances of “hasty generalization,” using emotionally powerful pictures of some behavior to promote generalizations which are not founded on a proper, representative sample. Dove 2016 has discussed the application of argument schemes to cases of visual argument, showing how this is easily accomplished. He suggests one scheme, “argument from fit” as a uniquely visual scheme that applies to arguments in which the borders of two objects are visually inspected to determine whether the objects are part of a larger whole (as when one tries to piece together fragments one might find in an archaeological dig).

5. Other Topics

Like any field of study, informal logic is constantly evolving. Its attempt to understand argument as it occurs in a broad range of real life situations continues to push it toward a broader account of argument which recognizes more ways in which arguing can occur and how and when it should be judged successful. The following are some current topics of discussion.

5.1 Argument Maps

When one understands an argument as a collection of premises and a conclusion with an inference structure one may illuminate and analyze this structure with argument diagrams or “maps.” Mapping of this sort has a long history. It is already used in Whatley 1826 and in the early twentieth century, by Wigmore 1913, who develops a form of mapping (“evidence charts”) to portray and analyze complex chains of judicial reasoning.

As interest in the analysis of informal reasoning has intensified, it has been accompanied by a renewed interest in argument mapping. In some ways this has revived the practice of mapping, but in a new way that allows for much more complex and sophisticated approaches to mapping. Most significantly, it has been accompanied by the development of software (Rationale, Reason!Able, Araucaria, Athena, Compendium, Theseus) and online aids (Debate Mapper, TruthMapping.Com, Argunet, Agora) designed to assist in the mapping of real life arguing.

5.2 Narratives in Argument

One of the catalysts for the development of informal logic has been the desire to extend theories of argument so that they can account for aspects of arguing which are not accounted for in traditional accounts of argument. The study of the argumentative use of visuals (photographs, video, drawings, etc.) is a case in point. A more recent topic is the study of the role of narratives in arguing. This is a role that is already highlighted in ancient times -- most famously in Plato. His version of “The Ring of Gyges” is, for example, a story used to support a particular conception of human nature. In the case of fables, parables, and morality plays, narratives seem to be explicitly designed to be effectively used in argument.

One can understand the narratives used in argument in different ways: as embellishments, analogies, or as veiled generalizations. Current discussions are influenced by Fisher 1987, who argues that argument itself is best understood as narrative, and by Nussbaum 1990, who looks to literature as a way to better understand complex moral situations. The significance of narratives in arguments is recognized in argument schemes that Walton, Reed, & Macagno 2008 identify as “narrative-based” schemes.

But the extent and usefulness of analyses of narratives as argument remains a matter of debate (see Govier & Ayer 2013, Olmos 2014, Plumer 2015). Certainly it is clear that stories, including fictional stories, can play a key role in establishing conclusions, but this leaves open the questions whether they should be understood as premises and/or conclusions, and whether they are in some way irreducibly narrative (and need to be analyzed and evaluated with alternative standards for good argument).

5.3 Argument Flags

It seems obvious that an argument cannot succeed without being recognized and paid attention to. The best argument in the world cannot convince someone of its conclusion if everyone ignores it. In the world of public argument, this is a serious issue, for the public has a great many arguers and arguments competing for its attention. In a world in which a quick search for information produces thousands of competing arguments on virtually any topic, it is constantly overwhelmed by many more arguments and points of view than anyone can consider seriously.

Argument “flags” operate as one solution to this problem, functioning as a way to draw attention to an argument. A successful flag may be a stunning photograph of a tragedy, a provocative act (of the sort that draws attention to Greenpeace campaigns), a large newspaper headline, or a question that peaks an audience’s curiosity. Many flags are not a part of the premise and conclusion structure of an argument, only serving to draw attention to it. In cases such as these, a flag does not add to the epistemic merit of an argument, but it may still play a key role achieving argument success by ensuring that an argument is taken seriously.

5.4 Emotions in Argument

Traditionally, emotional appeals have been seen as fallacious moves in argument. This is too simple a view of the role of emotion within informal discourse, where appeals to emotion play a significant role that cannot be rejected out of hand. In a discussion of nuclear policy, the emotion inherent in a description of the consequences of nuclear war (say, the dropping of the bomb on Hiroshima) can play a legitimate role in argument. In legal proceedings, there is explicit room for a victim’s emotional account of the impact of a crime, which is usually considered in sentencing.

Gilbert 1997,2014 has emphasized emotional arguments, investigating the role that different kinds of emotion and expressions of emotion play in real life arguments, where they often function as a way to convince an audience of a particular point of view. When a student (to take one of Gilbert’s examples) cries in a professor’s office as they plead for a higher mark, their emotional outpouring is a key component of their attempt to convince the professor that their mark should be changed. In real interchange, such appeals are frequently successful. In distinguishing between appeals which should be accepted and rejected, Gilbert suggests a re-conception of argument that recognizes emotional arguments as a unique genre of argument that needs to be evaluated in a different way than traditional approaches to argument suggest.

5.5 Critical Thinking Tests

Critical thinking tests attempt to measure argumentation skills. They have been used to test the abilities of students or others, but also as a way to test the success of attempts to teach informal reasoning. Though they can provide an important way to empirically measure the skills that informal logic teaches, many of the tests are inconclusive and beset by many problems.

What should count as good reasoning and critical thinking (or, even more so, creative thinking) is not easily assessed using standardized tests designed for large scale use, which typically rely on multiple choice question and answers (see Sobocan et al. 2007). The California Critical Thinking Test reflects the (outdated) view of critical thinking elaborated in “The Delphi Report,” commissioned by the American Philosophical Association in 1987. It focuses on a very narrow range of critical thinking skills (one of many possibilities) which in many ways oversimplifies the competencies required for good informal reasoning (see Groarke 2007).

In real life contexts, good arguing (and thinking) is in many ways open ended and unpredictable, dialectical, and influenced by pragmatic and contextual considerations which are difficult to incorporate within standard tests. Ennis 2013 provides a comprehensive proposal for dealing with this and the other complex issues that are raised by attempts to teach critical thinking.

5.6 Argument Mining

The assumptions of informal logic have been tested in a different way by commentators who study argument “corpora” -- large collections of argument drawn from natural language discourse. In an early study of this sort, Jorgenson, Kock and Rorbech 1991 analyzed a series of 37 one-hour televised debates from Danish public TV. The debates featured well-known public figures arguing for and against current policy proposal. A representative audience of 100 voters voted before and after the debate, in an attempt to statistically establish what moves and properties are likely to win votes in a representative audience. These conclusions were then compared with commonly held notions about “proper” or “valid” argumentation. Other studies consider corpora made up of large databases of selected written texts (see, e.g., Goodwin & Cortes 2010, and Mochales & Ieven 2009). In principle, corpora made up of whole libraries may be tested.

Argument mining has emerged as a subfield of data mining, or text mining (or computational linguistics). It uses software and algorithms that automatically process text looking for argument structures -- for premises, conclusions, argumentation schemes, and extended networks of argument. Researchers have investigated methods for argument mining in legal documents , on-line debates, product reviews, academic literature, user comments on proposed regulations, newspaper articles and court cases, as well as dialogical domains. Arg-tech, the Centre for Argument Technology, plays a central role in such developments.

5.7 Virtue-based Approaches to Argument

Virtue-based approaches to informal argument extend virtue-based approaches to ethics and epistemology to the realm of informal argument. Doing so shifts attention from a focus on acts or objects of arguing toward the agents who create them. Looking at arguments from a virtue point of view, one might say that the wise person (the person who embodies virtues) is the best judge and provides the ultimate criterion for whether something is a good or bad argument or should be believed. This makes the epistemological criterion the lived reality of someone judicious rather than a fixed formula or algorithm. A list of works on virtue approaches to argument is available at Virtues and Arguments: A Bibliography.

5.8 Artificial Intelligence (AI)

Like informal logic, the development of artificial intelligence requires theoretical models that can account for informal arguing in widely diverse contexts. Informal logic models of argument have, therefore, influenced the attempt to model argumentation between agents in multi-agent systems which mimic or assist human reasoning. Computational applications have been applied to large-scale webs of inter-connected arguments, and to reasoning about medical decisions, legal issues, chemical properties and other complex systems. Automated argument assistance functions as a computational aid that can assist in the construction of an argument. Verheij 2014 provides a good overview of the issues.

Insofar as informal logic remains an attempt to develop a logic that is accessible to the everyday reasoner, it and computational modeling will remain distinct endeavors. But both assume a theoretical understanding of the way in which informal reasoning works and should be assessed. In the long run, the formal modeling AI requires may reestablish stronger links between formal and informal logic. The results may foster the development of informal logic within a more integrated logic (or argumentation theory) that acknowledges the differences between formal and informal logic, but recognizes an overarching model of argument that accounts for both.

6. The Components of Informal Logic

As a field of study and research, informal logic has evolved into a complex attempt to understand the nature and assessment of informal arguments. Though a list of informal logic issues cannot be definitive, the development already outlined suggest that a comprehensive theory of informal argument (an “informal logic”) should be made up of answers to a significant, cohesive subset of the following questions.

1. What are acts of arguing and what principles of communication which they depend on?
2. How should non-verbal modes of arguing be understood?
3. What different kinds of argumentative dialogue (inquiry, negotiation, eristic, etc.) should be distinguished? And how do they govern the argumentation they contain?
4. What basic types of argument need to be distinguished?
5. When is a premise acceptable or unacceptable?
6. What kinds of informal validity (deductive, inductive, abductive, etc.) need to be distinguished?
7. What general criteria define good argument?
8. How should argument schema be defined?
9. What role should fallacies play in understanding and assessing arguments (and how should fallacies that play a role be defined)?
10. How do audience (pathos), ethos and other rhetorical notions determine successful argument?
11. What dialectical obligations are attached to informal arguing?
12. What is the extent to which the principles that govern informal argument can be incorporated within a formal systems?

Different collections of answers to these questions define different informal logics.

7. Informal Logic and Philosophy

To some extent, the relationship between informal logic and philosophy flows both ways. The practice of philosophy inevitably assumes (and often develops) some account of argument as it assembles evidence for different philosophical perspectives. Informal logic assumes (and often develops) some view of the nature of reason, rationality and what counts as evidence and knowledge as it develops its theory of argument. The philosophical issues in play are tied to complex, unsettled questions about knowledge and evidence.

Informal logic’s ties to epistemology are reflected in Mercier and Sperber (2011), which argues that reasoning is a practice which has evolved from, and needs to be understood in terms of, the practice of argumentation. Johnson 2000 pushes in the opposite direction, arguing that a comprehensive account of argument must be built upon a philosophical account of rationality. The account of knowledge that Goldman 1999 develops situates it in the social interactions that take place within interpersonal exchange and knowledge institutions. In developing this account he pays considerable attention to informal argument and the constraints which make it a valuable practice. Informal logic’s relationship to the epistemological principles of pragmatism is discussed in a 2002 volume of Philosophica which discusses informal logic in the context of Hilary Putnam’s philosophy.

Despite these overlapping interests, informal logic has had limited influence on core philosophical disciplines. Woods 2000 speculated on the reasons why. In part, informal logic’s position within philosophy reflects the broader fragmentation of philosophy in North America, Rescher 2005 (p. 4) concluding that “The most striking aspect of contemporary American philosophy is its fragmentation. The scale and complexity of the enterprise is such that if one seeks in contemporary American philosophy for a consensus on the problem agenda, let alone for agreement on the substantive issues, then one is predestined to look in vain.” In a context characterized by increasingly independent subdisciplines rather than shared interests, Rescher (p. 9) notes that “The rapid growth of ‘applied philosophy’ … is a striking structural feature of contemporary North American philosophy.” Informal logic is one aspect of this growth.

To some extent, informal logic’s relevance to philosophy does not lie in its influence on key philosophical disciplines so much as their influence on it. In North American and elsewhere, informal logic is a field in which philosophers apply their theories of argument (rationality, knowledge, etc.) to everyday argument. In keeping with this, philosophers continue to be the core contributors to informal logic, and philosophy departments in colleges and universities are the core department which teach the courses which are informal logic’s focus. The influence of these courses on enormous numbers of students requires that we at least qualify Rescher’s remark (p. 22) that: “The fact is that philosophy has little or no place in American popular (as opposed to academic) culture… …philosophy nowadays makes virtually no impact on the wider culture of North America.”

Outside of philosophy, informal logic has been increasingly influenced by -- and has exerted its own influence on -- Rhetoric, Communication Studies, Discourse Analysis, Semiotics, Linguistics, and Artificial Intelligence. Inside and outside of philosophy, its attempt to build a comprehensive theory of reasoning and argument has important implications for our view of rationality, the nature of the mind and its processes, and the social, political and epistemological role of reasoning and argument. At this point, explorations of its implications for philosophy of mind, ethics and epistemology remain rare and its focus continues to be the development for a broad theory of argumentation that can be a basis for the analysis and assessment of argument in a much broader range of contexts than those that have characterized traditional logic. Its growing relationship to computational modeling aims to provide this in a formal as well as informal way, in machine as well as human reasoning.

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• Arg-tech: Centre for Argument Technology
• Argument and Computation
• The listserv ARGTHRY provides a forum for announcements, queries, and discussion within the academic disciplines of Informal Logic and Argumentation Theory. To subscribe, send the message: “Subscribe ARGTHRY Yourfirstname Yourlastname” to listserv@yorku.ca, using your first and last name.
• The Arguer’s Lexicon. A lexicon of the names of informal logicians and other argumentation theorists.
• Argumentation: Critical Thinking, Dialogue, Persuasion (ArgDiaP)
• Argumentation et Analyse du Discours
• Automated Argument Assistance
• Association for Informal Logic and Critical Thinking (AILACT)
• Centre for Research in Reasoning, Argumentation & Rhetoric
• Cogency
• COMMA: Computational Models of Argument
• Dowden, Bradley, 2016. “Fallacies,”, in the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy, J. Fieser (ed.)
• Fallacies: The Nizkor Project
• Foundation for Critical Thinking
• Informal Logic
• International Society for the Study of Argumentation (ISSA)
• Logical Fallacies
• Ontario Society for the Study of Argumentation (OSSA)
• RAIL (Reasoning, Argumentation and Informal Logic)
• Silva Rhetoricae: The Forest of Rhetoric
• Studies in Logic, Grammar and Rhetoric
• Virtues and Arguments: A Bibliography
• Windsor Studies in Argumentation

Related Entries

abduction | Aristotle, General Topics: rhetoric | children, philosophy for | fallacies | logic: and games | logic: classical | logic: inductive | logical consequence | Port Royal Logic | science: and pseudo-science

Acknowledgments

The author would like to acknowledge and thank the members of ARGTHRY (and especially Tony Blair) for many suggestions on how to improve this article, and Roger Knights for comments on an earlier version.