Supplement to George Berkeley
B. Berkeley’s social activism and social thought
Although Berkeley is best known for his work in metaphysics and epistemology, he published several works that addressed specific social and political problems. All of these combine theoretical analysis with manifestos or policy proposals and the balance between the two varies from case to case. For example, A proposal for the Better Supplying our Churches in our Foreign Plantations and An Essay toward Preventing the Ruin of Great Britain are light on theory and focused on the practical. On the other hand, Passive Obedience is mainly theoretical although concerned with a specific political question and The Querist contains a complicated mix of theory, social commentary and detailed policy proposals. We won’t discuss all of his practical philosophy but will focus on those works which contain significant philosophical content, primarily Passive Obedience and The Querist.
Berkeley’s interest in social issues was not restricted to writing and his writing was itself, in some cases, a form of social activism. His best-known practical project was the Bermuda project, a plan to found a college in the New World. One of his aims in writing The Querist, was to advocate for a plan to reform the Irish monetary system and establish a central bank (see Section B.2). Although Berkeley devoted significant time and effort to both projects neither accomplished anything of any significance. Nevertheless, it’s clear that Berkeley did not see his philosophical work and social activism as separate endeavors. He foresaw practical consequences from his immaterialism and drew philosophical conclusions from his belief that tar-water was a universal remedy for health problems.
Berkeley’s social activism took place in the context of a fundamentally hierarchical social order and one that had many features that are morally repugnant to us today and whose problematic nature was recognized by at least some of Berkeley’s contemporaries. Ireland was an English colony governed by a Protestant, English-speaking, minority and the Catholic, Gaelic-speaking, majority were politically disenfranchised and restricted from full participation in the Irish economy. Newport, Rhode Island, where Berkeley spent three years pursuing the Bermuda project, was a center of the Atlantic slave trade and the use of enslaved people as servants and laborers was common. Although Berkeley advocated for significant reforms in both places, he never questioned or challenged the unjust social order itself and, while in Newport, purchased at least three enslaved people to work in his household and on his farm. One of the goals of the Bermuda project was to educate (and convert) Native Americans and, although Berkeley hoped that there would be families who would volunteer their children to be students at his proposed college, he explicitly raises the possibility of kidnapping Native American children for his school. In the section on The Querist below, we will further discuss his views on involuntary servitude in both the Irish and the American setting, but it’s clear that Berkeley did not see a fundamental moral problem in enslaving Africans and kidnapping Native American children and was willing to accept disenfranchising Irish Catholics both politically and economically. Berkeley’s social thought displays a complicated mix of the genuinely humanitarian and the truly horrifying and, to make things even more complicated, he explicitly disclaims some forms of racism. In what follows we will provide an overview of some of his ethical and social views but won’t address in detail whether his actions and activism are consistent with his theoretical views.
B.1 Passive Obedience
Berkeley’s most sustained discussion of foundational issues in moral and political philosophy came in a series of discourses he gave to Trinity College undergraduates which he subsequently published under the title, Passive Obedience: Or the Christian Doctrine of not resisting the Supreme Power, proved and vindicated upon the principles of the Law of Nature. As the subtitle suggests, the doctrine of passive obedience concerned the obedience owed to the supreme authority in the state. If we have a duty of passive obedience then we have a duty not to rebel or otherwise fight against the commands of the supreme civil authority. It does not require compliance with the commands of the state but it does require accepting the punishment for non-compliance. The doctrine of passive obedience was a politically sensitive topic in late 17th and early 18th century England and Ireland. Passive obedience was widely endorsed in the late 17th century by Anglican clergy, which put them in an awkward position during the revolution of 1688. Their religious views and self-interest put them firmly on the Protestant side, but the doctrine of passive obedience seemed to require them not to engage in active opposition to the Catholic monarch. In Ireland, where all the actual fighting of the revolution took place, Protestants were faced afterwards with the task of reconciling their principles with their actions. Even 25 years later, defending a strict duty of passive obedience could be taken as a rejection of the outcome of the revolution and as a sign of support for the exiled Catholic heir to the throne. Berkeley’s advancement in the Church of Ireland was seriously curtailed by this perception.[48]
Although the issues concerning what deference we owe to the commands of the civil authority are still with us, the main interest of Passive Obedience is not the conclusion he reaches on that question but rather the route that he follows to get there. Berkeley, as promised in the title, arrives at his conclusion starting from first principles. Berkeley sketches a comprehensive moral and political philosophy and argues that it follows from a small set of foundational principles. It’s to that system and its derivation that we will now turn.
B.1.1 The foundations of Berkeley’s moral system
Berkeley starts his discussion of the foundations of morality with a brief discussion of method. He lists four methods by which the moral law can be discovered: 1) directly from God’s ideas, 2) from innate ideas in our own minds, 3) from universal agreement and, 4) by deduction from first principles. Without explanation, he dismisses the first three (they “labour under great difficulties”) and proposes to proceed by “deductions of reason” (PO 4). Although he will proceed by deductions of reason, it doesn’t follow that the starting points from which the deductions proceed are known a priori and Berkeley, in general, treats the first principles as obvious without explaining exactly how we come to know them.
The starting point from which Berkeley derives his moral system are two fundamental principles:
- Happiness is what we most want and what constitutes our good (PO 5)
- There is “a sovereign omniscient Spirit, who alone can make us for ever happy, or, for ever miserable” and who is “the maker and preserver of all things.” (PO 6)
From these two principles Berkeley draws two further conclusions:
- Since our time on earth is insignificant with respect to the eternity in which we are in God’s hands, our pursuit of happiness should aim us at doing whatever it is that will result in God rewarding us with eternal happiness
- Since we are both created by and depend on God for our existence we owe God a duty of obedience to his will. (PO 6)
What 3) and 4) show is, that from the point of view of both prudence and duty, the ultimate aim of our action should be to do whatever it is that God commands us to do.[49] Acting in accordance with God’s will is what will best promote our happiness and acting in accordance with God’s will is also our duty.[50]
Accepting Berkeley’s conclusion, that we should do what God commands, does not by itself provide us with any determinate moral guidance. What’s required is some way of knowing what it is that God wants us to do. Berkeley’s attempt to address this question is what provides much of the originality and interest of his moral theory.
B.1.2 Berkeley, utilitarianism, natural law
Berkeley does not look to the Bible or the proclamations of the Anglican church in order to answer the question of what God commands us to do. Instead, as required by the method of deduction from first principle, he appeals to the fundamental principles from which he starts, primarily via an analysis of God’s nature, and uses that to state a general method for ascertaining what God commands of human beings. The argument, in outline, uses the assumption of God’s goodness and perfection to justify the claim that the aim of God’s commands is to promote the good of human beings. Since God doesn’t prefer any one person’s happiness to any other’s, Berkeley concludes that God’s laws are aimed at general happiness and that leads Berkeley to conclude that God’s commands are aimed at producing the greatest good for the greatest number.[51]
At this point, it might seem that there is just one law that God legislates for us: act in such a way as to produce the greatest good for the greatest number. But, as Berkeley points out, there is another possibility. Rather than “obliging every one upon each particular occasion to consult the public good, and always to do that which to him shall seem … most to conduce to it,” God could instead establish “some determinate, established laws, which, if universally practiced, have … an essential aptness to procure the well-being of mankind.” (PO 8) The second option enjoins us to aim at following God’s specific laws rather than directly at the well-being of humankind. If everyone always followed these laws then there would be no difference between the two options. But not everyone always does what they should and, whether from mistake or deliberate perversity, there are many departures from fully moral behavior. The failure of some to follow God’s law can create situations in which others, by following the law, bring about worse outcomes than they could obtain by breaking it. Berkeley is quite clear that on the second option following God’s laws can, in the world as it is, be the occasion of “great sufferings and misfortunes … to very many good men.” (PO 8) This consequence of following specific laws rather than aiming directly at the good, may make it seem clear that God would want us to act directly on the basis of the good rather than following a system of laws. Berkeley goes on, however, to argue in favor of God having decreed a system of determinate laws rather than the single law of trying to maximize human welfare. Berkeley here has distinguished quite clearly between what we now call act-utilitarianism (each action must be such as to produce maximum total welfare) and rule-utilitarianism (each action must be in accordance with that system of rules which is such that if everyone followed it total welfare would be maximized).
Berkeley gives two related arguments against the claim that God requires us to aim directly at the good. First, we are often not in a position to know what the best course of action in this sense would be. Consequently, we will often be uncertain as to which action is the right one to perform. Deciding whether a given action conforms to or violates a rule is, on the other hand, typically a much easier task. Supposing we know the determinate rules which God has decreed, then the rule-following option will lead to right-action in more cases. Second, we are even worse placed to evaluate the actions of others from the point of view of maximizing utility. It will be impossible to tell whether anyone has acted rightly or wrongly in any given case. Even if the immediate consequences are bad, it might be that they are outweighed by the long-term ones and, in any event, we will typically be even more ignorant of the relevant circumstances of other people than we are of what we need to know in choosing our own actions. The upshot of these two problems is that we would lack a reliable basis both for choosing what we do ourselves and for evaluating the action of others and, as a consequence, there will be no consistency in either the actions or moral judgments of even well-meaning people. The result will be a chaotic society in which, “there ensues the most horrible confusion of vice and virtue, sin and duty, that can possibly be imagined.” From which he concludes that what God requires is, “the observation of certain, universal, determinate rules or moral precepts, which, in their own nature, have a necessary tendency to promote the well-being of the sum of mankind.” (PO 10) Other than stating some widely accepted moral maxims as among the laws that God has decreed, Berkeley’s only detailed application of his system is to the question of passive obedience. Unsurprisingly, Berkeley argues that his version of the principle of passive obedience is one of the determinate rules that God has decreed.
Berkeley’s ethical theory has been categorized in different ways by different interpreters. Berkeley has been variously described as a natural law theorist (Flage 2019), a rule utilitarian (Darwall 2006), and an act utilitarian (Rickless 2016). One central issue is whether what God commands us to do is follow a set of determinate rules with considerations of utility used as a tool to discern God’s rules or whether God is commanding us to adopt his end and prescribing his rules as a means to that end. If the former, then Berkeley is a natural law theorist and considerations of utility are used to discover what God has commanded us to do. If the latter, then Berkeley is an act utilitarian and God’s rules are the effective means he has prescribed for us in pursuit of the happiness of all. In either case, we are morally obligated to follow God’s commands and the result of everyone following the rules is general happiness. The question concerns whether the rules are merely a means to general happiness or whether they supply the content of our moral obligations.
B.2 Berkeley on economics
Although it has received relatively little attention from philosophers, Berkeley devoted a significant amount of time and effort to economic issues on his return from America. His economic thought is almost entirely contained within The Querist which also contains an extensive discussion concerning social issues which we will discuss in the next section. The Querist is an odd production consisting entirely of a long list of numbered queries. There were 895 queries in the first edition (published in three installments over 3 years) but Berkeley cut it back to 595 in later editions (largely by omitting queries concerning details of his proposal for monetary reform and establishing a national bank). The focus of The Querist is on improving the economic situation of Ireland and thereby improving the well-being of the people of Ireland. The Irish economy in Berkeley’s time was almost entirely focused on supplying agricultural goods to England and a very large proportion of the Gaelic speaking, Catholic majority were desperately poor subsistence farmers. One notable feature of Berkeley’s proposals for reform of the Irish economy, in which he differs from other reform-minded Irish protestants such as Swift, is that he never directly challenges the English policies governing Ireland which were widely seen as a major cause of Ireland’s poverty and economic backwardness. Berkeley’s approach in The Querist is to take the restrictions on external trade as given and make proposals for improving the economy within that framework.
B.2.1 Berkeley on money and the central bank
In this section we will discuss Berkeley’s diagnosis of the unsatisfactory state of the Irish monetary system and his proposal to reform it. The specific problem that drew Berkeley’s attention was a very peculiar feature of the Irish monetary system in the early 18th century that Berkeley thought created serious problems for the Irish economy. Although there was an official monetary system based on the Irish pound, there was no currency embodying it. Rents and taxes (and other transactions) were specified in Irish pounds but they were paid using whatever foreign currency was available using officially set exchange rates. This peculiar arrangement, largely a product of an English refusal to allow Ireland to mint its own currency, meant Ireland had no control over the currency available for transactions within Ireland. In Berkeley’s time, distortions in the official exchange rates had led to a serious shortage of low value coins which made small cash transactions difficult (Johnston 1970). Although the ostensible problem that Berkeley is addressing is a very narrow one, not enough low value currency, the theory he offers is quite general and addresses fundamental questions about how currency obtains value and its role in the economy.
Berkeley’s proposed solution to this problem in The Querist was characteristically radical. Metal coinage was to be dispensed with entirely and replaced with a paper currency issued by a publicly owned central bank.[52] This proposal was especially bold at a time when financial innovation of any kind and paper currency in particular were viewed with extreme skepticism by the public in Ireland (and most of Europe).[53] The combined effect of the collapse of the South Sea Bubble in England and John Law’s Mississippi scheme in France, both a little over a decade earlier, had engendered grave doubts about any changes to existing economic arrangements. Berkeley nevertheless invested significant time and effort in lobbying for his proposals, among other efforts, taking up his seat in the Irish Parliament for the only time in his career.
There are two central components to Berkeley’s proposal. First, the replacement of gold and silver coinage with paper bills. The second is that the paper currency is to be issued by a publicly owned central bank with complete control over the money supply (within limits set by parliament). The currency had many of the characteristics of a fiat currency in the modern sense and was not to consist of certificates representing existing stores of precious metals or any other valuable commodity. The bank was not to have private shareholders and was to be supervised by a board of visitors appointed by the Irish Parliament.
One of the most interesting features of Berkeley’s discussion of money is that he is quite clear that the value of money doesn’t derive from either the value of the metal from which it is coined or from reserves backing it. Instead, the value of money derives from its acceptance as a marker of economic power. We can see this in these two queries:
23. Whether money is to be considered as having an intrinsic value, or as being a commodity, a standard, a measure, or a pledge, as is variously suggested by writers? And whether the true idea of money, as such, be not altogether that of a ticket or counter?
35. Whether power to command the industry of others be not real wealth? And whether money be not in truth tickets or tokens for conveying and recording such power, and whether it be of great consequence what materials the tickets are made of?
What gives money its value, according to Berkeley, is that it can be used to procure goods and services from other people and this power derives from the willingness of people to accept money in return for goods and services. Berkeley thought that once it is recognized that the value of money does not derive from the value of the material from which it is made, it can be seen that paper money has many advantages over metal. It’s cheaper to produce and the supply of money can be adjusted without the necessity of obtaining or storing precious metals. Because of these factors Berkeley thinks that the supply of money of various denominations can be more easily matched to the demands of the economy (Queries, 226, 572). Berkeley was especially interested in the availability of money to enable small value transactions since one of his strategies for reducing poverty was to involve the poor in the cash economy.
Berkeley recognized that a successful monetary system requires that people have confidence that they can use their money to obtain goods and services. He also recognized that inflation is one of the most common causes of loss of confidence in a monetary system. In the first edition of The Querist, Berkeley went into considerable detail in describing the publicly owned central bank that will issue the currency and govern the monetary system. Much of it is to ensure that the central bank is honest and its policies are motivated by the public good and not private interest. He also takes from Locke the idea that inflation is caused by an increase in the money supply relative to the availability of goods and services in the economy and devotes several queries to making this point and to ensuring that the central bank keeps the supply of money stable with respect to the size of the economy and thereby prevents both inflation and deflation.
B.2.2 The analogy between the visual language and money
There is an obvious analogy between the structure of Berkeley’s theory of money and Berkeley’s theory of vision. In both cases, there are items, currency or visual ideas, that are not in themselves valuable to us. In both cases, the items lacking intrinsic value derive an instrumental value from their correlation with something that is valuable to us. In the case of vision it is tangible qualities with their connection to pleasure and pain. In the case of money it is “the industry of others:” the goods or services they can supply us with. Berkeley typically uses different language in the two cases. Visual ideas are signs that signify the tangible qualities with which they are connected. Money is a ticket, counter, or token that conveys or records the power to command the industry of others. Nevertheless, the analogy is clear and striking.
The analogy also holds for two important structural features of the visual language. Visual ideas do not signify and are not directly correlated with tangible ideas. Instead, our visual ideas are correlated with and signify the prevailing action-experience connections. Similarly, money conveys power over the industry of others generally and is not tied to specific actions. What you get for your money depends not only on the amount of currency you have but the specific context in which you are exercising the power it conveys. And, very importantly, there is an exact counterpart to the role God plays in establishing the visual language. The relationship between visual ideas and tangible ideas is established and maintained by God and it is God’s wisdom and benevolence that ensures that those relationships are stable and knowable by us. In the case of money, it is the central bank that establishes and maintains the relationship between money and economic power. Central banks however, unlike God, are not wise and benevolent by nature. Berkeley devotes a large number of queries to the design and governance of the central bank and it’s very clear that the aim is to ensure that the central bank has the information about the economy that it needs and, most importantly, acts to promote the public good and not the interest of the government or the central bankers.
B.3 Berkeley on the well-ordered society
B.3.1 The well-being of a nation
Berkeley begins The Querist with two queries that establish the basic assumptions he will use in deriving and justifying his proposals for improving conditions in Ireland:
1. Whether there ever was, is, or will be, an industrious Nation poor, or an idle rich?
2. Whether a People can be called poor, where the common Sort are well fed, clothed, and lodged?
Industry, productive labor, is the true source of wealth and the measure of the wealth of a nation is the well-being of ordinary people. The various proposals that Berkeley puts forward in The Querist are all aimed at increasing the industry of the Irish people and thereby, given a well-ordered society, improving the lot of the common sort. Berkeley thought that the structure of the Irish economy, especially the monetary system, made it difficult for the industrious to reap the benefits of their labor. He also thought that features of Irish society produced sloth in the poor and wasteful luxury in the better off.
The way in which Irish society produces sloth and waste is by influencing the desires of the various groups that make up Irish society. For the poor, his diagnosis of the problem is their willingness to content themselves with mere subsistence:
19. Whether the bulk of our Irish Natives are not kept from thriving, by that cynical Content in Dirt and Beggary, which they possess to a Degree beyond any other People in Christendom?
Setting aside for now the moral judgment implied by calling their willingness to settle for mere subsistence “cynical”, it’s clear that Berkeley’s diagnosis is that the lack of industry in the poor is caused by their lack of appropriate desires. In order to change their behavior, we need to change what they want. We see a similar diagnosis in the case of the affluent, although the problem isn’t their lack of industry but rather the inappropriate use they make of their wealth:
61. Whether he whose Luxury consumeth foreign Products, and whose Industry produceth nothing domestic to Exchange for them, is not so far forth injurious to his Country?
In consuming foreign products, the well-off spend the product of their industry (or their ancestors’ industry) in a way that fails to benefit Irish society. Their consumption patterns result in the export of resources from Ireland that could have been used to stimulate the Irish economy for the ultimate benefit of the people of Ireland.
Given this diagnosis, the obvious solution is to change what it is that the Irish of various classes want. And Berkeley is quite clear in The Querist that what people want is something they learn from their peers and is, as a result, something that is open to change. For the poor the problem is that they want too little. By wanting too little, they are only willing to work until they have just enough and that means it is not possible to change their condition by expedients like higher wages (or allowing them to keep more of what they grow). Instead, the way to change the behavior of the Irish poor is to create in them new desires:
20. Whether the creating of Wants be not the likeliest way to produce Industry in a People? And whether if our Peasants were accustomed to eat Beef and wear Shoes they would not be more Industrious?
By stimulating desires to acquire goods beyond those absolutely necessary for life, the poor will be motivated to work harder and thereby contribute to the growth of the Irish economy. For the affluent, the problem is not that they want too little but that they want the wrong things. Berkeley devotes a number of queries to questioning the desires of the affluent for foreign luxuries. Although Berkeley is clearly skeptical of the appropriateness of wanting luxury items at all, his focus is on those wants that he saw as having the most pernicious effect on the economy, namely those for items imported from abroad. We can see both these attitudes in this series of queries:
161. How much of the necessary Sustenance of our People is yearly exported for Brandy?
162. Whether, if People must poison themselves, they had not better do it with their own Growth?
163. If we imported neither Claret from France nor Fir from Norway, what the Nation would save by it?
As Berkeley sees it, the poverty of a majority of the Irish people is not due to a shortage of resources but rather, in large part, to the distortions of the Irish economy caused by the failure of the poor to want enough and the inappropriate desire of the well-off for imported luxuries. The core of this part of his view is nicely summed up in Query 118:
118. Suppose the Bulk of our Inhabitants had Shoes to their Feet, Cloathes to their Backs, and Beef in their Bellies? Might not such a State be eligible for the Public, even though the Squires were condemned to drink Ale and Cyder?
B.3.2 Proper education and the penalty for sloth
Berkeley thinks that a well-governed state should not only focus on removing obstacles to economic activity, like Ireland’s distorted monetary system, but should also intervene to ensure that the population has appropriate desires. To correct the inappropriate desires of the population the best solution is proper education which includes inculcation of the principles of the established church. Education, however, takes different forms depending on the social standing and affluence of the student. There should be schools for the well-off but apprenticeships for the poor:
335. Whether a Sum, which would go but a little Way towards erecting Hospitals for maintaining and educating the Children of the Native Irish, might not go far in binding them out Apprentices to Protestant Masters, for Husbandry, useful Trades, and the service of Families?
Berkeley put some of these ideas into practice himself, setting up a spinning school for the children of the poor in his diocese and paying them in cash for their attendance. His own children, however, received education in classics from their father, and instruction in dancing from a dancing master. Both his interest in promoting the well-being of all of the Irish and his view that well-being consists in different things for different classes of people are evident in his own life.
As he emphasizes repeatedly in several of his publications Berkeley thought that the maintenance of social order requires an established church whose principles enjoy broad public support. This is the central theme of A Discourse addressed to Magistrates (published around the same time as The Querist) and one of the central themes of Alciphron. In The Querist, Berkeley recommends missionary activity to convert Irish Catholics to Anglicanism. Although he advocates for exposing Catholics to the doctrines of the established church, he explicitly rules out forced conversion (although he does consider compelled attendance at Protestant sermons) (Queries 322–325). Berkeley clearly believes that the state has a central role in promoting a particular set of values and a particular form of life and is no liberal in that sense. He does, however, in this part of his thinking, see the state’s role as one of educating, proselytizing, and incentivizing the desired values and forms of behavior and coercion plays a minimal role in the practices he recommends.
Given this background, it’s striking how different his recommendations are when it comes to what he calls “idleness and beggary”. For those who are capable of work but not engaged in it, Berkeley’s cure is temporary slavery:
577. Whether temporary Servitude would not be the best Cure for Idleness and Beggary?
579. Whether all sturdy Beggars should not be seized and made Slaves to the Public, for a certain Term of Years?
Berkeley gives two kinds of justification for this proposal in addition to the supposed deterrent effect of such punishment. First, that it has been tried and been found to be beneficial to the state:
576. Whether other Nations have not found great Benefit from the Use of Slaves in repairing High-roads, making Rivers Navigable, draining Bogs, erecting public Buildings, Bridges, and Manufactures?
And second, that his proposed policy of enslaving those that are poor and idle is, morally, no different from the accepted practice of imprisoning criminals:
580. Whether he who is chained in a Jail or Dungeon hath not, for the Time, lost his Liberty? And if so, whether temporary Slavery be not already admitted among us?
Although Berkeley scorns the idle of all classes, it is only the poor for whom enslavement is proposed and his discussion of the Irish poor is infused with aversion and disgust. This comes out quite clearly in A Word to the Wise:
The House of an Irish Peasant is the Cave of Poverty; within, you see a Pot and a little Straw, without, a Heap of Children tumbling on the Dunghill. … In every Road the ragged Ensigns of Poverty are displayed; you often meet Caravans of Poor, whole Families in a Drove, without Clothes to cover, or Bread to feed them, both which might be easily procured by moderate Labour. They are encouraged in this vagabond Life by the miserable Hospitality they meet with in every Cottage, whose Inhabitants expect the same kind Reception in their Turn, when they become Beggars themselves; Beggary being the last Refuge of these improvident Creatures.
Almost every discussion by Berkeley of the Irish poor emphasizes their dirtiness, a topic that he returns to repeatedly in both The Querist and A Word to the Wise. He even proposes a tax on dirt in The Querist (Query 558) although he almost certainly isn’t serious. Along with a real concern for the well-being of the poor, Berkeley shows an equally real disgust for their lifestyle, a disdain for any cultural differences, and an inability to comprehend the obstacles in the way of their obtaining better lives as a result of their own labor.[54]
We can now see Berkeley’s troubling and confusing set of attitudes towards enslaved Africans and Native Americans as rooted in and consonant with his attitudes toward the impoverished Catholic majority in Ireland.[55] He is firmly committed to a conception of the proper form of civilized life as found in England (and the Netherlands) as the best form of life for human beings. This form of civilized life contains within it, he thought, roles in which everyone, no matter their station, can find a happy life. And he is clearly concerned with making it possible for everyone, especially those lower on the social hierarchy, to have happy lives in accordance with his vision of civilized life. What he lacks is any tolerance for ways of life different from his ideal and any understanding of (or real interest in) the obstacles that the impoverished and oppressed face in achieving their goals. Berkeley’s proposal to educate Native American children was genuinely inspired by humanitarian concern and his willingness to kidnap them, if necessary, displays an equally real lack of empathy for and interest in the actual lives of the children and their families. Berkeley was not alone in recommending forms of involuntary servitude in the interest of humanitarian aims. Most notably, Francis Hutcheson, an influential 18th century moral philosopher made a proposal similar to Berkeley’s, which is especially interesting because Hutcheson’s work is often considered an important early source for the ideas that led to the abolitionist movement.[56] That Berkeley had distinguished company does not excuse his advocacy of and participation in reprehensible practices but does show that he was not unique in what seems to us now to be a paradoxical combination of attitudes.