1. Berkeley also argues against abstractionism in Alciphron and A Defense of Free-thinking in Mathematics (Berkeley [W] 3:292–293, 331–335; 4:134–5). See also the first draft of IP (Introduction” to the Principles), which differs in important ways from the published version ([W] 2:121–145).

2. Interpreters have usefully distinguished several different types of abstract ideas attacked by Berkeley. See Pappas 2000, 40–44.

3. The question of what exactly Berkeley’s argument against abstraction is, and what role it plays in supporting his immaterialism, is a disputed one. Winkler (1989, 30–35) and Jesseph (1993, 20–33) maintain that Berkeley’s main argument against abstraction is the argument from impossibility, according to which abstract ideas are impossible because they would be ideas of impossible objects. Such an argument could only play a supporting role in the attack on materialism. Others (including Pappas 2000, Bolton 1987, Atherton 1987, Muehlmann 1992) interpret the argument differently and assign a more central role to it. McKim 1997–8 provides a critical review of several relatively recent positions on the issue.

4. More specifically, she inquired as to “how the soul of a human being (it being only a thinking substance) can determine the bodily spirits, in order to being about voluntary actions” (Elizabeth of Bohemia and Descartes Corr., 62).

5. The origin of the label is Gallois 1974.

6. Analogously, I can conceive of something not thought of by me right now, even if in order to do so I must employ a representation that is conceived of by me right now. If Berkeley denies this, he ends up a solipsist and a presentist, not just an idealist, as is noted by many commentators, e.g. Tipton 1974, 161.

7. Campbell (2002, 128) attributes something like this point to Berkeley as well.

8. It presupposes representationalism because it assumes that we are immediately confronted with mind-dependent ideas and then raises the question of whether we can use them to conceive of unconceived, mind-independent objects.

9. Saidel 1993 provides a useful review and critique of some contemporary approaches to the Master Argument.

10. Another interesting and detailed account of the “identification argument” and the “argument from perceptual relativity” is offered by Muehlmann 1992, chapter 5.

11. More precisely, according to mechanism, bodies are not colored in the way we suppose them to be, based on our sensory ideas. One (Lockean) account of color is as a (mere) power to cause ideas in us. On that account, bodies are in fact colored and they would be colored even in the absence of perceivers.

12. For an alternative, phenomenalist account of Berkeleyian objects, see Winkler 1989, 191–203.

13. Contra more realistic interpretations of Berkeley’s ideas (sensible objects) proffered by Luce 1963 and Atherton 1990. On this topic see also Atherton 1995 and McCracken 1995.

14. See The Search After Truth, Elucidation Fifteen (Malebranche 1695 [1980], 657–668).

15. Of course, “if we open it” also requires an idealistic gloss, which would presumably go something like this: “If we form a volition to open it, which is then followed by the having of series of ideas of our hands moving, of the watch opening, etc.”.

16. Of course, this isn’t true of occasionalists such as Malebranche, who faced the same problem as Berkeley. It should also be noted that many officially rejected Descartes’ stance that natural philosophy concerns only efficient causation. Boyle, e.g., decreed that it should consider final causes, thus allowing it to partner with natural theology. His own work, however, had the overwhelming effect of directing attention to mechanical, presumably efficient, causes. Berkeley piously affirms the relevance of final causes to natural philosophy at PHK 107. For more on these issues see Nadler 1998.

17. For a more detailed and somewhat subtler account, see Downing 2005. Also see 5.2.3 below.

18. This oft-cited limerick and its companion (see below) can be found in Fleming 1985.

19. His claims here are interesting and perceptive. He maintains that the materialists must hold that the proper objects of the senses, e.g. light and colors, pop in and out of existence. And he highlights, à la Malebranche, the scholastic doctrine that conservation amounts to continuous creation. In both cases, however, there are clear grounds for arguing that the doctrine violates common sense less egregiously than an idealist intermittent existence.

20. Jonathan Bennett (1971, 170) turned this fact into a subject of scholarly controversy.

21. A number of controversial issues lurk here. Does Berkeley hold that ordinary objects are mediately or immediately perceived? Does Berkeley hold that all perception is immediate perception? A good guide here is George Pappas (2000, 147–182), who argues that Berkeley does allow for mediate perception, but that ordinary objects are typically immediately perceived.

22. Though done on the basis of regularities established by God.

23. Wilson 1999, 241 nicely raises a version of this worry.

24. See Wilson 1999, 241, footnote 2, where she cites Nicholas Sturgeon’s comments to her as the source of this point.

25. Berkeley explicitly affirms that spirits are substances in the Principles and Dialogues. Nevertheless, Robert Muehlmann (1992, ch. 6) has argued that Berkeley’s true view remains the Humean “congeries” account, although he conceals it.

26. Note that the marginal “+” sign that accompanies this entry is has standardly been taken as Berkeley’s indication that he has rejected or dropped consideration of the point contained therein. But see Daniels 2013 for an argument against this interpretation of the “+”.

27. The importance of regularity is not explicit in these entries, but Winkler (1989, 108–9) argues convincingly that Berkeley acknowledges it.

28. Tipton (1974, 307) notes that this definition would be “suspiciously useful” given Berkeley’s purposes.

29. Though he is happy to cite established authors when he agrees with them, more especially in his later works.

30. For discussion of the historical context see Part I of (Atherton 1990). For discussion of Kepler and his contribution to visual theory see (Lindberg 1976).

31. By not treating distance as input to visual size estimation Berkeley is able to give an account of the moon illusion that has the potential to avoid a problem faced by those that connect visual distance and visual size. The moon looks larger when it is near the horizon than when it is directly overhead and this is a psychological, not an optical phenomenon. One common way to explain the illusion is to claim that the moon looks more distant near the horizon and thus larger. A problem with this form of explanation is that most observers say that the moon looks closer when it is near the horizon. Since Berkeley’s explanation of the moon illusion does not involve an appeal to apparent distance his theory does not necessarily face the apparent incoherence that confront theories that rely on distance estimates (Egan 1998).

32. To recapitulate some key points from section 3 above, Berkeley commits himself in the Principles and Dialogues to a physical world constituted by sensory ideas. Berkeley’s physical objects are entirely passive, i.e. they lack all causal power, and only spirits/minds can be causes, with God (a spirit/mind) being the true cause of physical phenomena.

33. Oda (2022) and Peterschmitt (2008) have argued that Berkeley holds that Newtonian dynamic theory is true, which is incompatible with instrumentalist anti-realism; Oda argues for a pragmatist interpretation instead. But on Berkeley’s use of “truth” in this context see 4.3.3.

34. Since the efficient cause of the phenomena is never another physical/ideal thing but rather only God (or possibly some other mind).

35. See Ott (2019) for an argument that this De Motu version of laws of nature was Berkeley’s position all along.

36. See Belfrage 1985, 1986b; Berman 1994, 11–17; Pearce 2017, 11.

37. Berkeley, [W] 4:235–6.

38. This renunciation can also be seen in the earlier “Draft Introduction” of 1708. Berkeley, [W] 2:121–45.

39. See Jesseph 1993, ch.1. There is a large literature concerning both how Locke viewed abstract ideas and how exactly Berkeley argued against them. Michael Ayers (1991, vol. 1, 249) has argued that Locke’s abstract ideas are actually not different from Berkeley’s particular ideas, generally considered.

40. Toland 1696, 29–30, 36, 42.

41. Collins 1976 [1717], 56 (p. 4 of 1717 text).

42. See A 7.7.334–5. In the third edition of Alciphron, Berkeley omitted the sections wherein he presents and attacks the theory of abstract ideas. He let stand a rejection of abstract ideas, however, so, as Luce argues (in a note to A 7.4.291), this omission does not indicate any philosophical shift.

43. See 3D 233, PHK 89, and DM 21.

44. Both Berman 1981 and Belfrage 1986a interpret Berkeley along these same lines, as holding in the end a bifurcated theory of meaning, which allows that some language is meaningful by suggesting ideas, and some in virtue of other, more practical uses. Pearce 2022 calls this a “modified ideational theory” and argues against it. For a well-worked-out alternative reading of Berkeley that attributes a radical and unified theory of meaning to him, see Pearce 2017, which puts Alciphron VII and philosophy of language at the heart of Berkeley’s idealist theorizing. One surprising outcome of Pearce’s interpretation is that both forces and bodies are, for Berkeley, theory-dependent entities to which we can equally well “quasi-refer”.

45. Terms which denote activities of spirit or relations are in the same boat.

46. See Berkeley, [W] 2:137–8.

47. One might worry that Berkeley is left with a rather unsatisfying account of the religious doctrines he treats in Alciphron VII, since it turns out that “grace-theory,” for example, does not describe anything, such as a mode of action of God, but is simply inspirational. However, it should be noted that Berkeley applies this account only to certain Christian mysteries—grace, the Trinity, original sin, the nature of heaven. Berkeley maintains that we can have descriptive knowledge of God’s existence and his attributes. See Berman 1981, 219–229.

48. The details of exactly what Berkeley’s version of passive obedience allows in terms of defying the commands of the sovereign is complicated and a matter of disagreement in the secondary literature. For an interesting argument that Berkeley’s principle allows for very little in the way of disobedience see (Airaksinen 2021, 2022).

49. Rickless argues that Berkeley is best understood as adding an additional premise to the argument that we are morally obligated to do what God wills. The mere fact that God created and sustains us does not by itself justify the claim that we are obligated to do what God commands according to Rickless. In addition, the argument requires that the assumption that God is perfectly good (Rickless 2016, pp. 7–10). Berkeley clearly did accept the claim that God is perfectly good but doesn’t explicitly appeal to it in arguing for our obligation to obey God’s laws. We think it is unclear whether Berkeley thought his argument relied on these assumptions or not.

50. Some interpreters focus only on the prudential source of the requirement to do what God commands (e.g. Darwall 2005). We think that the final two sentences of PO 6 clearly distinguish between interest and duty and claim that both sorts of considerations require acting in conformity to God’s will.

51. This might seem clear but it has been denied (Flage 2008) and there has been some debate in the literature over exactly how to understand Berkeley’s conception of God’s aim (Rickless 2016, Flage 2019).

52. Neither part of Berkeley’s proposal is original. The two most relevant precedents are John Law’s proposal of a system for Scotland involving a paper currency issued by a national bank and the use of paper currency in the American colonies, both of which are discussed in The Querist. Berkeley was familiar with the second from the time he spent in Rhode Island in the early 1730s.

53. In 1721 there were resolutions passed in both houses of the Irish Parliament stating that anyone advocating a banking scheme would be “a Betrayer of the Liberty of his Country”. (Kelly 2010)

54. We are influenced here by the recent biography Berkeley by Jones (Jones 2021, Chap. 7). Jones explores Berkeley’s attitudes and knowledge of the lives and values of others and makes the case that Berkeley had limited interest in, knowledge of, and sympathy for those with values and lives different from his own.

55. As his proposal for enslaving the able-bodied poor in Ireland suggests, Berkeley’s advocacy for some forms of slavery and his acceptance of other forms does not have an obvious root in what we would now describe as racism. In a sermon he preached to the Society for the Propagation of the Gospel in 1732, Berkeley identifies “an irrational contempt of Blacks, as Creatures of another Species” on the part of British planters as one of the chief obstacles to converting them to Christianity. (Berkeley [W] 3:122)

56. Rozbicki (2001) has a fascinating discussion of early modern advocacy of enslaving the poor in Great Britain.