Supplement to George Berkeley
A. Berkeley on meaning
A.1 Early work and the Lockean theory
There’s a certain rather naive view of how language works, which Berkeley seems to have found in Locke and to which Berkeley himself adhered in his earliest philosophizing. This view is generally known in the Berkeley literature as “the Lockean theory.” The characteristic tenet of the Lockean theory, as Berkeley presents it, is expressed in the slogan, “Every significant (i.e. meaningful) word suggests an idea.”
For our purposes here, we will set aside the question of whether Locke actually held a version of “the Lockean theory”. Given Locke’s discussion of language in Book III of the Essay, it’s certainly prima facie plausible to attribute to Locke the view that significant words, excepting particles, stand for ideas. The question of whether Berkeley was right to attribute this view to Locke is complicated by further questions about the extent to which Locke and Berkeley have a common understanding of what ideas are. It’s quite clear that Berkeley did see Locke as holding a Lockean theory for two reasons: First, in his philosophical notebooks (PC 667) Berkeley specifically noted the exception made for particles in what must have been an allusion to Locke’s views about significance. Second, Berkeley held that the doctrine of abstract ideas was motivated by the thesis that every significant word must stand for a determinate idea, and Locke was the explicit target of Berkeley’s anti-abstractionism.
The earliest records of Berkeley’s philosophical thought show that his ideas about language and meaning were initially completely Lockean.[36] In his philosophical notebooks, one finds statements such as these:
+ 1 All significant words stand for Ideas (PC 378)
+ I affirm ‘tis manifestly absurd. no excuse in ye world can be given why a man should use a word without an idea. Certainly we shall find that wtever word we make use of in matter of pure reasoning has or ought to have a compleat Idea annext to it. (PC 638)
That Berkeley was not merely toying with the Lockean theory in the notebooks, that he actually accepted the doctrine, is confirmed by an early paper, “Of Infinities,” which Berkeley read before the Dublin Philosophical Society in 1707. In that paper Berkeley decrees that “we ought to use no sign without an idea answering it.”[37]
Although several early notebook entries endorse the unrestricted Lockean theory, in later entries, Berkeley points out what he takes to be exceptions to the Lockean theory (such as arithmetical terms and volition-denoting terms) and drops the theory in its universal form.
A.2 Introduction to the Principles
In his “Introduction” to the Principles (1710), Berkeley officially renounces the Lockean theory, which he sees as one important source of the doctrine of abstract ideas: (PI 19)[38]
But to give a farther account of how words came to produce the doctrine of abstract ideas, it must be observed that it is a received opinion, that language has no other end but the communicating our ideas, and that every significant name stands for an idea. This being so, and it being withal certain, that names, which yet are not thought altogether insignificant, do not always mark out particular conceivable ideas, it is straightway concluded that they stand for abstract notions. (PI 19)
Berkeley objects to the Lockean theory by giving counterexamples to certain rigid versions of it. One of those counterexamples is Berkeley’s famous critique of abstraction and diagnosis of how we actually manage to think generally.
A general term need not suggest one precise (abstract) idea in order to be significant (PI 18).
The unrestricted Lockean view leads to the incoherent (according to Berkeley) supposition of intrinsically general abstract ideas. Rather, Berkeley holds that a general term (e.g. “triangle”) may suggest many particular ideas indifferently, yet we can gain knowledge of general truths as long as we keep our terms to the same definitions (PI 16). An idea can be made general in a sense by being used in a general way, as a representative for a set of ideas (PI 16).[39]
Berkeley continues with further objections to the Lockean view:
… it is not necessary (even in the strictest reasonings) significant names which stand for ideas should, every time they are used, excite in the understanding the ideas they are made to stand for: in reading and discoursing, names being for the most part used as letters are in algebra, in which though a particular quantity be marked by each letter, yet to proceed right it is not requisite that in every step each letter suggest to your thoughts, that particular quantity it was appointed to stand for. (PI 19, my emphasis)
Berkeley’s most substantial deviation from the Lockean theory, however, comes in section 20 of the “Introduction.” As Berkeley sees it, the Lockean thesis about meaning is grounded in a view about the purpose of language: the purpose of language is to communicate ideas, therefore a word is meaningful when it succeeds in suggesting an appropriate idea in the mind of a hearer/reader. Berkeley allows that this is one purpose language may serve, but argues that language has other uses, which might be called emotive:
Besides, the communicating of ideas marked by words is not the chief and only end of language, as is commonly supposed. There are other ends, as the raising of some passion, the exciting to, or deterring from an action, the putting the mind in some particular disposition; to which the former is in many cases barely subservient, and sometimes entirely omitted, when these can be obtained without it, as I think doth not infrequently happen in the familiar use of language…. May we not, for example, be affected with the promise of a good thing, though we have not an idea of what it is? Or is not the being threatened with danger sufficient to excite a dread, though we think not of any particular evil likely to befall us, nor yet frame to ourselves an idea of danger in abstract? (PI 20)
This “theory of emotive meaning” (Belfrage 1986) is not discussed further in the Principles. However, in Alciphron, he takes it up again, although in a more developed and general form.
A.3 Alciphron
While in America, Berkeley composed Alciphron, a work of Christian apologetics in dialogue form, directed against the “free-thinkers” whom Berkeley took to be enemies of established Anglicanism. Alciphron is, however, also a very much a philosophical work, and is, among other things, a crucial source of Berkeley’s views on language. In dialogue 7, Berkeley has the character Alciphron (one of the book’s free-thinking, atheist philosophers) support his claim that religious doctrine is nonsense and cannot be believed by setting out a detailed version of the Lockean theory of meaning. Alciphron commits himself to a set of claims about the ends of language, semantics, and assent, including these:
The ultimate purpose of language is the communication of ideas. (Communication succeeds when the hearer/reader experiences the same train of ideas that was in the mind of the speaker/writer.)
Every significant word suggests an idea; the significance of a word is its associated idea.
Knowledge, belief, or any kind of “assent” requires having an appropriate train of ideas in mind. (A 7.2.287-8; A 7.3.288)
Both Alciphron’s views and his method of defending them are modelled on actual free-thinkers. John Toland, in particular, makes use of a Lockean theory of meaning in arguing that Christianity should be purged of its mysteries, such as the doctrine of the Trinity, and that revelation cannot be believed unless it is intelligible (i.e. idea-suggesting).[40] Similar views are expressed by Anthony Collins, who maintains that “when we use the term God, the Idea signify’d thereby, ought to be as distinct and determinate in us, as the Idea of a triangle or a square is, when we discourse of either of them; otherwise the term God is an empty sound.”[41]
Euphranor, the character who speaks for Berkeley, attacks Alciphron’s version of the Lockean theory by arguing for a number of exceptions to it, both major and minor.
A.3.1 Minor exceptions to the Lockean theory
Some counterexamples which Euphranor employs are familiar from the “Introduction” to the Principles. General terms, Euphranor argues, do not suggest one particular idea at every occasion of use and are none the less meaningful; instead, they denote an indefinite number of particular ideas, any one of which may be suggested at a particular occasion of use.[42] Moreover, “words may not be insignificant, although they should not, every time they are used, excite the ideas they signify in our minds; it being sufficient that we have it in our power to substitute things or ideas for their signs when there is occasion” (A 7.5.291–292). Words may sometimes function as place-holders which need not suggest their associated ideas at every occasion of use. Of course, these examples would require only fairly minor revisions to the Lockean theory.
Euphranor claims, in addition, that there is a certain class of words which, as he puts it, “denote an active principle, soul, or spirit” (A 7.5.292), and these words are meaningful despite never suggesting any ideas at all. Euphranor maintains that, although these words cannot stand for ideas (since ideas are passive, while spirits are active), nevertheless, “they are not insignificant neither; since I understand what is signified by the term I, or myself, or know what it means, although it be no idea, nor like an idea, but that which thinks, and wills, and apprehends ideas, and operates about them” (A 7.5.292). Elsewhere in his philosophical works (as we saw in 3.2.6 above), Berkeley suggests that we know what such words mean by some sort of internal reflection.[43] Here, Euphranor is only concerned to persuade Alciphron that the spirit-denoting terms constitute another category of exceptions to the Lockean theory. As usual, Alciphron offers little resistance.
A.3.2 Practical language and significance
None of these exceptions, however, represent Euphranor’s response to the main use which Alciphron seeks to make of the Lockean theory. As we’ve seen, Alciphron wants to use the Lockean theory to support his claim that religious doctrine is nonsense and cannot be believed. He fixes specifically on the Christian term ‘grace’ and argues that the term suggests no ideas and that, therefore, the Christian doctrine of grace is nonsensical and untenable (A 7.4.290-1).
Euphranor’s response is somewhat surprising, on two counts. First, Euphranor seems to grant, although perhaps just for the sake of argument, that no ideas are regularly associated with the term ‘grace’. Second, Euphranor does not suggest that ‘grace’ is a term which denotes an active principle, and that it is for this reason exempt from the Lockean strictures on significance. Rather, he argues for a much broader exception to the Lockean theory than the previously noted ones, an exception which, as he goes on to argue, allows ‘grace’ to count as meaningful in the context of Christian theology and ‘force’ to count as meaningful in the context of mechanics.
Euphranor begins this response by suggesting that language has more than one use:
It seems also to follow that there may be another use of words besides that of marking and suggesting distinct ideas, to wit, the influencing our conduct and actions, which may be done either by forming rules for us to act by, or by raising certain passions, dispositions, and emotions in our minds. (A 7.5.292)
Taken by itself, this does not represent a new thought for Berkeley; as we have seen, he discusses the significance of language which influences action in the “Introduction” to the Principles. However, in Alciphron, Berkeley is working with a broader conception of how language may influence action: it’s not just that a sentence may “excite us to action” (by influencing our emotions), but it may guide our action, by providing a rule for us to follow. Thus, more kinds of discourse (including, as it turns out, some scientific theories, as well as certain religious doctrines) fall under the scope of Berkeley’s discussion in Alciphron.
From this claim about the purpose of language, Euphranor jumps immediately to a semantic claim:
A discourse, therefore, that directs how to act or excites to the doing or forbearance of an action may, it seems, be useful and significant, although the words whereof it is composed should not bring each a distinct idea into our minds. (A 7.5.292)
Euphranor maintains that a discourse that contains words which do not suggest ideas may nevertheless be meaningful, in virtue of its ability to guide or influence action. Later, he makes the further claim that the very words which do not suggest ideas are nonetheless significant when they play a role in guiding action. (A 7.8.296-7)
Berkeley next has Euphranor outline and affirm further conclusions about assent:
But, although terms are signs, yet having granted that those signs may be significant, though they should not suggest ideas represented by them, provided they serve to regulate and influence our wills, passions, or conduct, you have consequently granted that the mind of man may assent to propositions containing such terms, when it is so directed or affected by them, notwithstanding it should not perceive distinct ideas marked by those terms. (A 7.8.296-7.)
Later, Euphranor suggests that assent to action-guiding (non-idea-suggesting) language is a special kind of assent, which is exhibited in action:
There is, if I mistake not, a practical faith, or assent, which sheweth itself in the will and actions of a man, although his understanding may not be furnished with those abstract, precise, distinct ideas, which, whatever a philosopher may pretend, are acknowledged to be above the talents of common men; among whom, nevertheless, may be found, even according to your own concession, many instances of such practical faith, in other matters which do not concern religion. (A 7.9.299)
Thus, Berkeley suggests that when one is appropriately guided or inspired by language whose purpose is to guide or inspire action, one has assented to it. (The guidance/inspiration need not take place via having a train of ideas.)
To sum up, Berkeley (through Euphranor) argues for one rather large exception to the Lockean theory, an exception for what might be called “practical language.” Language whose purpose is to guide or inspire action may be significant despite containing words which do not suggest ideas, in virtue of its use. Such language, Berkeley suggests, influences our actions either by “forming rules for us to act by” or “by raising certain passions, dispositions and emotions in our mind.” The significance of such language (and fragments thereof) is its role (and their roles) in influencing action. It is possible to assent to such language, even when it does not suggest trains of ideas, when one is capable of being appropriately guided or inspired by it.
A.3.3 ‘Force’ and ‘grace’
Berkeley applies this account of practical language in order to further his apologetic aims. Earlier in the dialogue, Alciphron had attempted to draw a contrast between the purportedly empty concept of grace and the purportedly clear, physical concept of force; Euphranor now counters Alciphron’s rhetorical tactics by drawing an extended parallel between the use of the term ‘grace’ in Christian religious doctrine and the use of the term ‘force’ in mechanics. First, he extracts from Alciphron a definition of force as “that in bodies which produceth motion and other sensible effects” (A 7.6.294), a thing distinct from those effects. Next, he gets Alciphron to agree, after introspection, that he can form no idea of force. Euphranor then argues that the utility of the term ‘force’, in the context of mechanics, must prevent us from considering it meaningless; the term ‘grace’, he suggests, must be declared meaningful for the same sorts of reasons (A 7.7.295-6).
The “doctrine of force” directs our actions by providing rules for us to act by, rules which tell us what to do if we want to bring about certain motions, and so teach us to frame engines and to predict the motions of the stars. Thus, it is significant. Dynamical terms, including ‘force’, count as significant in virtue of the utility of the dynamical discourse. Since the discourse is meaningful, and we obviously understand its meaning since we can make use of it, we can assent to it. Euphranor asserts further that there is an undeniable parallel between the Christian doctrine of grace and dynamics. Although we can form no idea of grace, the doctrine of grace inspires us to good actions, Euphranor claims, by its appeal to our emotions, and it is therefore significant and deserving of assent.
What is it, though, to assent to an action-directing rule (or an exhortation, in the case of some religious doctrines)? It must be something like this: to commit oneself to acting according to it. If this sort of commitment is what Berkeley means by ‘assent’ in the case of language which functions practically, we can see why he holds that a person whom the doctrine of grace inspires to good actions has assented to the doctrine.
What, then, does Berkeley mean by suggesting, as he occasionally does, that propositions about both force and grace may be true and useful? What could it be for a rule, directive, or an exhortation to be true? As is detailed in 4.2.2 in the main article, Berkeley can’t mean literally true, here, since he commits himself in De Motu to anti-realism about dynamics, and he thinks realism about it is untenable. It’s noteworthy that Berkeley doesn’t suggest in Alciphron that propositions about force or grace may be true, simpliciter, but rather that they may be “useful and true,” or vice versa. What Berkeley must mean might be better expressed by ‘right’ than ‘true’; a true action-guiding rule or exhortation is one that guides rightly, i.e. one which produces good results when followed.
A.3.4 Practical vs. descriptive language
At this point we should step back from Berkeley’s account of practical language and see what it is contrasted with in Berkeley’s thought. Language which consists of idea-denoting and/or spirit-denoting terms, because such terms refer, is descriptive, expresses purported facts. Such language is, of course, meaningful/significant. It seems, from what Berkeley says and fails to say, that descriptive sentences work pretty much as the Lockean theory would have it–they suggest, or can suggest, at any rate, trains of ideas, and their significance is tied to this.[44] The situation is complicated by spirit-denoting terms, which refer and have meaning through some introspective mechanism.[45]
Practical language, however, may contain non-referential terms. Such language may nevertheless guide or influence action through providing rules for us to act by or through provoking certain emotions. The significance or meaning of such language is its role in guiding action. A natural question to ask is how non-descriptive language manages to do guide our actions in this way, given that it doesn’t do so by provoking a train of ideas which would constitute a literal understanding of the language, in Berkeley’s view. This question is not really answered in Alciphron. For some indication of how this might work for talk of forces, we might look to De Motu, discussed in the main article. As for ‘grace’, Berkeley does not directly address the question of how it acquires its ability to provoke emotions which inspire piety and right action. However, in the “Draft Introduction,” when discussing the emotive significance of the doctrine that “the good things which God hath prepared for them that love him are such as eye hath not seen nor ear heard nor hath it enter’d into the heart of man to conceive,” Berkeley posits a gradual process of conditioning by which the promise of “a good thing” comes to habitually stir up “diligence and zeal” in a person.[46] A similar process might be posited in the case of ‘grace’.[47]