1. Probably the best all-purpose understanding of what logics are would take them as equivalence classes of proof systems under the relation of having mutually interderivable rules, though even this ignores issues about translational equivalence across differing languages. For many practical purposes it is sufficient to individuate logics more coarsely, as consequence relations or generalized consequence relations, or even, as is common in some areas, simply sets of formulas.

2. There has been much controversy as to how well this or that set of rules governing implication or disjunction, for example, manages to capture the (putatively) corresponding natural language analogue—if-then, or (in the cases cited)—but this entry will not be considering such connective-specific issues.

3. This coincides with the algebraically defined notion of a context given above.

4. Sometimes we will speak of $\mathrm{\#}$ as truth-functional over a class of valuations instead of truth-functional with respect to the class, when the immediate linguistic context contains another occurrence of the phrase “with respect to”.

5. See Leblanc (1966), p. 169 and n. 14; also Sundholm (2001), p. 38.

6. We could make the same point apropos of the consequence relation, ${⊢}_{\vee }$ say, determined by the class of all $\vee$-Boolean valuations. (See the opening paragraph of Section 5 for pointers to more information on all of this.)

7. Had the historical development of logic run differently and the framework we would naturally call Fmla-Set come to initial prominence, we would have been fussing about the consistent valuations being closed under disjunctive combinations, and the sequent-undefinability of the class of $\wedge$-Boolean valuations. As it is, we shall be hearing no more of $+$ and $\sum$.

8. That is, if $\sigma =\mathrm{\Gamma }\succ \mathrm{\Delta }$ and ${\sigma }^{\prime }={\mathrm{\Gamma }}^{\prime }\succ {\mathrm{\Delta }}^{\prime },\sigma +{\sigma }^{\prime }$ is $\mathrm{\Gamma },{\mathrm{\Gamma }}^{\prime }\succ \mathrm{\Delta },{\mathrm{\Delta }}^{\prime }$.

9. A somewhat similar range of properties is the focus of Williamson (2006a), though with definitions that make the concepts in question apply to arbitrary linguistic contexts and not just to connectives (see Section 1 above), and without the explicit relativity to logics (consequence relations or generalized consequence relations).

10. Additional background on these matters is mentioned in the opening paragraph of Section 5. For an articulation of the issues from an algebraic perspective, Caicedo and Cignoli (2001), Caicedo (2004), and Ertola Biraben and San Martín (2011).

11. The fact that a generalized consequence relation is a binary relation means that we need to distinguish symmetric and non-symmetric such relations, as in general, and means that it is an unwise terminological decision to call generalized consequence relations symmetric consequence relations, as in Dunn and Hardegree (2001), Chapter 6. There seems to be a confusion here between whether a binary relation is symmetric and whether the treatment of its two relata is symmetrical. Note, incidentally, that it is binary relations that are symmetric, not binary operations (connectives or otherwise), pace Restall (1999), p. 385, who writes of a binary operation corresponding to a kind of conjunction that it is “idempotent, symmetric, and associative”. The word wanted is ‘commutative’. (Of course a connective qua syntactic operation can never literally be commutative; what is meant is that the corresponding ‘Lindenbaum-algebraic’ operation on synonymy-classes of formulas is commutative.) Restall is in famous—if muddled—company here; compare Quine (1951), describing conjunction as transitive on one page (p. 18) and associative on the next. The present point is not that one should never use terminology appropriate to binary relations when speaking of connectives—since there is, for instance, for any valuation $v$ the relation $R_v$, say, holding between $\varphi$ and $\psi$ just in case $v(\varphi \wedge \psi )=\text{T},$ and for Boolean valuations at least, this relation is symmetric. It is just that a clearer head is called for than Quine and Restall—and many other writers—have displayed in jumbling up the binary relational terminology (reflexive, symmetric, transitive,…) with the binary operational terminology (idempotent, commutative, associative, …). Among the ‘others’ are Dunn and Hardegree (again), who write on p. 215 of Dunn and Hardegree (2001) of the “symmetry of conjunction”. For (pointers to) more on all this, see the opening paragraph of Section 5.

12. Just as the sequents of Set-Fmla can be thought of as those Set-Set sequents $\mathrm{\Gamma }\succ \mathrm{\Delta }$ with $\mathrm{\Delta }$ having exactly one element, those of Fmla have the further feature that $\mathrm{\Gamma }$ is empty, making these sequents stand in a one-to-one correspondence with the formulas of the language, with which for practical purposes we may identify them, explaining the following words of the main text. There are still two possibilities here, though. When the axiomatic or ‘Hilbert’ approach is taken, the rules are formula-to-formula rules and the objects proved are formulas. On the other hand, in our initial presentation of natural deduction, before assumption discharging rules got into the act, the rules were again presented as formula-to-formula rules, but with the things proved with these rules were in effect Set-Fmla sequents: meaning that the rules enabled us to pass from a set of initial assumptions to a final formula. Should we say that the logical framework here is Set-Fmla on the basis of what ends up being proved, or that it is Fmla, on the basis of what the premisses and conclusions of the rules involved are? Now that the distinction has been duly noted, there is no urgent need to supply an answer to this question.

13. The two views contrasted here are distinguished in Meyer (1974).

14. In fact for any rules $R\cup \{\varrho \},\varrho$ is derivable from $R$ together with these structural rules if and only if $\mathit{\text{Glo}}(R)\subseteq \mathit{\text{Glo}}(\varrho )$.

15. Note that the operations $+$ and $\cdot$ on valuations give least upper bounds and greatest lower bounds with respect to this partial order.

16. In fact, Garson works with a variation on the framework Set-Fmla which allows sequents $\mathrm{\Gamma }\succ \varphi$ with $\mathrm{\Gamma }$ infinite, and this feature is essential to his proof of the claim here reported. Whether it is essential for the correctness of the claim, I do not know.

17. See the opening paragraph of Section 5.

18. The condition for $\to$ was given incorrectly in Garson (2001); Garson (1990) should be consulted for the correct formulation.

19. Dummett (1991) provides an extended discussion of such positions. There is an interesting proposal in Peacocke (1987) for “reading off” (Boolean) valuational semantics from inference rules found ‘primitively compelling’ by reasoners (as a necessary condition for their possessing the concepts expressed by and, or, etc.), which for some cases may be introduction rules and others elimination rules. This attractive suggestion has unfortunately come in for worrying criticism more recently: for example in Williamson (2006b), (2013). It may be necessary to retreat from a claim about possession of the concepts concerned, to a claim about something like mastery of those concepts, with the attendant obligation to spell out what the latter consists in, in a way that does not make the claim vacuous.

20. Thus the consequence relation associated with the present natural deduction system is trivial—“almost inconsistent”, as it sometimes put—in the sense introduced apropos of Rautenberg’s maximality theorem in Section 2. (For a proper formulation of the natural deduction rules here the above formula-to-formula rules should be explicitly represented as sequent-to-sequent rules with a set parameter, “$\mathrm{\Gamma }$” sitting on the left of a $\text{“}\succ \text{”}$.) The provable sequents $\varphi \succ \varphi \text{Tonk}\psi$ and $\varphi \text{Tonk}\psi \succ \psi$ represent conditions on this consequence relation induced by the determinants $⟨\text{T},x,\text{T}⟩$ for $x=\text{T},\text{F},$ in the former case and $⟨y,\text{F},\text{F}⟩$ for $y=\text{T},\text{F}$, in the latter. Thus any valuation consistent with this consequence relation must respect each of two opposite determinants—making Tonk overdetermined—$⟨\text{T},\text{F},\text{T}⟩$, taking $x=\text{F}$ and $⟨\text{T},\text{F},\text{F}⟩$ taking $y=\text{T}$. The only valuations that respect both these determinants are $v_{\text{T}}$, assigning $\text{T}$ to every formula, and $v_{\text{F}}$ assigning $\text{F}$ to every formula, and the logic determined by $\{v_{\text{T}},v_{\text{F}}\}$ is the smallest trivial consequence relation on the language concerned. This is our semantic gloss on the $\text{Tonk}$ example. It would be quite wrong to diagnose the problem in terms of the non-existence of a truth-function corresponding to $\text{Tonk}$, or to say, as Stevenson (1961), p. 127, does, that the problem is that Prior “gives the meanings of connectives in terms of permissive rules, whereas they should be stated in terms of truth-function statements in a metalanguage.” (Prior 1976 replies to Stevenson, and inter alia suggests that the consequence relation just described can be thought of as “one-valued logic”—cf. Hamblin 1967; the better term would be constant-valued logic.) There is nothing incoherent about non-truth-functional—or more accurately, not fully determined—connectives: the problem arises from being overdetermined. The same objection, as Read (1988), p. 168, observes, appears to apply to the remark in Peacocke (1987) that the “semantical objection to tonk is that there is no binary function on truth values which validates both its introduction and its elimination rules”, though there is more room for manoeuvre here: the implicit suggestion is that coherence requires soundness, not soundness and completeness, under some truth-functional interpretation. This amounts to deeming unintelligible any connective which is ‘strongly contra-classical’, in the sense of not being thus interpretable. But what does soundness under ‘some truth-functional interpretation’ mean? It will not do to say: soundness with respect to some $V$ over which the connective in question is truth-functional, since the there may not be enough variety in the truth-values supplied by $V$ to the formulas of the language, in which case its elements may respect the determinants for a truth-function only vacuously because some possibilities do not arise. (For an extreme case, consider $V=\varnothing$.) One natural thing to require is that all combinatorially possible truth-value assignments to the propositional variables are provided, i.e., that $\mathrm{\forall }X\subseteq \mathbb{N}\mathrm{\exists }v\in V\mathrm{\forall }k\in \mathbb{N}[v(p_k)=\text{T}]\text{ iff }k\in X$. Note that this makes $V$ uncountable. For most purposes, including the present one, a much weaker condition suffices, namely that $V$ should be non-constant in the sense that $V$ contains some valuation distinct from $v_{\text{T}}$ and $v_{\text{F}}$.

21. One such example is mentioned in the opening paragraph of Section 5.

22. The same phenomenon occurs with the proof system for the 1-ary ‘anticipation’ connective discussed in Ertola Biraben (2012), as was first observed by Brian Weatherson.

23. Of necessity, some examples in this paragraph have been mentioned without the explanation that would accompany them in a fuller treatment of this material. There is also a philosophical complication ignored in the use, above and below, of such phrases as ‘adherent of intuitionistic logic’, in that they seem at least to presume the incorrectness of a position that has been called logical pluralism and defended under that name in Beall and Restall (2006).

24. Cf. Koslow (1992), base of p. 129.

25. Requiring $\mathrm{\Delta }=\mathrm{\Theta }=\varnothing$ in $(\vee \text{E})$ blocks the proof of the quantum-logically contested distribution sequent $p\wedge (q\vee r)\succ (p\wedge q)\vee (p\wedge r)$; see Dummett (1991), p.205f., and also, of ‘sequent calculus’ interest: p. 42, especially three-quarters down the page. The general acceptability of the distribution laws has also recently been questioned for reasons independent of  quantum-logical considerations in Holliday and Mandelkern (2022), Holliday (2023). (In respect of $\wedge /\vee$ interactions, even the more fundamental absorption laws have been known to raise eyebrows for certain equivalence relations of logical interest, though we do not go into this here.)

26. Rules for multiplicative and additive conjunction are given in note 46. See Troelstra (1992) for further information about linear logic.

27. Actually a bit more is needed to obtain $\mathbf{R}$, in that distribution of additive conjunction over additive disjunction is part of $\mathbf{R}$ which does not follow from the description given. Further details can be found in Avron (1988).

28. Here we see that the empty succedent is something of a luxury in intuitionistic logic, rather than a necessity, since we could always use $F$ to fill it—or rather, $\mathrm{\perp }$, as one would say, since there are no $F$-vs.$-f$ subtleties to worry about.

29. Actually, there is a complication (being ignored here) because of the contraction rule. One disadvantage of the set-based frameworks is that, loosely speaking, applications of this rule become invisible.

30. Notice that with “$\varphi \text{Tonk}\psi$” replaced by “$\varphi ,\psi$” the inset sequents are available by (Id) and (Weakening) on the left and right. Since the comma here is not a connective, however, there is no formula—in the absence of $\text{Tonk}$ which could serve as a cut formula on the basis of these two sequent premisses. On one usage of the term ‘connective’, that associated with Belnap’s Display Logic (see Restall (2000), Chapter 6) something corresponding to the comma and many more somewhat analogous devices are sometimes referred to as ‘structure connectives’ (as opposed to ‘formula connectives’). This whole topic lies outside of our purview.

31. This example appears in a slightly different form, but explicitly contrasted with that of $\text{Tonk}$ in the same way, on p. 164 of Došen and Schroeder-Heister (1985).

32. This idea is essentially that of Setlur (1970), where a variation on the theme of Helena Rasiowa’s, of taking hybrids in the framework Fmla—holding fixed the remaining connectives—is to be found. The device of taking direct products of matrix tables which works in Fmla does not fare so well in the richer frameworks; some remarks on the comparison with Set-Fmla in this respect can be found in Rautenberg (1985), pp. 7–9, and (1989), esp. p. 532. (Or see the reference given in the opening paragraph of Section 5.) In an earlier publication, not listed in the bibliography, I used the term ‘products’ instead of ‘hybrids’ for the greatest lower bounds with respect to the subconnective relation, oblivious to the confusion this might engender. It did at least have one advantage, not shared by ‘hybrids’, of calling readily to mind a word—namely sums—for the corresponding least upper bounds, as illustrated by ${\text{Tonk}}^{+}$ below (for $\wedge$ and $\vee )$.

33. The term harmony has been used mostly, and subject to various degrees of technicalization, for the relation of mutual appropriateness of elimination and introduction rules in natural deduction rather than, as here, to left and right rules in a sequent calculus. See Section 5 for references.

34. The idea that we could use a rule of $◻$ introduction or insertion on the right with a proviso to the effect that formulas on the left be ‘fully modalized’, and use this in the reduplicated system to argue that since $◻\varphi \succ \varphi$ is provable, the duplicated version of this rule allows the transition to $◻\varphi \succ {◻}^{\prime }\varphi$, on the grounds that the formula on the left is ‘fully modalized’, involves an illicitly equivocal use of the latter phrase. Something close to a model-theoretic version of this mistake would be involved in the suggestion that since $\mathbf{S}\mathbf{5}$ is determined by the class of models in which the accessibility relation is universal, and there is only one universal relation on any given set, $◻$ is uniquely characterized by this logic. The mistake here is to think that because we can simplify the completeness result for $\mathbf{S}\mathbf{5}$ from equivalence-relational models to universal models, the same applies to the bimodal “reduplicated $\mathbf{S}\mathbf{5}$” logic that is at issue for the unique characterization claim. (“Something close”, because the syntactical argument would also apply in the case of $\mathbf{S}\mathbf{4}$ too, where nothing like the fallacy in this model-theoretic reasoning is likely to seem tempting.)

35. As with talk of the commutativity of conjunction, etc., what is meant is that the corresponding operation in the Lindenbaum algebra of formulas is a left inverse of that corresponding to $\mathrm{\neg }$.

36. Substitution-invariance implies that the class of propositional variables is not special; the latter is equivalent to substitution-invariance given closure under uniform variable-for-variable substitutions, a weakening of substitution-invariance usually satisfied even by proposed logics not closed under arbitrary (uniform) substitution—in which case, accordingly, the propositional variables are special. An interesting recent example of a logic (or range of logics) not even satisying this weaker substitution condition is provided by those sporting pattern connectives (van Toor, 2022), forming compounds whose truth-values are sensitive not only to the truth-values of their components (on a given a valuation) but to which of those components are occurrences of the same formulas as are other other components.

37. One could understand this in terms of the constancy of an associated truth function, but also purely syntactically: $\mathrm{\#}$ is constant according to $⊢$ if all formulas with # as main connective are $⊣⊢$-equivalent.

38. There is a natural notion of conservative extension which applies directly to (pairs of) consequence relations, but to avoid going into that here, we have adopted a formulation in terms of conservative extension as a relation between proof systems. Such a formulation would not be ideal here anyway because the fact that the initial consequence relation is $\vee$-classical does not imply that the extended consequence relation is, by contrast with the situation in Set-Set, since the conditional condition corresponding to $(\vee \text{E})$ is not guaranteed to be preserved under extensions.

39. This is sometimes put by saying that $⊢$ enjoys the Deduction Theorem, generalizing some terminology from a particular way of defining consequence relations on the basis of rules and axioms in logic treated by the axiomatic approach.

40. See Rousseau (1968).

41. For (a reference to) more on this aspect of contraries and subcontraries, see the opening paragraph of Section 5.

42. This example comes from Humberstone (1995), though in 2019 Konrad Turzyński observed (personal communication) that the four-valued table for demi-negation – values denoted by 1, 2, 3, 4 – given on the right of Figure 2 (p. 5) there, coincides with the table – in values respectively denoted by $v,i,u,f$ – for the ‘initiation’ connective (written as a capital N with a right-pointing arrow on top of it) of Leonard Sławomir Rogowski in publications in Polish in 1961 and 1964 on the four-valued ‘directional logic’ he saw as motivated by some Hegelian considerations. (Turzyński informs me that this coincidence had also been noticed by Fabien Schang.) Exact references to Rogowski’s papers, along with the table for initiation, can be found in Turzyński (1990). (Alternatively, the 1964 piece, together with the table in question, is given some attention in Kalinowski 1967.) For more on demi-negation, see further p. 174f. of Humberstone (2016) and references given there, as well as Paoli (2019), and, for related material, Hitoshi and Wansing (2018). There have been many other interesting recent developments and variations on the negation front, several of them touched on in the discusison (and in items cited in the bibliography) of Wansing, Olkhovikov, and Omori (2021); see also De and Omori (2014) and – despite its title featuring conditionals (the main theme) rather than negation – Niki and Omori (2022). A more wide-ranging general introduction to the field is provided by Horn and Wansing (2022).

43. This is because there is no 1-ary truth-function $f$ with $f(f(\text{T}))=\text{F}$ and $f(f(\text{F}))=\text{T}$.

44. As it happens, the (published) quantum-mechanically motivated work on $\sqrt{\mathbf{not}}$ antedates the philosophically motivated work by six years: see Deutsch (1989). Note that the phrase “the proposed connective” is used unapologetically here—as in the hybrids cases—in the absence of any suggestion that the conditions to which we have subjected it suffice for unique characterization.

45. See §§3 and 4 of Humberstone (2000) for further discussion and references, as well as sources cited in the first paragraph of the Notes and Sources section (§5 of this entry).

46. Contraction can be understood as the structural rule of that name in the multiset-based frameworks or, for the axiomatic approach in Fmla, as the schema $(\varphi \to (\varphi \to \psi ))\to (\varphi \to \psi )$. The sequent calculus rules for (additive) $\wedge$ are $(\wedge$ Left) as given in Section 2, with capital Greek letters reconstrued as multiset-variables, along with $(\wedge$ Right) taking us from $\mathrm{\Gamma }\succ \varphi ,\mathrm{\Delta }$ and $\mathrm{\Gamma }\succ \psi ,\mathrm{\Delta }$ to $\mathrm{\Gamma }\succ \varphi \wedge \psi ,\mathrm{\Delta }$, while those for (multiplicative) $\circ$ are as follows. The left insertion rule takes us from $\mathrm{\Gamma },\varphi ,\psi \succ \mathrm{\Delta }$ to $\mathrm{\Gamma },\varphi \circ \psi \succ \mathrm{\Delta }$, while the right insertion rule takes us from $\mathrm{\Gamma }\succ \varphi ,\mathrm{\Delta }$ and ${\mathrm{\Gamma }}^{\prime }\succ \psi ,{\mathrm{\Delta }}^{\prime }$ to $\mathrm{\Gamma },{\mathrm{\Gamma }}^{\prime }\succ \varphi \circ \psi ,\mathrm{\Delta },{\mathrm{\Delta }}^{\prime }$. The Mset-Fmla${}_0$ rules suited to Intuitionistic Linear Logic are obtained from these Mset-Mset rules by the obvious restrictions on the right-hand sides.

47. In linear logic already we have $t\to T$ provable without its converse, for instance.

48. In a sequent calculus presentation one would instead add the inverted form, sometimes called Expansion, of the structural rule of Contraction.

49. Theorem 5.8 in Blok and Pigozzi (1989) gives the desired $\psi$ and $\chi$ for a given $\varphi$ as $\varphi \wedge (\varphi \to \varphi )$ and $\varphi \to \varphi$ respectively. The proof on p. 49 of Blok and Pigozzi (1989) is seriously garbled, though the result is correct. Speaking of errors, let me mention that Dunn and Hardegree’s attempt to explain what Blok and Pigozzi mean by “algebraizable”, at Definition 7.13.3 of Dunn and Hardegree (2001), rather misses the point, leaving out the requirement for two-way invertible translations between $⊢$ and ${\models }_{\mathbf{K}}$, and ends up singling out the consequence relations which, in Blok and Pigozzi’s terminology, “have an algebraic semantics” (the algebraizable ones being those having what Blok and Pigozzi call an equivalent algebraic semantics).

50. This point is explained on p. 23 of Davies and Humberstone (1980), where relevant work by Dummett is cited – not that precisely this terminology is used there to make the point. Further references to Dummett on this topic, and discussion of his preferred approach to it via matrix methodology, can be found in §4 of Humberstone (1998). The connection with the present semantic setting is provided by thinking of frames with distinguished points (one per frame), underlying the models considered in the first paragraph, above, and recalling that any such frame gives rise to a matrix whose elements are sets of points from the frame. One takes the set of all such points as the sole designated element to capture the general validity of formulas (to have validity in the matrix correspond to validity on the frame), and takes all of sets of points containing the distinguished point as the designated elements in order to capture the real-world (or diagonal) validity of formulas. For the validity of sequents (or the characterization of consequence relations) in the general and real-world styles a more roundabout description – not given here – is called for, since in either case it is the local rather than global consequence relations that we are concerned with here.

51. Fusco (2019), p. 17, writes, concerning the favoured interpretation of $\varphi \text{OR}\psi$ as (1)/(2), “This semantic value for disjunctions comes from the classic literature on disjunctive questions (Groenendijk and Stokhof, 1982; Lewis, 1982).” The gloss here is fine if “comes from” means “is inspired by, ” though not if it means “coincides with that to be found in”. The details in all three cases differ, as we can illustrate by comparing, below, the semantic values they assign (relative to any model) to what we shall write as $p\text{OR}q$ in all three cases. The semantic value of a formula/sentence $\varphi$ we take as a propositional concept in the sense of Stalnaker 1978: a function mapping worlds to propositions $(=$sets of worlds), whose argument is the reference world/world-taken-as-actual and whose value is the set of worlds (of evaluation’ at which $\varphi$ is true relative to that reference world (in the model in question). Since all we need to know about the reference world for this purpose in the case in which $\varphi$ is constructed from sentence letters $p,q$ (as here, since the $\varphi$ of current interest is $p\text{OR}q)$. Fusco’s $\text{OR}$ notation is used for all three cases, the third being that described in Fusco (2015) (as well as in the Stalnaker-style matrix in Figure 8 in Fusco 2019, which coincides with Figure 3 of Fusco 2015), and $\Vert \varphi \Vert$; is the set of worlds at which the Boolean formula $\varphi$ is true.

Lewis’s $p\text{OR}q$: $p\wedge q\mapsto \Vert p\vee q\Vert ;$ $p\wedge \mathrm{\neg }q\mapsto \Vert p\Vert ;$ $\mathrm{\neg }p\wedge q\mapsto \Vert q\Vert ;$ $\mathrm{\neg }p\wedge \mathrm{\neg }q\mapsto \Vert \mathrm{\perp }\Vert =\varnothing$.

Groenendijk–Stokhof’s $p\text{OR}q$: $p\wedge q\mapsto \Vert p\wedge q\Vert ;$ $p\wedge \mathrm{\neg }q\mapsto \Vert p\wedge \mathrm{\neg }q\Vert ;$ $\mathrm{\neg }p\wedge q\mapsto \Vert \mathrm{\neg }p\wedge q\Vert ;$ $\mathrm{\neg }p\wedge \mathrm{\neg }q\mapsto \Vert \mathrm{\neg }p\wedge \mathrm{\neg }q\Vert$.

Fusco’s $p\text{OR}q$: $p\wedge q\mapsto \Vert p\vee q\Vert ;$ $p\wedge \mathrm{\neg }q\mapsto \Vert p\Vert ;$ $\mathrm{\neg }p\wedge q\mapsto \Vert q\Vert ;$ $\mathrm{\neg }p\wedge \mathrm{\neg }q\mapsto \Vert p\vee q\Vert$.

The Groenendijk–Stokhof characterization of the propositional concept in question is based on lines 5–7 of p. 180 of Groenendijk and Stokhof (1982). The first case listed under Lewis’s name here is a ‘don’t care’ case for him:

What happens if (…) more than one of the presented alternatives are true? Then I think a presupposition required for the proper use of the ‘whether’-clause has failed, with the result that no clear-cut data on truth-conditions are available and so we may as well handle the case in the most technically convenient way.

Perhaps the same should be said of the case in which neither alternative is true (or no alternative it, as Lewis would put it, since he thinks of the whether/$or$ construction as involving a multigrade – rather than a binary – connective).

To obtain, from the specification of the propositional concepts as above, a Boolean$+A$(ctually) representation having a given such function as its semantic value – thereby spelling out the understanding of $p\text{OR}q$ for the case in question, replace the “maps to” arrow with with an implicational arrow, for each of the four state-descriptions ${\psi }_1,\dots ,{\psi }_4$, putting the antecedent of the implication thus formed into the scope of $\text{“}A\text{”}$ and dropping the $\Vert$s to obtain its consequent ${\chi }_i(i=1,\dots ,4)$. Thus $\text{“}{\psi }_i\mapsto \Vert {\chi }_i\Vert \text{”}$ becomes $\text{“}A{\psi }_i\to {\chi }_i\text{”}$. One then conjoins the four cases to give the desired representation. Alternatively, since the antecedents $A{\psi }_i$ in a given case are mutually exclusive and jointly exhaustive, we can replace the implications with conjunctions and the conjunctions with disjunctions to obtain an unrestrictedly equivalent representation. This is essentially the relation between (1) and (2) in the main text (replacing the schematic letters with sentence letters), except that in (1) Fusco has simplified the representation by collapsing the $p\wedge q$ and $\mathrm{\neg }p\wedge \mathrm{\neg }q$ cases into a single $p\leftrightarrow q$ case, since the conditionals with these $A$-prefixed antecedents have the same consequent (namely $p\vee q)$, with (2) following suit in this regard.

The use of the $\text{OR}$-notation in the three cases above should not be taken to suggest that Lewis and Groenendijk–Stokhof were following Fusco’s general strategy, of tailoring the received wisdom as to how disjunction works across the board (namely as $\vee )$ so as to give a single all-purpose account working equally well for its bread-and-butter occurrences as for certain problematically embedded occurrences, namely the deontically embedded occurrences. It is not as though the main aim of Lewis and Groenendijk–Stokhof had been to provide a similarly uniform account, except with a different range of problematic cases, namely the indirect question embeddings. Rather, their aim was simply to provide some satisfactory compositional account of the problematic constructions. (On this they make different proposals, even restricting attention to the case in which exactly one of the alternatives posed by an alternative question obtains – $p$, say, out of $\{p,q\}$. To know, in this case, whether $p$ or $q$, understood ‘alternatively‘ – rising-then-falling intonation, as opposed to knowing whether or not it is the case that $p$ or $q$ – Lewis requires the subject simply to know that $p$, whereas Groenendijk and Stokhof require the subject to know that $p$ and also that not$-q$, and quite generally, for them knowing whether this is the case or that is the case is a matter of knowing whether this is the case and knowing whether that is the case, with alternative questions thus reduced to multiple polar questions.) In a final section, Lewis (1982) toys (not very enthusiastically) with a treatment of “whether $\varphi$ or $\psi$” as wheth$\varphi \vee$wheth$\psi$, where wheth$\varphi$ is interpreted as $A\varphi \wedge †\varphi$. Here $†$ is an operator that reduplicates the world of evaluation as the reference world in the same way that $A$ reduplicates the reference world as the world of evaluation, found in Stalnaker 1978, Davies and Humberstone 1980 (note 16), Fusco 2019, as well as in work by Lewis not in our bibliography, and elsewhere. This “$†$” has no effect on purely Boolean formulas, which is why were able to state (3) in the main text without including it (given the restriction on $\varphi ,\psi$ there). Also, the contemporary descendant of the approach in Groenendijk and Stokhof (1982), namely inquisitive semantics – see §7.1 of Aloni (2016) and §2 of Cross and Roelofsen (2018) for more detail and further references – manages considerable advances in unifying various expressions across what might have been thought to be radically discontinuous uses across declarative and interrogative contexts, though as an incidental by-product in what may seem like the opposite direction, it makes available at least three different disjunction-like connectives each taken as the main form of disjunction in some piece of work in the genre: see §6 in Humberstone 2019 for a comparative discussion of them, as well as §7 there for further (one-dimensional) aspects of the logic and semantics of whether, with some examples of missteps in this area given in Humberstone 2016 (see the index entries under knowing whether).

52. We ignore a slight complication here over $\vee$-Elimination for one of the consequence relations described in Fusco (2015) – that given in Definition 13 there – because of an interaction between the supervaluational treatment of that consequence relation and the presence of an operator for what Fusco calls settled truth and notates using as a solid black box.

53. Footnote 36 in Fusco (2015) is potentially confusing on this score. How best to reformulate it for Fusco’s purposes is not a question that we can to go into here, because of the multiplicity of consequence relations involved. Although the present selective presentation of ideas from Fusco (2015) has focused on two such relations – general consequence and diagonal consequence – there are in fact four consequence relations in play in the discussion there: see p. 20, left-hand column. (The preceding note alluded to one of the consequence relations sidelined here.)

54. This is not to say there are no difficulties in the vicinity. In particular, expressed with a casual informality here, the following difficulty arises. If it is supposed to be a priori knowable that $Ap\leftrightarrow p$ – for example, that there are actually pandas in Lhasa if and only if there are pandas in Lhasa, then how can $K(Ap\leftrightarrow p)$ represent knowing whether $p$? We presumably cannot know a priori whether or not there are pandas in Lhasa. This problem is noted, and a solution suggested, in Rabinowicz and Segerberg (1994). (These authors, incidentally, use the terms strong and weak validity for general and real-word/diagonal validity. A fuller listing of the terminologies employed for this distinction by different people is given in note 177 of Humberstone 2016, p. 219, with additional background in note 45 on p. 60 of the same work.)

55. If you do not have access to a diagram of the kind mentioned here, see the opening paragraph of Section 5.

56. Subsequent moves in a similar direction for cases for logics other than ${⊢}_{CL}$ (varying what counts as compositionality from case to case) are made in Bonnay and Westerståhl (2023), Tong and Westerståhl (2023).

57. Here we are saying $uv(p\vee p)=\text{F}$, but didn’t the paragraph above (beginning ‘Accordingly’), end by speaking of $uv$’s verifying the formula $p\vee p$? Yes, but that was in the course of a Reductio proof that began by supposing $\vee$ to have a truth-function associated with it on the valuation $uv,$ a supposition we saw led to a contradiction. Here we are simply following the definition of conjunctive combination: $uv(p\vee p)=\text{T}$ iff $u(p\vee p)=\text{T}$ and $v(p\vee p)=\text{T}$, for which this second conjunct fails, as $v(p\vee p)=\text{F}$.

58. This perspective has been urged by many theorists with otherwise differing inclinations, including Michael Dummett, Dana Scott, and Roman Suszko. When dealing with a two-element matrix exactly one of which is designated, as in Rautenberg’s maximality result in Section 2, the distinction between $h$ and $v_h$ collapses.