The Ethics of Manipulation

First published Fri Mar 30, 2018; substantive revision Tue Mar 31, 2026

Suppose that Tonya plans to do Y, but Irving wants her to do X instead. Irving has tried unsuccessfully to provide Tonya with reasons for doing X rather than Y. If Irving is unwilling to resort to coercion or force, he might deploy any of the following tactics to try to influence Tonya’s choice. For example, Irving might …

  1. Charm Tonya into wanting to please Irving by doing X.
  2. Exaggerate the advantages of doing X and the disadvantages of doing Y, and/or understate the disadvantages of doing X and the advantages of doing Y.
  3. Make Tonya feel guilty for preferring to do Y.
  4. Induce an emotional state in Tonya that makes doing X seem more appropriate than it really is.
  5. Convince Tonya that doing Y will lead to disapproval, scorn, and perhaps even rejection, from Tonya’s friends.
  6. Make Tonya feel badly about herself and portray Y as a choice that will confirm or exacerbate this feeling, and/or portray X as a choice that will alleviate it.
  7. Engage in a program of continually nagging Tonya to do X.
  8. Make Tonya doubt her own judgment so that she will rely on Irving’s advice to do X.
  9. Make it clear to Tonya that if she does Y rather than X, Irving will withdraw his friendship, sulk, or become irritable and unpleasant to be around.
  10. Focus Tonya’s attention on some aspect of doing Y that Tonya fears and heighten that fear to get her to change her mind about doing Y.

Each of these tactics could reasonably be called manipulation. Many also have more specific, commonplace names, such as “guilt trip” (tactic 3), “gaslighting” (tactic 8), “peer pressure” (tactic 5), “negging” (tactic 6), and “emotional blackmail” (tactic 9). Perhaps not everyone will agree that every tactic on this list is a case of manipulation. And for some, whether it is manipulation might depend on details that have not been specified. For example, if Y is seriously immoral, then perhaps it is not manipulative for Irving to induce Tonya to feel guilty about preferring to do Y. It is also possible that we might revise our judgments about some of these tactics in light of a fully worked out and well supported theory of manipulation—if we had one. Nevertheless, this list illustrates the sorts of things that are called “manipulation” in ordinary discourse, and the variety of tactics commonly given that label.

Manipulation is typically distinguished from both coercion and rational persuasion. But this raises the question: Is every form of influence that is neither coercion nor rational persuasion a form of manipulation? If not, then what distinguishes it from other forms of influence that are neither coercion nor rational persuasion?

The term “manipulation” is commonly used to indicate moral disapproval: To say that Irving manipulated Tonya is commonly taken to be a moral criticism of Irving’s behavior. Is manipulation always immoral? Why is manipulation immoral (when it is immoral)? If manipulation is not always immoral, then what determines when it is immoral?

1. Preliminaries

1.1 Ordinary versus Global Manipulation

Manipulative tactics like those listed above are commonplace in ordinary life. This distinguishes them from forms of influence described as “manipulation” in the free will literature. There, the term “manipulation” typically refers to radical programming or reprogramming of all or most of an agent’s mental states. Such global manipulation (as we might call it) is also typically imagined as happening via extra-ordinary methods, such as supernatural intervention, direct neurological engineering, or radical programs of indoctrination or brainwashing. Global manipulation is typically thought to deprive its victim of free will. This common intuition drives the “manipulation argument”, which seeks to defend incompatibilism by claiming that living in a deterministic universe is analogous to being the victim of global manipulation. (For a detailed discussion of this argument, see the discussion of manipulation arguments in the entry on arguments for incompatibilism.)

Despite the differences between what we might call “ordinary manipulation” and the forms of manipulation in the free will literature, we might still wonder about the relationship between them. If global manipulation completely deprives its victim of free will, might ordinary forms of manipulation do something similar, on a limited scale? If Tonya succumbs to one of Irving’s tactics, should we regard her as being less free—and perhaps less responsible—for doing X? So far, few people have explored the connections between ordinary manipulation and the forms of global manipulation discussed in the free will literature. (Two exceptions are Long 2014 and Todd 2013).

1.2 Applications of a Theory of Ordinary Manipulation

Until recently, ordinary manipulation was seldom the subject of philosophical inquiry in its own right. However, the fact that it is commonly thought to undermine the validity of consent has led to its frequent mention in areas where consent is an important topic.

One such area is medical ethics, where proposed conditions for autonomous informed consent often include the condition that consent is not manipulated. In fact, one of the earliest sustained philosophical discussions of manipulation appears in Ruth Faden, Tom Beauchamp, and Nancy King’s influential book, A History and Theory of Informed Consent (1986). The view that manipulation undermines the validity of consent is widely held among medical ethicists. However, there is far less agreement about how to determine whether a given form of influence is manipulative. Nowhere is this lack of agreement more apparent than in recent discussions of “nudges.”

The concept of a nudge was introduced by Cass Sunstein and Richard Thaler to refer to the deliberate introduction of subtle, non-coercive influences into people’s decision-making to get them to make better choices (Thaler & Sunstein 2009; Sunstein 2014). Some nudges merely provide or improve the comprehensibility of information. Such “informational” nudges might be seen as inherently non-manipulative. However, one might worry that even purely informational nudges might be manipulative merely in the selection of which information is presented. For example, providing nutrition information on food packaging might subtly influence people to make food choices based on health considerations rather than taste. More pressing concerns arise with nudges that operate by psychological mechanisms whose relationship to rational deliberation is questionable. Many of these nudges exploit heuristics, reasoning and decision-making biases, and other psychological processes that operate outside of conscious awareness. For example, some evidence suggests that patients are more likely to choose an operation if they are told that it has a 90% survival rate rather than a 10% fatality rate. Is it manipulative for a surgeon to exploit this framing effect to nudge the patient into making the decision that the surgeon thinks best? Is it manipulative for a cafeteria manager to place healthier food items at eye level to nudge customers into choosing them? The question of whether and when nudges manipulate has sparked a lively debate.

Some defenders of nudges suggest that because it is often impossible to frame a decision without pointing the decision-maker in some direction, it is not manipulative to deliberately frame decisions. For example, physicians must provide outcome information either in terms of fatality rate or survival rate (and if they give both, they must give one first), and cafeteria managers must choose something to put at eye level in the displays. This being the case, why think that deliberately choosing one way of framing the decision over another is manipulative? But there are reasons to be wary of this line of thought. Suppose that Jones is traveling to a job interview on a subway car so crowded that it is inevitable that he will bump up against his fellow passengers. Suppose Jones exploits this fact to deliberately bump a rival candidate for the same job, who happens to be riding the same subway car, so that he is forced out the door just as it closes, thus ensuring that he will be late for his interview. Clearly the fact that it was inevitable that Jones’s rival would be subjected to some unintentional bumping does not legitimize Jones’s intentionally bumping his rival out the door. Similarly, the fact that we are inevitably subjected to some unintentional non-rational influences does not, by itself, legitimize intentionally using non-rational influences to affect people’s behavior (for similar arguments, see Douglass 2022 and Renzo 2025b: 192).

Nuanced discussions of whether nudges manipulate often focus on the psychological mechanisms by which the nudging occurs. However, no consensus has yet emerged about which psychological mechanisms render a nudge manipulative and which do not. (For a sample of approaches to the question of whether and when nudges manipulate, see Blumenthal-Barby 2012; Blumenthal-Barby & Burroughs 2012; Saghai 2013; Wilkinson 2013; Hanna 2015; Moles 2015; and Nys & Engelen 2017. For arguments that nudges can be sometimes morally justified even when they are manipulative, see Wilkinson 2017, Nys & Engelen 2017, and Sunstein 2015: 446).

Questions about the legitimacy of nudges go beyond the medical context. Thaler and Sunstein advocate their use by government, employers, and other institutions besides the health care industry. The use of nudges by government raises additional concerns, especially about the paternalism behind them (Arneson 2015; White 2013).

Questions about other forms of manipulation in the political sphere have also been raised by philosophers and political theorists. The idea that political leaders might gain, retain, or consolidate power by methods that we would now call manipulative go back at least as far as ancient Greek figures like Callicles and Thrasymachus. Niccolo Machiavelli not only details but recommends political tactics that we would likely regard as manipulative. More recent philosophical work on political manipulation includes Goodin (1980), Ware (1981), Riker (1986), Mills (1995), Dowding (2016), Gorton (2016), Whitfield (2020), Christiano (2022), Saul (2024), and the papers collected by Le Cheminant and Parrish (2011); for an overview of this literature, see Noggle (2021). Philosophical work on manipulation may be useful to political scientists who study forms of influence that seem aptly described as manipulation (e.g., Wilson 2024).

In business ethics, much philosophical attention has been focused on the question of whether advertising is manipulative. The economist John Kenneth Galbraith famously called advertising “the manipulation of consumer desire” and compared being the target of advertising with being

assailed by demons which instilled in him a passion sometimes for silk shirts, sometimes for kitchenware, sometimes for chamber pots, and sometimes for orange squash. (Galbraith 1958)

Several philosophers offer similar criticisms of advertising. As is the case with purely informational nudges, the presentation of accurate information in advertising seems less likely to be manipulative than forms of advertising that operate by other mechanisms (though the selection of which information is presented might be manipulative). Accordingly, non-informational advertising is the most frequent target for claims about manipulation. Tom Beauchamp (1984) and Roger Crisp (1987) offer influential arguments that such advertising can be manipulative. Similar criticisms claim that non-informational advertising can subvert autonomy or improperly tamper with consumers’ desires (e.g., Santilli 1983). Such critiques are either versions of or close relatives to critiques of advertising as manipulation. On the other side, Robert Arrington (1982) argues that, as a matter of fact, advertising very seldom manipulates its audience or undermines its audience’s autonomy. Michael Phillips (1997) has marshalled a large body of empirical evidence to argue that while some advertising is manipulative, its critics vastly overestimate its power to influence consumers.

In addition to the (rather sparse) philosophical literature on manipulation in commerce, there is a significant and growing legal literature on commercial manipulation. Notable examples include Strauss (1991), Hanson and Kysar (1999), Goodman (2013), Calo (2014), Berman (2015), Sunstein (2016), Becher and Feldman (2016), Kilovaty (2019), and Norton (2021). Some of this literature rivals the philosophical literature in the sophistication with which it grapples with the challenges of defining manipulation. In addition, some of it explicitly references the philosophical literature on manipulation. Notable examples include Goodman (2013), Becher and Feldman (2016), Kilovaty (2019), and Norton (2021).

Considerable recent interest in manipulation has been driven by worries about online manipulation and other forms of technological manipulation. These worries have engaged philosophers, (see, e.g., Klenk 2022, 2023, Susser et al. 2019, 2020, and the papers collected by Jongepier and Klenk (eds.) 2022), legal scholars and regulators (see, e.g., Day and Stemler 2020, Spencer 2020, Edwards 2008, Luguri and Strahilevitz 2021, Sunstein 2025, and Federal Trade Commission 2022), and others (see, e.g., Brignull 2023, Wilson 2023, and Gehl and Lawson 2022). In an especially thorough discussion spanning both theoretical and practical issues relating to manipulation, Cass Sunstein (2025) proposes a right against manipulation, and works out its legal and public policy applications to such areas as artificial intelligence, deepfakes, nudges, social pressure, and “sludge,” i.e., deliberate efforts to make certain actions more difficult than necessary to discourage people from choosing them.

Finally, it is worth noting that the topic of manipulation is related to other topics of recent philosophical interest, such as gaslighting (Abramson 2024) racist dogwhistles (Saul 2024), and the right to mental integrity (Douglas 2026).

1.3 Two Questions about Manipulation

A satisfactory theory of manipulation should answer two main questions. One question—call it the identification question—concerns definition and identification: How can we identify which forms of influence are manipulative and which are not? Most theorists have assumed that a satisfactory answer to this question would involve a general definition of manipulation, which explains what the diverse forms of manipulative influence have in common to make them all manifestations of a single phenomenon. However, a significant minority view suggests that the multifarious nature of manipulation renders it immune from traditional philosophical definitions. Even so, it seems reasonable to expect any satisfactory answer to the identification question to provide guidance, if not strict criteria, for determining whether a given instance of influence is manipulative.

A second question—call it the evaluation question—concerns manipulation’s moral status. A satisfactory answer to this question should tell us either that manipulation is always immoral, or how to determine when it is immoral. More importantly, a satisfactory answer to the evaluation question should explain why manipulation is immoral when it is immoral.

Although the two questions are distinct, they are not entirely independent. Any analysis of why manipulation is immoral (when it is immoral) will presuppose some account of what manipulation is. Thus, our answer to the identification question will constrain our answer to the evaluation question. But an answer to the identification question might do more than constrain our answer to the evaluation question: it might also guide it. If an account of manipulation entails that it is relevantly similar to some other thing that we have independent grounds for regarding as morally wrong, then we would likely want to argue that manipulation is wrong for similar reasons. Finally, we might need to adjust our answers to one or both questions if their conjunction has implausible implications. For example, if we define manipulation as every form of influence besides rational persuasion or coercion, and then claim that the wrongness of manipulation is absolute, we will be forced to conclude that no form of influence besides rational persuasion is ever morally legitimate. This is a radical conclusion that few would be willing to accept.

2. Answering the Identification Question

Several accounts of manipulation have been put forward. Most fall into three rough categories: those that characterize manipulation as an influence that bypasses reason; those that treat it as a form of trickery, and those that treat it as a form of pressure. In addition, there are hybrid accounts, and accounts that deny that manipulation can be defined at all. These are only rough categories meant to aid exposition and illuminate major themes; for some theories, a case could be made for placement in more than one category.

2.1. Manipulation as Bypassing or Undermining Reason

Manipulation is sometimes said to “bypass” the target’s rational deliberation. It is not always clear, however, whether this claim is meant as a definition of manipulation or merely as a statement about manipulation (perhaps one that partly explains its moral status). But let us consider whether the idea that manipulation bypasses reason can serve as a definition of manipulation.

The thought that manipulative influences bypass the target’s capacity for rational deliberation is appealing for at least two reasons. First, it seems reasonable to think that because manipulation differs from rational persuasion, it must influence behavior by means that do not engage the target’s rational capacities. Second, it seems intuitive to describe forms of influence that do clearly bypass the target’s capacity for rational deliberation as manipulative. For example, suppose that subliminal advertising worked in the way that it is commonly—though probably inaccurately—portrayed, so that being exposed to a subliminal message urging you to “Drink Coke” could influence your behavior without engaging your mechanisms of rational deliberation. Intuitively such an influence would seem to be a clear case of manipulation.

Subliminal advertising tactics—along with hypnosis and behavioral conditioning—are commonly portrayed as effective methods to influence others without their knowledge and thus without engaging their capacities for rational deliberation. The effectiveness of such tactics is almost certainly wildly exaggerated in the popular (and sometimes philosophical) imagination. However, if we imagine them working as well as they are sometimes portrayed, then they would constitute clear examples of what it might mean to say that manipulation bypasses reason. Thus, we might understand manipulation in terms of bypassing rational deliberation, and understand “bypassing rational deliberation” in terms of exploiting psychological mechanisms or techniques that can generate behavior without any input from rational deliberation.

Another way that manipulation might bypass rational deliberation would be for it to appeal to non-conscious motivations. Eric Cave explores this idea in a pair of papers (Cave 2007, 2014) on what he calls “motive manipulation.” Cave distinguishes between “concerns,” which are conscious pro-attitudes, and unconscious “non-concern motives.” He then defines motive manipulation as influence that operates by engaging unconscious non-concern motives. This theory clearly implies that appeals to non-conscious motives, as well as influences that operate via “quasi-hypnotic techniques” and “crude behavioral conditioning” are manipulative (Cave 2014: 188). Although Cave himself does not claim that all forms of manipulation are of this sort (Cave 2007: 130), perhaps we could add the appeal to non-conscious motives to the list of psychological mechanisms that are manipulative because they bypass reason.

Unfortunately, however, the strategy of defining manipulation in terms of influences that bypass reason in these ways faces problems. If we define manipulation in terms of bypassing rational deliberation, and then use the appeal to unconscious motives and exaggerated portrayals of hypnosis and subliminal advertising to illustrate what it means to bypass rational deliberation, we will set a very high bar for something to count as manipulation. This bar would be too high to count any of Irving’s tactics as manipulation, since none of them completely bypasses Tonya’s capacity for rational deliberation in the way that subliminal advertising, hypnosis, conditioning, or the appeal to unconscious motives would appear to do.

A more promising version of the “bypassing reason” approach sees manipulation as influence that bypasses the target’s conscious reasoning processes. The most straightforward way for an influence to do this would be for it to escape conscious attention altogether. Thus, we might define manipulation as hidden or covert influence, so that a manipulative influence goes unnoticed and thus influences behavior without entering into the target’s conscious deliberation. An early version of this “covert influence” approach to manipulation was suggested by the political theorist Alan Ware (1981). Ware characterizes manipulation as an influence on the target which is covert in the sense that the target lacks knowledge or understanding of how she is being influenced. Similarly, Alan Strudler suggests that “a sufficient even though not exhaustive characterization of manipulation” is that it involves changing a person’s behavior “through a chain of events that has the desired effect only because the person is unaware of that chain” (Strudler 2005: 459).

An especially influential version of this view has been defended by Daniel Susser, Beate Roessler, and Helen Nissenbaum, who write that: “manipulation is hidden influence. … Covertly influencing someone—imposing a hidden influence—means influencing them in a way they aren’t consciously aware of, and in a way they couldn’t easily become aware of” (Susser et al., 2019: 4).

The covert influence approach works well with influences that bypass conscious attention, such as priming, framing effects, and subliminal influence, as well as those that employ cognitive biases of the sort made famous by the work of Daniel Kahneman, Amos Tversky, and colleagues (see Kahneman 2013 for an overview). Many of these influences are associated with what psychologists call Type I processes, which are thought to be fast, automatic, and--most significantly--opaque to consciousness. The covert influence approach also works well with many less exotic forms of manipulation that rely on stealth, such as misdirection, deception, and gaslighting. However, it faces obstacles in dealing with other clear cases of manipulation. Many manipulative influences, such as peer pressure, nagging, and guilt trips, do not seem covert. Indeed, it is rather difficult not to notice when tactics like these are being used to influence one’s behavior; yet they are commonly counted as instances of manipulation.

Perhaps, however, it is not the influence itself that must be covert in order for it to bypass reason in the relevant sense. Perhaps it is sufficient that the intent behind it must be covert. Perhaps the covertness of the intent behind an influence renders it less likely to trigger rational scrutiny by the target. That is, even if I am aware that you are trying to influence me, if I am unaware of your true intentions, I might not engage in rational deliberation about whether to resist the influence. Such a view is defended by Radim Belohrad, who claims that

In manipulation, the influencer is keen to create an impression that her motives are very different from what she projects. … The manipulator always projects intentions that differ from her real intentions. (Belohrad 2019: 457–459)

Along similar lines, Gregory Whitfield claims that

An act of manipulation is any intentional attempt by an agent (A) to cause another agent (B) to will/prefer/intend/act other than what A takes B’s will, preference or intention to be, where A does so utilizing methods that obscure and render deniable A’s intentions vis-à-vis B. (Whitfield 2020: 11)

It is certainly true that manipulators often keep their true intentions hidden. Iago wants Othello to think that he intends to be his friend, rather than the agent of his destruction. Exaggerating the benefits of doing what the manipulator wants, while understating the advantages of other options (tactic 2 on our list) probably works best if the target falsely believes that the manipulator intends to provide objective advice. However, there are other examples of manipulation where the intent does not seem to be hidden. The intent of a teenager nagging for a new cellphone is quite transparent—to get the parent to provide the new phone. Similarly, when adolescents engage in peer pressure to get a fellow to smoke, their intention—to get the target to smoke—is quite transparent. Targets of guilt trips often—perhaps typically—know exactly what the guilt tripper intends to get the target to do. Perhaps anticipating these worries, Whitfield argues that manipulation only requires the manipulator to have “plausible deniability” about his true intentions. It is not clear that this response fully addresses the problem, however. It is not obvious that tactics like peer pressure and nagging only work, or only count as manipulation, if their users can plausibly deny their intentions.

Despite its challenges, the covert influence view has the advantage of providing a compelling account of manipulation’s hostile relationship to reason. On many conceptions of autonomy, the covert influence view would also seem to account for and explain the intuition that manipulation undermines autonomy. If, as is often claimed, autonomy requires some sort of critical self-reflection, then influences that escape conscious attention would also seem to escape critical self-reflection.

A somewhat different way that we might attempt to characterize manipulation as bypassing reason would be to see it as employing non-rational influences. On this view, manipulation might not bypass deliberation, but it would bypass rational deliberation by introducing non-rational influences into the deliberative process. Thus, we might follow Joseph Raz in claiming that

manipulation, unlike coercion, does not interfere with a person’s options. Instead it perverts the way that person reaches decisions, forms preferences, or adopts goals. (Raz 1988: 377)

Treating manipulation as bypassing rational deliberation, and then characterizing “bypassing rational deliberation” in terms of introducing non-rational influences into deliberation, would cohere nicely with the observation that manipulation is a contrary of rational persuasion.

Despite its appeal, this approach faces a significant challenge: Many forms of non-rational influence do not seem to be manipulative. For example, graphic portrayals of the dangers of smoking or texting while driving are not obviously manipulative even when they impart no new information to the target (Blumenthal-Barby 2012). In addition, moral persuasion often involves non-rational influence. Appeals to the Golden Rule invite the interlocutor to imagine how it would feel to be on the receiving end of the action under consideration. It is difficult to believe that all such appeals are inherently manipulative, even when they appeal more to feelings than facts. Finally, consider something as innocuous as dressing up before going on a date or an interview. Presumably, the purpose of such “impression management” is to convey a certain impression to the audience. Yet dressing up on a single occasion provides little if any rational basis for conclusions about what the well-dressed person is really like day in and day out. Thus, impression management of this sort seems to be an attempt at non-rational influence. Yet it seems odd to count it as manipulation—especially if we treat “manipulation” as having a negative moral connotation. Of course, we might avoid this problem by defining “manipulation” in a morally neutral way, and then claiming that these forms of manipulation are not immoral, while others are. But this would merely move the problem without solving it, for now we would want to know what distinguishes immoral forms of manipulation from those that are not immoral.

Perhaps we could address this problem by defining reason more broadly, so that appeals to emotions could count as forms of rational persuasion. Such a move might be independently motivated by the rejection of what some critics regard as the hyper-cognitivist radical separation of reason from emotion. However, it is not clear that allowing emotional appeals to count as rational persuasion will get us very far in defining manipulation in terms of bypassing reason. For while we will avoid the implausible implication that all appeals to emotion are ipso facto manipulative, we now face the question of which appeals to emotion are manipulative and which are not. And that is close to the very question that the idea of bypassing reason was supposed to help us answer.

Thus, despite the plausibility of the claim that manipulation bypasses reason, using this claim to define manipulation faces serious challenges: If we take “bypassing” very literally, then the account seems to miss many examples of genuine manipulation. But if we loosen our understanding of “bypassing reason” so that it applies to any non-rational form of influence, then it seems to count as manipulative many forms of influence that do not seem manipulative. And if we fix that problem by adopting a conception of reason according to which appeals to the emotions are not ipso facto non-rational, then we are left with the original problem of determining which appeals to the emotions are manipulative and which are not. Perhaps there is a way to characterize “bypassing reason” that can undergird a plausible definition of manipulation in terms of bypassing reason. But the most obvious ways to define “bypassing reason” face serious challenges.

Nevertheless, there remains something plausible, even compelling, about the idea that manipulation stands in a hostile relationship with reason. Perhaps what is needed is a better way to develop that thought into an account of manipulation. One possibility is to see manipulation not as bypassing rational deliberation, but as having some sort of detrimental effect on it.

For example, Jason Hanna suggests that manipulation (or at least certain types of it) “involves the intentional use of nonrational means of influence, where these means affect the target’s deliberation for the worse” (Hanna 2015: 630). Similarly, Moti Gorin suggests that “manipulation is best understood as a process of influence that deliberately fails to track reasons, which failure need not entail the bypassing or subversion of the targeted agent’s rationality.” (Gorin 2018: 237)

An especially sophisticated version of this idea has been suggested by Massimo Renzo, who writes that manipulation “involves intentionally interfering with their efforts to adequately respond to their reasons for action in order to induce them to fall short” either by failing to do what they have reason to do, or doing what they have reason to do, but doing it for the wrong reason (Renzo 2025b: 191). On Renzo’s view, manipulative influence does not bypass the target’s rational faculties. Instead, it makes use of them, so that “Manipulation involves intentionally exploiting our capacity to exercise our practical agency in order to undermine our efforts to adequately respond to our reasons for action” (Renzo 2025b: 199).

The plausibility of the idea that manipulation stands in a hostile relationship to reason makes these accounts appealing. One challenge for them, however, is that there are multiple notions of reason: Objective, subjective, strategic, procedural, substantive, ecological, moral, prudential, etc. Which reasons should we see manipulation as interfering with our ability to track? Until this question is answered, this approach to defining manipulation is difficult to evaluate.

2.2 Manipulation as Trickery

A second approach to manipulation treats it as a form of trickery, and ties it conceptually to deception. The connection between manipulation and deception is a common theme in both non-philosophical and philosophical discussions of manipulation. In his 1980 book Manipulatory Politics, Robert Goodin argues that manipulation is inherently deceptive, and offers this test for whether an influence is manipulative: “1. Is the interference deceptive? 2. Is the interference contrary to the putative will of those subject to it?” (Goodin, 1980: 35). In the literature on advertising, the charge that (at least some) advertising is manipulative often rests on the claim that it creates false beliefs or misleading associations (e.g., linking the vitality of the Marlboro man to a product which causes lung cancer). Similarly, in his discussion of promises, T. M. Scanlon condemns manipulation as a means of inducing false beliefs and expectations (Scanlon 1998: 298–322). Shlomo Cohen offers a somewhat different account of the relationship between manipulation and deception, according to which the distinction lies in the methods by which the target is induced to adopt a false belief (Cohen 2018; see Krstić 2024 for discussion and critique). But even on this more nuanced view, there is still a strong connection between manipulation and deception.

Other views in this family treat manipulation as a broader category of which deception is a special case. Deception tricks a person into adopting a faulty belief. What we might call the Trickery Account claims that manipulation also tricks a person into adopting something faulty, though that “something” is not limited to faulty beliefs. In particular, it might also include other inappropriate mental states or bad reasons.

An early example of this version of the trickery approach to manipulation can be found in a 1980 paper by Vance Kasten, who writes that

manipulation occurs when there is a difference in kind between what one intends to do and what one actually does, when that difference is traceable to another in such a way that the victim may be said to have been misled. (Kasten 1980: 54)

Although many of Kasten’s examples of misleading involve deception, he also includes examples in which manipulation involves inducing the target to have inappropriate emotions like guilt. In a 1996 paper, Robert Noggle defended a similar approach, writing that

There are certain norms or ideals that govern beliefs, desires, and emotions. Manipulative action is the attempt to get someone’s beliefs, desires, or emotions to violate these norms, to fall short of these ideals. (Noggle 1996: 44)

The norms or ideals in question will vary by mental state: a belief falls short of its ideal if it is false; a pattern of attention falls short of its ideal if excessive attention is being paid to something less relevant for the choice at hand; an emotion falls short of its ideal if it is not appropriate to the situation (Noggle 1996: 44–47). In a similar vein, Anne Barnhill writes that

manipulation is directly influencing someone’s beliefs, desires, or emotions such that she falls short of ideals for belief, desire, or emotion in ways typically not in her self-interest or likely not in her self-interest in the present context. (Barnhill 2014: 73, emphasis original)

Other theorists taking this same general approach define manipulation as an attempt to get someone to adopt faulty reasons (or faulty assessments of one’s reasons) rather than, or in addition to, faulty mental states. For example, Claudia Mills writes:

We might say, then, that manipulation in some way purports to be offering good reasons, when in fact it does not. A manipulator tries to change another’s beliefs and desires by offering her bad reasons, disguised as good, or faulty arguments, disguised as sound—where the manipulator himself knows these to be bad reasons and faulty arguments. (Mills 1995: 100)

A similar picture of manipulation emerges from the work of the political theorist Keith Dowding (2016, 2018; see also Dowding and Oprea 2024). Dowding does not attempt to characterize manipulation directly. Rather, he proposes ideal conditions for persuasion in a deliberative democracy—conditions that would exclude manipulation. These conditions prohibit appealing to reasons the persuader does not accept and emotions the persuader does not share. These prohibitions suggest seeing manipulation as influence that appeals to what the manipulator sees as bad reasons or inappropriate emotions.

The trickery approach might be further expanded by adopting Michael Cholbi’s observation that the phenomenon of ego depletion might induce targets of manipulation to form faulty intentions (that is, intentions that do not reflect their considered values) because their resistance to temptation has been worn down (Cholbi 2014).

Trickery accounts have much in common with accounts that define manipulation as influences that interfere with the target’s ability to respond to reasons, since it seems plausible to claim that a faulty mental state would tend to interfere with the target’s ability to respond to reasons. However, insofar as there may be other ways to interfere with someone’s ability to respond to reasons, they remain distinct, if overlapping, approaches.

Proponents of the trickery approach disagree over several details, most notably how to define a faulty mental state or bad reason. Some proponents of the trickery view argue that manipulation occurs when the influencer attempts to induce what the influencer regards as a faulty mental state or bad reason into the target’s deliberations (Mills 1995; Noggle 1996; this idea is built into Dowding’s account). Others argue that we should define manipulation as introducing an objectively faulty mental state or bad reason into the target’s deliberations (Hanna 2015: 634; see also Sunstein 2016: 89). Anne Barnhill suggests that our usage of the term “manipulation” is inconsistent on the question (Barnhill 2014).

The trickery view can be motivated by appeal to various examples of clear cases of manipulation. One especially fruitful set of such examples is Shakespeare’s Othello. It seems natural to describe Shakespeare’s character Iago as a manipulator. The trickery view accounts for our sense that Iago manipulates Othello by noting that Iago tricks him into adopting various faulty mental states—false beliefs, unwarranted suspicions, irrational emotions, and so on. Similarly, gaslighting seems to trick the target into adopting a faulty assessment of the reliability of one’s own judgement. Guilt trips trick the target into feeling inappropriate or excessive guilt.

However, the trickery view faces challenges in accounting for an important class of tactics that seem, intuitively, to be manipulative. Tactics like charm offensives, peer pressure, nagging, and emotional blackmail do not seem to involve trickery. Nor it is clear that such tactics operate by inducing the target to adopt any sort of faulty mental state. Yet it seems quite natural to classify them as examples of manipulation.

2.3 Manipulation as Pressure

A third way to characterize manipulation is to treat it as a kind of pressure to do as the influencer wishes. On this account, tactics like emotional blackmail, nagging, and peer pressure are paradigm cases of manipulation, since they exert pressure on the target by imposing costs for failing to do what the manipulator wishes. One rationale for treating manipulation as a form of pressure is the observation that manipulation is neither rational persuasion nor coercion. It seems plausible, then, to suppose that there is a continuum between rational persuasion and coercion with regard to the level of pressure being exerted, with rational persuasion exerting no pressure, coercion exerting maximum pressure, and the middle region, manipulation, exerting pressure that falls short of being coercive. In this way, we might arrive at the idea that manipulation is a form of pressure that does not rise to the level of coercion.

One of the earliest philosophical accounts of manipulation, by Ruth Faden, Tom Beauchamp, and Nancy King, offers this sort of analysis of manipulation as pressure. They begin by contrasting using rational persuasion to convince a patient to take a medically necessary drug with simply coercing him to take it. Then they observe that

There are many in-between cases: For example, suppose the physician has made clear that he or she will be upset with the patient if the patient does not take the drug, and the patient is intimidated. Although the patient is not convinced that it is the best course to take the medication, … the patient agrees to take the drug because it appears that acceptance will foster a better relationship with the doctor… Here the patient performs the action … under a heavy measure of control by the physician’s role, authority, and indeed prescription. Unlike the first case, the patient does not find it overwhelmingly difficult to resist the physician’s proposal, but, unlike the second case, it is nonetheless awkward and difficult to resist this rather “controlling” physician. (Faden, Beauchamp, & King 1986: 258)

They claim that such “in between” cases constitute manipulation. Joel Feinberg offers a similar account of manipulation. He writes that many techniques for getting someone to act in a certain way

can be placed on a spectrum of force running from compulsion proper, at one extreme, through compulsive pressure, coercion proper, and coercive pressure, to manipulation, persuasion, enticement, and simple requests at the other extreme. The line between forcing to act and merely getting to act is drawn somewhere in the manipulation or persuasion part of the scale. (Feinberg 1989: 189)

Michael Kligman and Charles Culver offer a similar account:

The attempt to influence B’s behavior takes on a manipulative character when … A’s primary intent is no longer to convince B, in a good faith manner, that acting as desired by A would be in keeping with B’s rational assessments of outcome; [but rather] to procure or engineer the needed assent by bringing pressure to bear, in a deliberate and calculated way, on what he presumes to be the manipulable features of B’s motivational system. (Kligman & Culver 1992: 186–187)

Kligman and Culver go on to distinguish this manipulative pressure from coercion by claiming that the latter, unlike the former, involves “sufficiently strong incentives … that it would be unreasonable to expect any rational person not to so act” (Kligman & Culver 1992: 187). Marcia Baron (2003) and Allen Wood (2014) also discussed forms of manipulation that seem best characterized as forms of pressure.

Although we have been treating the idea that manipulation consists of a form of pressure as a full-fledged theory of manipulation, this is somewhat artificial. That is because most of the authors just cited hold only that some forms of manipulation consist of pressure. Thus, it is somewhat artificial to speak of the pressure model as a theory meant to cover all forms of manipulation. It is more accurate to regard the pressure model as claiming that exerting non-coercive pressure is sufficient (but perhaps not necessary) for an influence to count as manipulative.

2.4 Disjunctive, Hybrid, and Non-Definitional Views

When we survey tactics that seem like intuitively clear cases of manipulation, we find some that seem to involve trickery, and others that seem to involve pressure. This is puzzling, since, on the face of it, trickery and pressure seem rather dissimilar. What should we make of the fact that we use the same concept—manipulation—to refer to methods of influence that seem to operate by such dissimilar mechanisms?

Several responses are possible. First, we might adopt a disjunctive view, according to which manipulation consists of either trickery or pressure. Indeed, in one of the earliest philosophical analyses of manipulation, Joel Rudinow takes this approach. Rudinow begins with the following thesis:

A attempts to manipulate S iff A attempts to influence S’s behavior by means of deception or pressure or by playing on a supposed weakness of S. (Rudinow 1978: 343)

Rudinow goes on to claim that the use of pressure is manipulative only if the would-be manipulator directs it at some supposed weakness in his target that will render the target unable to resist it; this leads him to finalize his definition in terms of “deception or by playing upon a supposed weakness” of the target, with the second disjunct meant to cover pressure-based tactics (Rudinow 1978: 346). Several other philosophers have followed Rudinow’s disjunctive approach to defining manipulation (Tomlinson 1986; Sher 2011; Mandava & Millum 2013). Indeed, as we noted earlier, it is common for people who discuss manipulative pressure to claim that manipulation comes in other forms as well.

A somewhat different version of the disjunctive strategy might begin with the pressure account’s idea that manipulation occupies the middle ground in a continuum of pressure between rational persuasion and coercion, but then add a second dimension consisting of a continuum between rational persuasion and outright lying. We might then define manipulation in terms of a two-dimensional space bounded by rational persuasion, outright lying, and coercion. A strategy like this is suggested by Sapir Handelman, although he also adds a third dimension that measures the level of “control” that a given form of influence exerts (Handelman 2009).

Patricia Greenspan suggests that manipulation is a sort of hybrid between coercion and deception. She writes that

cases of manipulation seem to have a foot in both of the usual categories of intentional interference with another agent’s autonomy, coercion and deception, but partly as a result, they do not fit squarely in either category. (Greenspan 2003: 157)

Thus, we might characterize her view as a “conjunctive” theory of manipulation, according to which it contains elements of both pressure and deception. It certainly seems true that manipulators often use both pressure and deception. For example, a manipulator who employs peer pressure might also exaggerate the extent to which the target’s peers will disapprove of her if she chooses the option that the manipulator wants her not to choose. However, we can also point to relatively pure cases of manipulative pressure or manipulative trickery: It is not difficult to imagine a case of pure peer pressure, where the manipulator does not seek to induce any false beliefs, or a case of pure misdirection, where the manipulator does not seek to impose any pressure. The apparent existence of cases of manipulation that involve only deception or only pressure seems to be a problem for Greenspan’s hybrid view.

The obvious advantage of a disjunctive definition of manipulation as involving either trickery or pressure is that it can account for the variety of forms of manipulation far better than either conjunct. However, this advantage comes at a price. Simply putting an “or” between the trickery and pressure accounts leaves unanswered the question of what makes all forms of manipulation manifestations of the same phenomenon. Of course, it is possible that this question cannot be answered because, as a matter of fact, there are two irreducibly different forms of manipulation. But this seems like a conclusion that we should accept only reluctantly, after having made a good faith effort to determine whether there really is anything in common between pressure-based manipulation and trickery-based manipulation.

We might, perhaps, avoid this conclusion if we can find a broader category into which both pressure and manipulation fit. One recent attempt to do this is Noggle’s “Mistake Account” (Noggle 2025). This theory claims that manipulative pressure operates when and because the target chooses akratically. Akratic choices are like adopting faulty mental states in that both are mistakes. Thus, Noggle’s account treats manipulation as influence that operates by inducing a mistake, where manipulative pressure involves the mistake of akratic choice, and manipulative trickery involves the mistake of adopting a faulty mental state. (Noggle also suggests (2025: 120) that the Mistake Account can be formulated in terms of tracking reasons.) It remains to be seen, however, whether this theory’s key claim that manipulative pressure operates via akrasia will prove convincing (Cohen 2025, 38–40).

A more ambitious strategy to account for both pressure and trickery involves defining manipulation in terms of something about the manipulator rather than something about the influence. One way to do this might be to draw on Marcia Baron’s important paper (Baron 2003) on “Manipulativeness,” which diagnoses the underlying moral wrong in manipulation in terms of an Aristotelian vice. She suggests treating manipulativeness as the vice of excess with regard to “to what extent—and how and when and to whom and for what sorts of ends—to seek to influence others’ conduct” (Baron 2003: 48). On her view,

manipulativeness is at the opposite extreme from the vice of refraining from offering potentially helpful counsel; or refraining from trying to stop someone from doing something very dangerous, for example, from driving home from one’s house while drunk. (Baron 2003: 48)

Perhaps, then, we can understand the underlying similarity between trickery- and pressure-based manipulation as manifestations of a common vice, as different ways of going wrong with regard to how and how much we should try to influence those around us.

Baron’s remarks about the mind-set of the manipulator are insightful and instructive. However, it is unclear whether they suffice to answer the characterization question. For it is unclear whether, by themselves, they can distinguish manipulation from other forms of excess with regard to influence, such as coercion. Or consider someone who persists in offering rational arguments for some course of action to someone who has every right to decide on their own course of action, and who has made it clear that such arguments are unwelcome. This would seem to be an excess with regard to influence, yet it would not seem to be an example of manipulation.

The idea that manipulation should be characterized in terms of the mindset of the manipulator also appears in recent work by Michael Klenk (2022). According to Klenk, the manipulator influences negligently: manipulation involves influencing someone by some method while disregarding whether that method reveals reasons for the target to do, think, or feel as the manipulator wishes (Klenk 2022: 97). While this view requires a certain mindset from the manipulator, it also has some affinities for the trickery view, inasmuch as the negligence required is negligence with regard to whether the influence tricks the target into changing how he feels, acts, or thinks for a bad reason or no reason at all. A hybrid view along these lines might allow us to integrate some of Baron’s insights about the manipulator’s mindset with a more specific characterization of the sort of influence to which that mindset leads.

A more radical response to the difficulty of creating a definition that captures all forms of manipulation is to claim that manipulation is a complex phenomenon that cannot be captured by any set of necessary and sufficient conditions—even a disjunctive set. This “non-definitional” approach claims that the term “manipulation” refers to such a diverse set of phenomena that no definition can capture every form of influence to which the term is commonly applied. For example, Felicia Ackerman (1995) argues that the term “manipulation” exhibits “combinatorial vagueness”: while it is connected to features like inhibition of rational deliberation, unethicalness, deceptiveness, playing upon non-rational impulses, shrewdness, pressure, etc., “no condition on the list is sufficient, … and no single condition … is even necessary” for an instance of influence to be manipulative (Ackerman 1995: 337–38).

In a recent book, Shlomo Cohen (2025) offers a more elaborate version of this approach. He agrees with Ackerman that there is no set of necessary and sufficient conditions for an influence to count as manipulation; thus, “manipulation” is best seen as a cluster concept, with instances of manipulation having greater or lesser resemblance to paradigm instances of it (Cohen 2025: 80–81). Moreover, Cohen argues that seeing an influence as manipulation involves seeing it as one to which the metaphor of “mechanification” is apt. Cohen regards this metaphor, which invokes ideas of operating someone as a mechanism, as “constitutive of the concept of manipulation” (Cohen 2025: 64; see also 71–74). The extent to which we see an influence as mechanification depends, in turn, on the extent to which the influence has certain features, no single subset of which is necessary and sufficient for manipulation. These features include: being done with the intention “to influence in a mechanifying way;” operating by “getting into the target’s head;” exploiting the target’s psychological vulnerabilities; being non-transparent; having unwanted effects on the target; and the extent to which it differs from what we would expect in the situation (Cohen 2025: 83–111). Because influences can have a larger or smaller number of these features, many of which also vary in degree, influences will fall on a continuum from clear, paradigmatic cases of manipulation, to clear, paradigmatic cases of non-manipulative influence. Importantly, there will be no clear boundaries between manipulative and non-manipulative influence.

Although Cohen’s analysis is, by far, the most sophisticated defense of the claim that the concept of manipulation cannot be defined in terms of necessary and sufficient conditions, others have expressed skepticism about either the possibility or the need to give it a precise definition. For example, Sophie Gibert has argued that we do not need to define manipulation in order to “answer important normative questions about manipulation” (Gibert 2023: 336). Anne Barnhill has argued that, for many purposes in applied ethics, it is less important to agree on a definition of manipulation than to isolate “specific feature(s) of the influence that sparks the charge of manipulation, and … query whether influence of that sort is problematic” (Barnhill 2022: 49). Cass Sunstein (2025) has expressed skepticism about whether our commonsense concept of manipulation can be captured in a precise definition. However, he proposes a legal right against certain forms of manipulation, and argues that, for the purposes of defining such a right, an approximate definition that picks out forms of manipulation that are proper targets for government regulation will suffice.

Thus, we can distinguish between what we might call “principled” non-definitionalists and what we might call “pragmatic” non-definitionalists. The first category includes those who argue that the concept of manipulation cannot, in fact, be captured by a traditional definition. The second, looser category includes those who are skeptical or agnostic about the prospects of defining “manipulation,” or who propose work-arounds that will allow important practical or theoretical work concerning manipulation to proceed in the absence of a consensus about how best to define it. Ackerman and Cohen seem clearly to defend the principled non-definitionalist view. The statements quoted above from Barnhill, Gibert, and Sunstein suggest more pragmatic forms of non-definitionalism.

3 Answering the Evaluation Question

A complete answer to the evaluation question should tell us about the sort of wrongfulness that manipulation possesses, at least in those cases where it is immoral: Is it absolutely immoral, pro tanto immoral, prima facie immoral, etc.? It should also tell us when manipulation is immoral if it is not always immoral. Finally, a satisfactory answer to the evaluation question should tell us why it is immoral in cases when it is immoral.

A temptingly simple way to answer both the characterization and the evaluation questions in one fell swoop would be to adopt a “moralized” definition according to which manipulation is morally wrong by definition. A simple version of this approach might define manipulation as “wrongful influence,” or, perhaps, “wrongful influence other than coercion.” This would make manipulation morally wrong by definition. However, moralized definitions of manipulation have not been popular among philosophers. Allen Wood has argued against moralized definitions of “manipulation” (and other terms), writing that

If we think that moral argument should proceed not merely by invoking our pro- or con- sentiments, or appealing to our unargued intuitions, but instead by identifying objective facts about a situation that give us good reasons for condemning or approving certain things, then we would generally do much better to use a non-moralized sense of words like “coercion”, “manipulation”, and “exploitation”—a sense in which these words can be used to refer to such objective facts. (Wood 2014: 19–20)

It is important to keep in mind that the target of Wood’s critique is what we might call “fully” moralized definitions. Wood’s own example of a moralized definition is the definition of “murder” as “wrongful homicide” (Wood 2014: 18). If this is what we mean by a “moralized definition,” then most philosophers share Wood’s preference to avoid defining “manipulation” this way. But employing a “fully” moralized definition is different from defining “manipulation” in a way that helps to explain its negative moral connotation, perhaps by linking it to some other feature, such as deception or bypassing reason, that we have independent reason to regard as morally undesirable.

3.1 When Is Manipulation Wrong?

One need not claim that manipulation is wrong by definition in order to claim that it is always wrong. However, this is not a common view among philosophers.

To see why, let’s fill in the details of our story about Irving and Tonya like so: Suppose that Tonya is a captured terrorist who has hidden a bomb in the city; her preferred course of action is to keep its location secret until it explodes. And suppose that Irving is an FBI interrogator who wants Tonya to reveal the bomb’s location before it explodes. If we claim that manipulation is absolutely wrong, so that it remains wrong all things considered, no matter what the consequences, then we would have to conclude that Irving’s action was wrong on balance. Inasmuch as this hardline view resembles Kant’s notorious hardline position that lying is always wrong, one might look to Kant’s ethics for considerations to support it. But this hardline view against manipulation seems just as unappealing as Kant’s hardline position against lying. The existence of cases like this, where behavior that seems clearly manipulative also seems morally justified, poses problems for both the idea that manipulation is wrongful by definition, and for the idea that manipulation is absolutely immoral even if this is not so by definition.

A less extreme position would be that while manipulation is always pro tanto wrong, other moral considerations can sometimes outweigh the pro tanto wrongness of manipulation. Thus, we might think that manipulation is always wrong to some extent, but that countervailing moral factors might sometimes suffice to make manipulation justified on balance. What might such factors include? One obvious candidate would be consequences—for example, the fact that Irving’s successful manipulation of Tonya would save many innocent lives. Non-consequentialist factors might also be thought to be countervailing considerations: Perhaps the immorality of Tonya’s character, or the fact that she is acting on an evil desire or intention, is a countervailing factor that can outweigh the pro tanto wrongness of Irving’s manipulation. It is important to note that, on this view, the fact that an action involves manipulation is always a moral reason to avoid it, even if stronger countervailing considerations render it not wrong on balance. For example, even if Irving’s manipulation of Terrorist Tonya is not wrong on balance (e.g., because of the innocent lives that will be saved), if Irving can get Tonya to reveal the bomb’s location without manipulation (or anything else that is comparably immoral), then it would be morally better to avoid manipulating her.

By contrast, we might hold that manipulation is merely prima facie immoral. On this view, there is a presumption that manipulation is immoral, but this presumption can be defeated in some situations. When the presumption is defeated, manipulation is not wrong at all (i.e., not even pro tanto wrong). On this view, we might say that while manipulation is usually wrong, it is not wrong at all in the terrorist scenario. On this view, not only is Irving’s manipulation of Terrorist Tonya not wrong on balance, but there is not even any moral reason for him to choose a non-manipulative method of getting Tonya to reveal the bomb’s location if one is available.

A more complex—but, perhaps, ultimately more plausible—view would combine the prima facie and pro tanto approaches. Such a view would hold that manipulation is prima facie wrong, but that when it is wrong, the wrongness is pro tanto rather than absolute. On this view, there are situations in which the presumption against manipulation is defeated and manipulation is not even pro tanto wrong. For example, it seems reasonable to think that certain forms of manipulation are not wrong at all in certain contexts, such as playing on the emotions in drama, misdirection and other trickery in games and athletic contests, and so on. In these cases, the prima facie wrongness of manipulation is defeated, so that it is not wrong at all. But when the prima facie wrongness of manipulation is not defeated, its wrongness is still only pro tanto, so that it may be outweighed by countervailing considerations. On this combined view, some instances of manipulation are not wrong at all, while others are pro tanto wrong; of the latter group, some remain wrong on balance, while others have their wrongness outweighed by other factors, such as the unavailability of any less wrongful means of preventing some great harm. A view along these lines has been defended by Marcia Baron (2014: 116–17). Although this view is far less absolute than the hardline view, it retains the claim that there is always a presumption that manipulation is immoral, though this presumption is sometimes defeated and sometimes outweighed.

The idea that manipulation is presumptively immoral—that is, morally wrong except in situations where its wrongness is defeated or outweighed—is both natural and common. But it is not without challenges. The most straightforward way to reject the claim that manipulation is presumptively wrong would be to define it broadly enough to include influences that do not seem at all morally problematic. The more expansively we define the term “manipulation,” the less plausible it may be to assume that it is even presumptively immoral. Thus, we might arrive at a very broad, morally neutral account of manipulation, according to which whether a given instance of manipulation is immoral will always depend on the facts of the situation. Clearly there are non-moralized notions of manipulation. When we speak of a scientist manipulating variables in an experiment, or a pilot manipulating the plane’s controls, our use of the term is devoid of any hint of moral opprobrium. In the social sciences, we can find cases of the term “manipulation” being used in a morally neutral way even when another person is the target of manipulation. For example, several papers by the evolutionary psychologist David M. Buss and colleagues use the term “manipulation” more or less as a synonym for “influence” in their discussions of how humans influence the behavior of other humans (D.M. Buss 1992; D.M. Buss et al. 1987).

In a recent book, Shlomo Cohen (Cohen 2025) takes a similar approach. He argues that “manipulation is … not even typically bad” (Cohen 2025: 125). Instead, it only seems bad because the most extreme examples are bad. As we noted earlier (see section 2.4), Cohen denies that there is a sharp line between manipulation and non-manipulative influence. Although his view is not as expansive as Buss’s, it does count as manipulation many cases of influence that seem morally innocuous. For example, Cohen counts it as manipulation to use non-rational influences to quell someone’s insecurities so as to facilitate social interactions. More generally, Cohen counts as manipulation many influences that ameliorate social awkwardness, miscommunication, and other forms of “social friction.” Because manipulation’s role as a “social lubricant” is “so integral to and important for the success of human relations and social cooperation,” Cohen claims that it is “implausible to view manipulation as bad at its core” (Cohen 2026: 6).

The concept of manipulation is probably fuzzy enough that it is neither incoherent nor clearly incorrect to define it broadly enough to include influences that do not seem morally problematic. Indeed, for certain purposes, such as scientific studies of how organisms affect each other’s behavior, a morally neutral term may be more appropriate than one with a negative moral connotation. But a morally neutral definition does not seem to capture everything we typically mean when we use the term “manipulation” in ordinary conversation. Typically, when we call an influence “manipulation,” we do so in part to cast it in a morally negative light. Thus, while a morally neutral definition of “manipulation” might be appropriate for certain scientific purposes, for other purposes, such as picking out morally disreputable forms of influence, a definition that preserves the term’s negative moral connotations may be preferable. But even if we adopt a morally neutral definition, the evaluation question remains. It simply transforms into the question of why wrongful instances of manipulation are wrong.

3.2 Manipulation and Harm

Perhaps the most obvious explanation for manipulation’s wrongfulness (when it is wrong) is the harm it does. Manipulation is commonly used aggressively, as a way to harm the manipulator’s target, typically for the manipulator’s benefit. The harmfulness of manipulation seems especially salient in manipulative relationships, where manipulation may lead to subordination and even abuse. Less serious economic harms might be cited as a wrong-making feature of manipulative advertising, and there has been some discussion of how manipulation might lead targets to enter into exploitative contracts. Systematic political manipulation may weaken democratic institutions and perhaps even lead to tyranny.

But not all instances of manipulation harm their victims. In fact, manipulation sometimes benefits its target. If the harm to the victim is the only wrong-making feature of manipulation, then paternalistic or beneficent manipulation could never be even pro tanto wrong. But this claim strikes most people as implausible. To see this, consider that the debate about whether paternalistic nudges are wrongfully manipulative is not settled simply by pointing out that they benefit their targets. The fact that it seems possible for an act to be wrongfully manipulative, even though it benefits (and is intended to benefit) the target, presumably explains why there are few, if any, defenses of the claim that manipulation is wrong only when and because it harms the target. Nevertheless, it seems plausible to hold that when manipulation does harm its target, this harm adds to the wrongness of the manipulative behavior.

3.3 Manipulation and Autonomy

Another natural way to account for the wrongness of manipulation would be to claim that it violates, undermines, or is otherwise antithetical to the target’s personal autonomy. Manipulation, by definition, influences decision-making by means that—unlike rational persuasion—do not seem to be autonomy-preserving. Thus, it is natural to regard it as interfering with autonomous decision-making. The idea that manipulation is wrong because it undermines autonomous choice is implicit in discussions of manipulation as a potential invalidator of consent. But even outside of discussions of autonomous consent, the claim that manipulation is immoral because it undermines autonomy is commonly made (and perhaps even more commonly assumed).

However, there are reasons for caution about tying the moral status of manipulation too tightly to its effects on autonomy. One can imagine cases where it is not obvious that manipulation undermines autonomy. One can even imagine cases where manipulation might enhance the target’s overall autonomy. For example, a teacher might manipulate a student into taking a class which ultimately enhances her autonomy by opening new career options, improving her skills of critical self-reflection, etc. We might also imagine cases where manipulation is used to support the target’s autonomous choice. Suppose that Tonya has autonomously decided to leave an abusive partner, but that she is now tempted to go back. If Irving resorts to a manipulative tactic designed to keep her from backsliding on her autonomous choice to leave her abuser, then his action might seem less like undermining Tonya’s autonomy and more like supporting it.

One might respond that these examples do not undermine the claim that manipulation is wrong when and because it undermines autonomy because these autonomy-enhancing instances of manipulation are not wrong. However, this response faces a complication: Consider the case where Irving manipulates Tonya into resisting the temptation to backslide on her resolution to leave her abusive partner. It seems plausible to say that Irving’s manipulation in this case is not wrong on balance. But it also seems plausible to say that it was nevertheless pro tanto wrong, since it seems plausible to think that it would have been morally preferable for Irving to find some non-manipulative way to help Tonya avoid backsliding. But this judgment seems inconsistent with the claim that manipulation is wrong only when and because it undermines autonomy. Of course, it is open to defenders of the autonomy account of the wrongness of manipulation to bite the bullet here and deny that autonomy-enhancing manipulation is even pro tanto immoral.

Alternatively—and perhaps more plausibly—the defender of the autonomy account of the wrongness of manipulation might concede that Irving’s autonomy-enhancing manipulation of Tonya is pro tanto wrong. But she might explain this by claiming that while the manipulation is autonomy-enhancing overall, it nevertheless undermines Tonya’s autonomy in the short term. The fact that Irving’s manipulation undermines Tonya’s autonomy temporarily explains why it is pro tanto immoral—and why it would be morally better for Irving to find a non-manipulative way to help Tonya avoid backsliding. But the fact that the manipulation enhances Tonya’s autonomy overall explains why it is not immoral on balance. Of course, this strategy will not appeal to those who hold that it is wrong to undermine a person’s autonomy even when doing so enhances that same person’s overall autonomy.

A more significant threat to the link between manipulation and autonomy appears in an influential paper by Sarah Buss. She argues that “when we are obligated to refrain from manipulation or deceiving one another, this has relatively little to do with the value of autonomy” (S. Buss 2005: 208). Buss’s argument has two parts. First, she claims that manipulation does not, in fact, deprive its victim of the ability to make choices; indeed, it typically presupposes that the target will make her own choice. But if the manipulation does not take away the target’s choice, Buss maintains, it does not undermine her autonomy. (For a similar argument, see Long 2014). Second, Buss argues that it is false to claim that an autonomous agent would rationally reject being subjected to manipulative influences. To support this claim, Buss argues that manipulation and deception are “pervasive forms of human interaction which are often quite benign and even valuable” (S. Buss 2005: 224). Her most notable example is the cultivation of romantic love, which often involves—and may even require—significant amounts of behavior that is aptly described as manipulation.

Defenders of the link between autonomy and the wrongness of manipulation are not without potential replies to Buss’s intriguing argument. For one thing, it seems possible to craft a notion of autonomy according to which having false information (or other faulty mental states) or being subjected to pressure (even when it does not rise to the level of coercion) compromise a person’s autonomy. Even though false beliefs about how to achieve one’s ends may not compromise one’s authentic values or one’s powers of practical reasoning, they do seem to compromise one’s ability to achieve one’s autonomously-chosen ends, and it is plausible to regard this as a diminishment of (some form of) autonomy. Moreover, the defender of the link between autonomy and the wrongness of manipulation might simply deny that the forms of manipulation to which an autonomous agent would consent (for example, those required by romantic love) are wrongful cases of manipulation.

3.4 Manipulation and Treating Persons as Things

Several accounts of manipulation tie its moral status to the fact that it influences behavior by methods that seem analogous to how one might operate a tool or a device. On this view, manipulation involves treating the target as a device to be operated rather than an agent to be reasoned with. As Claudia Mills puts it,

a manipulator is interested in reasons not as logical justifiers but as causal levers. For the manipulator, reasons are tools, and a bad reason can work as well as, or better than, a good one. (Mills 1995: 100–101)

The point here is that a manipulator treats his target not as a fellow rational agent, for that would require giving good reasons for doing as the manipulator proposes. Instead, the manipulator treats his target as a being whose behavior is to be elicited by pressing the most effective “causal levers.”

Of course, the idea that treating a person as a mere object is immoral is a prominent feature of Kant’s account of respect for persons (see the entry on respect). Thus, it would be natural to appeal to Kantian ideas to help elaborate the idea that manipulation is wrong because of the way that it treats its target. As Thomas E. Hill writes,

The idea that one should try to reason with others rather than to manipulate them by nonrational techniques is manifest in Kant’s discussion of the duty to respect others. (Hill 1980: 96)

Although Kant’s moral philosophy is a natural place to look for the idea that the wrongfulness of manipulation derives from a failure to treat the target as a person, there are potential drawbacks to tying the account too tightly to Kant. For Kant’s notion of rational agency appears to be of the hyper-cognitive, hyper-intellectual variety. Hence, if it is unethical to fail to treat someone as that kind of rational agent, we might be pushed toward the conclusion that the only acceptable basis for human interaction is the kind of coldly intellectual rational persuasion that excludes any appeal to emotions. But as we saw earlier, there are good reasons for regarding such a conclusion as implausible.

In a recent paper, Massimo Renzo offers a more subtle account of how manipulation violates the Kantian prohibition against treating a person as a mere means. Renzo writes that

When we are manipulated, our practical agency is coopted by the manipulator and turned against itself. … in order to induce us to pursue the ends of the manipulator.... [Thus,] manipulation involves a special form of using someone as a means.... [I]t involves using someone’s capacity to exercise their practical agency to serve the ends of the manipulator. (Renzo 2025b: 196–197)

Thus, on Renzo’s view, it is crucial that manipulation does not bypass the target’s practical agency: “when we are manipulated, we do retain our capacity to respond to our reasons for action —that capacity is not extinguished, but exploited by manipulators, the way in which we do that is put at the service of the realization of the ends of the manipulator” (Renzo 2025b: 197). In other words, the manipulator arranges things so that the manipulee’s own rational deliberation plays a crucial role in the manipulator’s plan. This makes manipulation an example par excellence of a violation of Kant’s prohibition of treating someone’s humanity as a mere means. It is the manipulee’s own rational agency (which, on Kant’s view, is central to humanity) that the manipulator uses as a means to advance the manipulator’s ends.

One might worry that such a view would not handle cases of paternalistic manipulation, such as the described above where Irving manipulates Tonya into resisting the temptation to backslide on her resolution to leave her abusive partner. Here the manipulation is designed not to further the manipulator’s ends, but those of the target herself. Renzo argues that this also applies to paternalistic manipulation:

When I manipulate you to ensure that you achieve a certain goal you want to pursue, I’m treating your happiness as my own end, but I am not treating you as a rational agent free to choose whether to pursue your own ends and how. I am still imposing my end on you. It’s just that in this case my end is ensuring that you get to achieve the goal you are pursuing. (Renzo 2025b: 198)

3.5 Other Suggestions

Although harm, autonomy, and treating persons as things are the most prominent suggestions about what makes manipulation wrong when it is wrong, one can find other suggestions in the literature. For example, Marcia Baron’s virtue-theoretic account of manipulativeness suggests that we might account for what is wrong about manipulation in terms of the character of the manipulator (Baron 2003). Patricia Greenspan suggests that when manipulation is immoral, it is because it violates the terms of the relationship between the manipulator and his target—terms that will vary according to the nature of the relationship between them (Greenspan 2003). Such a view suggests—plausibly—that the moral status of a given instance of manipulation will depend at least in part on the nature of the relationship between the influencer and the target of the influence.

More recently, Robert Noggle (2025) has argued that the defining feature of manipulation is that it involves inducing mistakes, so that manipulation inherits its moral status from the normative status of mistakes; on this view, manipulation is bad because mistakes are bad. One potential worry about this view is whether it captures the sense that manipulation is often experienced as a violation; one might wonder whether tracing the badness of manipulation to the badness of a mistake does justice to this experience. More generally, one might question whether mistakes have the right sort of badness to explain why (wrongful) manipulation is bad (Cohen forthcoming).

A final, more radical view, would be that no feature of manipulation itself makes wrongful instances of it wrong. In a provocative paper, Sophie Gibert (2023) argues that manipulation is not wrong qua manipulation. Instead, she argues, when manipulation is wrong, it is not wrong because it is manipulation, but because it infringes some independent right. Thus, she denies that manipulation is wrong because of something about manipulation itself, such as its negative effects on the target’s deliberation. Gibert calls her claim the “Reductive View,” since it claims that “the wrong of wrongful manipulation is nothing over and above the wrong of infringing other rights” (Gibert 2023: 334). One challenge for this view is to show that all clearly wrongful cases of manipulation do, in fact, violate some right. Moreover, to avoid being ad hoc, the rights involved should be ones that we have independent reason to think exist (see Renzo 2025a for additional critical discussion of Gibert’s view).

4. Further Issues

In addition to answering the identification and evaluation questions, a complete theory of manipulation should address several further issues.

4.1 Manipulating Persons versus Manipulating Situations

Discussions of manipulation often distinguish between cases where the manipulator influences his target directly, and cases where the manipulator influences the target’s behavior by arranging the target’s environment in ways that induce her to act one way rather than another. Consider Joel Rudinow’s example of a malingerer who manipulates a psychiatrist into admitting him to the psychiatric ward (Rudinow 1978). He does this by fooling a police officer into thinking he is about to commit suicide. The police officer brings him to the ward, reports that he is suicidal, and requests that he be admitted. Although the psychiatrist is not fooled, her hospital’s rules force her to admit the malingerer at the police officer’s request. It seems clear that the malingerer has manipulated the police officer by tricking him into adopting a faulty belief. But the psychiatrist, while not falling for the feigned suicide attempt and thus not adopting any faulty beliefs, is nevertheless induced to do what she did not want to do. Although it seems correct to say that the psychiatrist was manipulated, this form of manipulation seems different from what was done to the police officer. By feigning a suicide attempt, the malingerer has tampered with the police officer’s beliefs. But he has maneuvered the psychiatrist into admitting him, not by tampering with her psychological states, but rather by “gaming the system,” as we might say.

In his book, The Art of Political Manipulation (Riker 1986), the political scientist William Riker calls the latter form of manipulation “heresthetic,” and characterizes it as “structuring the world so you can win” (1986: ix). His focus is on political tactics like gerrymandering, poison pill amendments, and strategic voting, all of which are often described as manipulation, and all of which seem more like what Rudinow’s malingerer does to the psychiatrist than what he does to the police officer.

In a similar way, the sociologists Donald Warwick and Herbert Kelman distinguish between “environmental” and “psychic” manipulation (Warwick & Kelman 1973). Their work influenced Faden, Beauchamp, and King’s seminal philosophical account of manipulation, which makes a similar distinction (Faden, Beauchamp, & King 1986: 355–68). Anne Barnhill distinguishes between manipulation that “changes the options available to the person or changes the situation she’s in, and thereby changes her attitudes” on the one hand, and manipulation that “changes a person’s attitudes directly without changing the options available to her or the surrounding situation” on the other (Barnhill 2014: 53). Drawing a similar distinction, Claudia Mills writes

If A wants to get B to do act x, there are two general strategies that A might undertake. A might change, or propose to change, the external or objective features of B’s choice situation; or alternatively, A might try to alter certain internal or subjective features of B’s choice situation. While some writers might call both strategies manipulative, at least in certain circumstances, I prefer to reserve the label manipulation for a subset of morally problematic actions falling in the second category. (Mills 1995: 97)

Although Rudinow’s case provides a clear contrast between what we might call psychological manipulation and situational manipulation, this distinction is not always so clear. Consider tactic 9 above, where Irving threatens to withdraw his friendship if Tonya does not do as Irving wishes. Is this psychological manipulation, or situational manipulation? Defining situational manipulation as changing the objective features of the situation would classify it as situational manipulation, since Irving changes Tonya’s choice situation so that doing Y and retaining Irving’s friendship is no longer an option. But how is this tactic any less of a direct interference with Tonya’s decision than if Irving had engaged in some form of deception? Why would it be more like what the malingerer does to the police officer than what he does to the psychiatrist?

This is not to deny that there is a difference between psychological and situational manipulation. Instead, it is to ask what that difference is, and why it might matter. Presumably, the distinction is meant to differentiate between tactics that affect a target’s behavior by directly tampering with her psychology and those that do not. But if this is the distinction, then it seems plausible to think that Irving’s use of emotional blackmail is at least as direct a tampering with Tonya’s psychology as, say, Iago’s dropping of the handkerchief in a location where it will trick Othello into becoming inappropriately suspicious. Yet criteria like those proposed by Mills seem to imply that these two forms of manipulation are on opposite sides of that distinction.

Nevertheless, there does seem something importantly different between what the malingerer in Rudinow’s example does to the police officer and what he does to the psychiatrist. But much work remains to be done to provide a well-motivated account of that difference. Such an account should not only get the intuitively right answers in cases of direct pressure (like emotional blackmail) and indirect deception (like Iago’s dropping the handkerchief), but it should also explain whether and why the distinction makes a moral difference.

4.2 Manipulation and Intent

Some views of manipulation claim, or at least suggest, that manipulation only occurs when the influencer has certain intentions—such as the intention to lead the target astray. Marcia Baron and Kate Manne offer compelling reasons to think that such requirements are too strong. Baron argues that manipulation can occur even if the manipulator only has

a combination of intent and recklessness: the aim of getting the other person to do what one wants, together with recklessness in the way that one goes about reaching that goal. (Baron 2014: 103)

Baron goes on to argue that the manipulator need not be aware that she has that intention (Baron 2014, 101). To explore the question of what level of intent must be present for manipulation to occur, Manne offers the example of Joan, who gives extravagant gifts to relatives who pay her less attention than (she thinks) they should (Manne 2014, 225). Manne tells Joan’s story in such a way that it seems plausible to say both that Joan’s gift-giving is a manipulative attempt to make her relatives feel guilty, and that Joan does not consciously intend to make her relatives feel guilty. If Manne’s description of her example is correct, then it seems that Joan can manipulate her relatives into feeling guilty without having any conscious intention of making them feel guilty. (Later, Manne goes even farther, suggesting that “people can even behave manipulatively despite consciously intending not to” (2014: 235)) Of course, those who hold that manipulation requires more conscious intention than Manne allows might simply deny that Joan’s behavior is manipulative. Nevertheless, the arguments offered by Baron and Manne raise important questions about the level of conscious intentionality required for an action to be manipulative.

The question of what sort of intention is required for an act to count as manipulative has practical implications for assessing the behavior of children, who sometimes behave in ways that seem aptly described as manipulative even when they are too young to have the complicated intentions that some theories of manipulation might require. Similar worries arise for assessing the behavior of people for whom manipulativeness has become a habit, or a part of their personalities. Indeed, certain personality disorders—such as borderline personality disorder and antisocial personality disorder—are often characterized by manipulativeness, as is the so-called Machiavellian personality type (Christie & Geis 1970). As professor of psychiatric nursing Len Bowers writes,

the manipulative behaviour of some personality-disordered (PD) patients is consistent and frequent. It is an integral part of their interpersonal style, a part of the very disorder itself. (Bowers 2003: 329; see also Potter 2006)

In such cases, one wonders what level of intentionality lies behind behavior that we would otherwise think of as manipulative. Even if we are inclined to regard childhood or certain personality disorders as factors that mitigate the blameworthiness of manipulative behavior, it would seem counterintuitive for a theory of manipulation to say that children and persons with personality disorders are incapable of acting manipulatively.

The question of what kind of intent, if any, is necessary for an influence to count as manipulation has become increasingly important with the rise of online and other technological influences. While some technologies can be seen as extensions or embodiments of their designer’s manipulative intentions, as technological systems become more autonomous, their activities may develop in ways that their designers neither intended nor even foresaw.

Suppose that an algorithm is designed to try out various kinds of content, user interfaces, notifications, and other variations of a digital platform’s user interface and select those that increase the levels of some targeted behavior (such as voting for a certain candidate, purchasing certain products, or just maintaining engagement with the platform). It seems plausible that such an algorithm could end up selecting elements of the user interface that exert influences that, had they been chosen deliberately by a human, we would label as manipulation. Should we say that the algorithm, which lacks the kind of intent that a human might have, nevertheless manipulates users? Such questions are even more relevant once we add artificial intelligence to the system: It seems more than plausible that such systems, given instructions to influence the humans with whom they interact, will find ways of doing so that we would otherwise count as manipulation. Should we count influences produced by systems like these as manipulation?

Several answers seem possible. First, we could simply deny that manipulation requires any intention or state of mind. Second, we could go in the opposite direction and maintain that manipulation does require intent, and conclude that technological influence of these sorts are not manipulation. Many will find both of these answers unappealing. A third possibility is to retain the claim that manipulation par excellence requires intent, but that technologies can manipulate in a looser sense (Pepp et al. 2022), or that they exert “manipulation-like” influences (Nyholm 2022). A fourth possibility would be to define manipulation in terms of a lack of concern with how one’s influence operates, and thus see technological manipulation as genuine manipulation if and to the extent that it operates in ways that do not embody or display such a concern (Klenk 2022). A related possibilty would be to trace the manipulativeness of the algorithm back to the mental state of the designer, but to loosen the intent requirement on the designer. Thus, we might say that an alogrithm is maniplative even if it was not designed to be so, simply when and because the designer did not take sufficient care to ensure that it would avoid manipulative ways of interacting with users.

4.3 Manipulation, Vulnerability, and Oppression

The idea that manipulation can be a tool for the powerful to oppress the less powerful is not new, even if the term “manipulation” has not always been used to express it. Marxian notions of ideology and false consciousness as mechanisms that facilitate the exploitation of workers by capital clearly resemble the concept of manipulation as it is being used here. (Allen Wood explores some of these connections in Wood 2014.) More recently, the concept of “gaslighting” has become a common feature of feminist theorizing about how the patriarchy manipulates women into doubting their own judgments about reality. On a smaller scale, a bevy of self-help books focus on how manipulative tactics can be used to create and maintain subordination within relationships (Braiker 2004; Simon 2010; Kole 2016).

A relative lack of socio-political power is almost certainly one source of vulnerability to manipulation. But there are likely others as well. The trickery model of manipulation suggests that people who are less intellectually sophisticated are especially vulnerable to trickery and therefore to manipulation. The pressure model suggests that financial, social, and emotional desperation may make one especially vulnerable to pressures created by threats to worsen an already tenuous situation. Moreover, some forms of manipulation, like so-called “negging” and gaslighting may work to increase the target’s vulnerability to further manipulation.

However, it may also be true that manipulation is a tempting tool for use by the vulnerable against the powerful. As Patricia Greenspan notes,

manipulation is often recommended as a strategy particularly for women, or simply is treated as characteristic of women, at least in a world where women cannot act openly to achieve their ends. A further argument for manipulation in these cases appeals to the limits on what is possible in a position of subordination. (Greenspan 2003: 156)

Similarly, Len Bowers observes that

it is possible to interpret manipulation as a normal response to incarceration, rather than as being a pathological style of behavior, … manipulative strategies may be viewed as a low-key way of fighting back at a system which has deprived the prisoner of normal freedom. (Bowers 2003: 330)

Finally, it seems likely that one reason why children often resort to manipulative tactics is that they often lack any other (or any other equally effective) way to get what they want.

It is also worth noting that the idea that manipulation undermines autonomous choice might itself be used, somewhat paradoxically, to undermine autonomous choice, especially among the non-elite. This point comes out forcefully in a comment by Sarah Skwire (2015, Other Internet Resources) on George Akerlof and Robert Shiller’s book, Phishing for Phools (Akerlof & Shiller 2015). Akerlof and Shiller discuss a number of advertising, sales, and marketing practices that they deem manipulative. Skwire suggests that the reason why Akerlof and Shiller call these practices manipulative is that consumers subjected to them make choices that Akerlof and Shiller think are sufficiently irrational that they would only be made under the influence of manipulation. Skwire writes that this approach to detecting manipulation demonstrates “contempt for the decisions made by people who are poorer and from a lower social class than the authors” (Skwire 2015, Other Internet Resources). In short, she suggests that Akerlof and Shiller are too quick to suspect manipulation in cases where people make different decisions from the ones they think best. Whether or not we agree with Skwire’s criticisms of Akerlof and Shiller, her point serves as a cautionary one: Even if we accept that manipulation undermines autonomous choice, we must be careful not to use that as a reason to suspect that people who make different choices from what we think are best must therefore be victims of manipulation. It would be ironic—and unjust—to use the idea that manipulation is a wrongful interference with autonomy as a weapon to delegitimize the autonomous choices of people with whom we disagree or whose situations, needs, and values we do not understand.

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