1. Most of this discussion, like many discussions in political philosophy, takes the situation in industrialized countries of the Global North as given. This entry presents this discussion, but without claiming universality for it. More dialogue with researchers from the Global South, about their understanding of economic institutions and practices and the potentials for democratization, is a desideratum for future research (see also §5.3).

2. Here one also comes to the underlying question of whether monetary policy could be democratized, instead of being delegated to experts in central banks, as is currently mostly the case. See §5.1 of the entry on the philosophy of money and finance

3. Wurm et al. (2024) provide a case study of a holocratic organization, showing that despite claims to equal participation, power remains distributed unequally. Of course, this is just one case, but it does raise questions about how far democratic structures can go in reducing power imbalances. More research is needed in this area.

4. A related question that can be raised with regard to economic democracy is whether it could be realized within one country, and if so, what kind of economic relations it should have with other countries (see e.g. Schweickart 2011, 85–87, for a discussion). For reasons of scope, and because this discussion is not specific to economic democracy but concerns all proposals for changing the economic system, I omit it here.

5. Most mainstream economic theorizing has denied that there exist power relations within companies, see notably Alchian and Demsetz 1972. For a critical discussion see e.g. Bowles and Gintis 1992 or Ciepley 2004. For reasons of space, I here cannot engage in a detailed discussion about the nature of companies, and specifically corporations (but see §3.2 above).

6. Moreover, the workplace is also a space where individuals meet others across political partisan lines and across many other demographic features (e.g. religion, ethnic background, etc.) (Estlund 2003). The reason is that people typically cannot pick their colleagues completely freely, and thus meet others whom they might not meet in their private and associational life. However, this argument is less convincing if workplaces are more and more “fissured” (Weil 2014) and therefore often split along socioeconomic lines (Herzog 2025).

7. An example is the “Diesel scandal” in which Volkswagen – a partly publicly owned company with strong co-determination – used a manipulative software to bring cars to the market that fulfilled emission criteria only in test stands. Internal criticism of these practices was quelled in a top-down culture of fear, without voice for workers who wanted to prevent the scandal and the ensuing harm to the company (see e.g. Clot et al., 2024, 171–173).

8. The relation between the cooperative movement and labor unions has sometimes been indifferent or even hostile, as they were pursuing different strategies (worker ownership vs. worker control). In today’s situation, however, there has been a rapprochement: see e.g. Dirnbach 2017.

9. There is also a line of reasoning that connects “meaningful work” to workplace democracy, arguing that the former requires the latter (see notably Yeoman 2014). Meaningful work, however, is a more controversial ideal, therefore I have not discussed this line in this entry.