Economic Democracy

First published Thu May 14, 2026

“Economic democracy” describes the idea that democratic principles should apply not only to the political realm, but also to the economic realm (e.g. Cohen 1989; Cumbers 2020; Dahl 1985; Ellerman 1992; 2009; 2021; Kelly 2019; Malleson 2014; O’Neill 2008; Schweickart 2011). It goes beyond the idea of the “primacy of democracy” (Berman 2006), according to which democratic politics should set the rules for the economy. Instead, it aims at embedding democratic principles, and especially the equal moral standing of all members of society, also within the institutions of the economy, especially the workplace. As such, it can be understood as part of a wider understanding of democracy that sees it as a “way of life” (Dewey 1939 [1988]; Frega 2020).

In recent years, there has been renewed interest in the topic of economic democracy, and in particular workplace democracy (e.g. Anderson 2017; Honneth 2024; Herzog 2018, 2022; Frega et al. 2019; McGaughey 2024).[1] One of the reasons is that political democracy is under pressure in many countries, and economic democracy is seen as a strategy for strengthening it (e.g. Gould 2019). With high levels of material inequality, the tensions between democratic and capitalist logics are rising: those who are economically successful can assemble more and more power, including political power, thereby undermining the “fair value of the political liberties” of other citizens (Rawls 1999, 197). In addition, there are the environmental problems caused by the current economic system, in particular climate change. This makes it necessary to fundamentally rethink the purpose of economic activities and the responsibility for respecting planetary boundaries (Rockström et al. 2009). “Economic democracy” as a theoretical approach suggests a new paradigm for the economy, a “democratic economy.” It is not a mere theoretical blueprint, but can build on existing institutions, e.g. co-determined firms, in which worker representatives have seats on company boards, or worker cooperatives.

This entry will, after a short historical contextualization and explication of core ideas (§1), focus on intrinsic and instrumental arguments for economic democracy (§2). This is followed by a discussion of several objections, including, prominently, the objection from inefficiency (§3). As the discussion will show, the weighing of arguments for and against economic democracy depends not only on normative principles, but also on the details of institutional design and on assumptions about what is feasible in practice. Therefore, the entry then zooms in onto workplace democracy, discussing possible institutional forms but also presenting arguments for why democratizing workplaces on their own might be insufficient (§4). The final section (§5) provides a short overview of empirical research and points to open lines of further research.

1. Historical context and core ideas

1.1 Historical context

The history of ideas about economic democracy goes back at least to the 19th century (see e.g. Cumbers 2020, chap. I). During the industrial revolution, work in large companies, which made use of economies of scale, became the norm, with workers submitting to the authority of company owners and managers (Anderson 2017, chap. 1). These companies often created gruesome and exploitative working conditions, without any counterpower that would protect workers’ rights. There were many attempts, in theory and in practice, to come up with more worker-friendly economic institutions, reaching from the cooperative movement to the creation of labor unions and left-wing political parties.

One example is Proudhon who, already in the 1840s, called for “leaders, instructors, superintendents” in industry to be “chosen from the laborers by the laborers themselves” (Proudhon 1840, §6), a principle that was realized in worker cooperatives. Worker cooperatives were particularly strong in France, while the UK saw many consumer cooperatives, and Germany cooperative banks – efforts that led to the joint establishment of the International Co-Operative Alliance in 1895 (Cornforth 1992, 186-188). Left-wing political parties were started in many countries, splitting, in the second half of the 19th century, into reform-oriented social democratic parties and revolution-oriented socialist parties. The First International, as an international network, was founded in 1864 and held its first congress in 1866, followed by the Second International in 1889.

The term “industrial democracy” was introduced in the late 19th century in the UK (Webb and Webb 1897), to denote the call for a democratic organization of unions and the introduction of collective bargaining, i.e. the right of unions to negotiate over wages and working conditions for all workers in a company or industry. Referring to the English term, the term “Wirtschaftsdemokratie” (“economic democracy”) was used in the German union movement in the early decades of the 20th century, where it was considerably broadened. It described a program for putting monopolistic firms under public control, strengthening workers’ voices in all companies through works councils and co-determination, but also supporting workers through workers’ banks and consumer cooperatives and by giving their representatives a greater role in political bodies (Napthali 1928; for discussion see e.g. Müller-Jentsch 2008; Weinzen 1992).

In the 20th century, these ideas fared differently in different countries. Some European countries went quite far in introducing mechanisms of co-determination (see e.g. the entries on different countries in Széll 1992). Since the 1980s, however, the turn towards free-market politics came with an attack on unions, especially in Anglophone countries, but also beyond. It weakened the interest in alternative forms of organizing economic activities, fostering a “there is no alternative” attitude. Unionization rates, like membership in mass organizations in general, declined in many countries. Insofar as the participation of workers, e.g. in self-governing teams, was an issue at all, it was considered from a perspective of employee motivation and efficiency (e.g. Pausch 2013), not as a broader program with connections to political democracy. Research interest in the topic, which was quite active in the 1970s (e.g. Pateman 1970), also declined.

In the 21st century, however, with rising inequality and urgent environmental issues, there has been renewed interest in the topic among philosophers and social scientists (e.g. Anderson 2017; Ferreras 2017; for an overview in philosophy see Frega et al. 2019; for perspectives from the social sciences see e.g. Cornell and Barenberg 2022). Recent survey data from the US show that there is high support for greater voice for workers, even if survey participants are prompted to consider possible efficiency losses (Mazumder and Yan 2024). As noted above, there is also growing interest among democratic theorists in how a more democratic economic system could help stabilize political democracy (e.g. Gould 2019).

1.2 Core Ideas

What, then, are the core ideas of economic democracy in the current debate? The overall question is which set of institutions can ensure, together, that it is not the owners of capital, or the anonymous forces of the market, but the democratic voices of all citizens that controls the economy. This implies the democratic setting of the rules of the economic system. It is often combined with a call for the reduction of inequality, from above and from below, because both poverty and riches, beyond a certain point, contradict the democratic principle of moral equality and can undermine equal participation in the democratic process. These are points that “economic democracy” shares with “social democracy,” which emphasizes the “primacy of politics” (e.g. Berman 2006). But whereas social democracy mostly relies on legislation and redistributive taxation, economic democracy embraces a broader set of institutional strategies, which are meant to introduce democratic control into the economic system itself, at various levels.

A core element of economic democracy is democratic control of the work process by workers themselves. It can take different forms, which will be discussed in detail below (§5.1). A second set of issues concerns democratic control over the financial system, to prevent private investment decisions from undercutting democratic decision-making (e.g. Schweickart 2011, 61-66; Cohen 1989, 28, 40).[2] A third, related issue concerns democratic control over the means of production. Some authors here call for an abolition of private property in the means of production (e.g. Vrousalis 2019). Others suggest a mix of public and private forms of ownership (e.g. Cumbers 2020; for an analysis of different ownership models for firms see also Hansman 1996), with private property being circumscribed by democratic laws and regulation. Fourthly, also related, there is discussion about the role of markets. All writers in the tradition of economic democracy agree that markets need to be put under democratic political control. But while some (e.g. Schweickart 2011) see them as useful instruments of coordination and as providing certain freedoms, others see them as necessary evil, at best, and are interested in new forms of (full or partial) democratic planning (e.g. Albert and Hahnel 1991; Hahnel 2021; Hebenton and O’Neill 2024; on the intellectual history of the council movement see Muldoon 2020). Some point to the potential of digital technologies for this purpose (e.g. Phillips and Rozworski 2019).

It is also worth briefly commenting on the notion of “democracy” in “economic democracy.” Many authors rely on a deliberative understanding of democracy, in which legitimacy is created by the public exchange of arguments and the search for reasonable compromise (e.g. Cohen 1989; Felicetti 2018). Some take inspiration from neorepublicanism and its focus on non-domination (e.g. Pettit 1997), which leads to an understanding of economic democracy as ensuring non-domination. Some also follow a participatory model, in which active participation of citizens – not only in public deliberation and in voting, but in decision-making at various levels – is a crucial element (e.g. Gould 1988; 2019; Pateman 1970; 2012). However, antagonistic elements – e.g. the collective organizing of workers to resist one-sided power grabs – are also part of the debate (e.g. Bagg 2024, chap. 10). Some authors have also suggested introducing lottocratic elements in the economic system, i.e. using the instrument of randomly selected citizen assemblies (or, within companies, worker assemblies, e.g. Pek 2021). Importantly, however, economic democracy concerns not only formal institutional structures, but also the social norms that govern social interactions, at the workplace and beyond (e.g. Frega 2020).

2. Arguments in favor of economic democracy

Discussion about economic democracy often starts from the “parallel case”: a parallel argument for holding power democratically to account in the political and in the economic sphere (e.g. Dahl 1985, chap. 4; Walzer 1983, 291–303). While some authors have defended this parallel case, others have rejected it, pointing to important differences between companies and states (for discussions, see e.g. Landemore and Ferreras 2016; González‐Ricoy 2014a; 2022). Instead of going into this discussion, I here explore the underlying reasons that might speak for the democratic governance of political and economic institutions. These can be divided into intrinsic and instrumental arguments for economic democracy.

2.1 Intrinsic arguments for economic democracy

A first set of arguments starts from the assumption that democracy is valuable in itself, and should be expanded to all spheres of life, unless there are strong countervailing reasons (candidates for the latter will be taken up in §4 below). The economy, from this perspective, is not a “private” sphere in the sense of, say, the pursuit of private hobbies but a “public” sphere in which individuals with different values and interests meet, regulated by public rules. The economy should be governed by the same principles – democratic governance within the confines of the rule of law – that govern the public sphere in a broader sense. The reasons for endorsing this view can differ depending on what view of democracy one has. From a liberal egalitarian perspective, democracy can be understood as expressing the equal moral standing of individuals, and as an instrument to protect inviolable individual rights (e.g. Christiano 2008) – a view that fits well with the deliberative approach taken by many economic democrats. From a neorepublican perspective, which understands freedom as non-domination, a key point is to protect individuals from the arbitrary power of others (e.g. Pettit 1997). Insofar as the economic system puts some individuals into positions of power over others, there need to be checks and balances and counterpower. Note, however, that this line of argument can also lead to the perspective of “workplace republicanism,” which limits workers’ voice to what is necessary for preventing domination (e.g. Hsieh 2005; 2008). In contrast, if one’s normative commitment is to notions such as autonomy or active participation in deliberation and decision-making, one would want to go further and endorse an active role for individuals in economic decision-making, in the workplace and elsewhere (for discussions see e.g. Gonzalez-Ricoy 2014b; Breen 2015).

2.2 Instrumental arguments for economic democracy

Instrumental arguments for economic democracy do not focus so much on the intrinsic value of democratizing the economic sphere (although they can also accept it), but rather on its effects. These effects can lie within the economic system themselves, e.g. greater distributive justice or overall well-being. But they can also lie outside of the economic system, concerning broader societal issues also in other social spheres.

A core line of argument, in this context, is the need to preserve social conditions under which political democracy remains stable. Such an argument can take the following form:

  1. Political democracy can be normatively justified (on various possible grounds, e.g., again, liberal, republican, or participatory) as the best available political system.
  2. Given (a), we have good reason to endorse measures that ensure that that political democracy remains stable over time.
  3. Economic democracy is needed for political democracy to remain stable over time.
  4. Therefore, we have good reason to endorse economic democracy.

Note that the crucial premise (c) is an empirical premise. As such, it needs to consider all available evidence of how different democratic systems – with different economic systems – have fared. As mentioned earlier, it is the current weakening of political democracy in many countries that has contributed to the renewed interest in economic democracy, speaking directly to premise (c).

An important version of this argument relates to the psychological underpinnings of political democracy. John Stuart Mill had described two psychological preconditions of democracy, namely an “active character” and “a sense of the common good,” and a democratic economy might be better at creating and maintaining those among citizens (Cohen 1989, 29; see also Satz 2023). Below, I will discuss a version of this argument – the so-called “spillover” argument (Pateman 1970, chap. 3; Mason 1982) – that applies this point specifically to democratic workplaces. An additional argument, which speaks to claims about a lack of interest and information among voters, is that workers might have more incentives, and better opportunities, to be informed about political issues if they are organized in unions and can actively participate in the governance of workplaces (O’Neill and White 2018; Christiano 2019).

However, economic democracy could also be justified along instrumental lines with regard to other normative goals. It might, for example, be seen as an instrument for ensuring that the economy does not exhaust planetary resources (e.g. Johanisova and Wolf 2012; Webb and Novkovic 2014). This argument is most plausible if one assumes that the environmental crisis is caused, specifically, by the power and profit-seeking of capitalist companies or the dynamics of unregulated markets (in contrast to being caused by, say, independently existing preferences for ever higher consumption in the population; see e.g. Foster 2023; Fraser 2023). A more democratic governance of the economic system might then, indeed, lower the pressure on planetary resources.

Like all instrumental arguments, this defense of economic democracy faces the question of whether it is a necessary instrument for achieving the goal in question, and whether there might also be other instruments available. The answers to these questions depend on which causal mechanisms one focuses on. For example, if one holds that the most important mechanism through which economic democracy would help stabilize political democracy is the reduction of inequality, then one might ask whether other strategies for reducing inequality, e.g. through taxation, might provide feasible (and maybe more desirable) alternatives. If one thinks that for saving political democracy, it is crucial that citizens have opportunities for participation, one might ask whether this requires participation in economic decision-making, or whether there could also be other “training grounds” for democracy, e.g. in civil society organizations such as non-governmental organizations or non-profit associations. In both cases, defenders of economic democracy need to respond with additional arguments for why their strategy is the most promising and/or the most feasible one. Attention to empirical evidence is crucial for weighing these arguments, which is one of the reasons why existing evidence is summarized in §5 below.

3. Arguments against economic democracy

Arguments against economic democracy can not only be found in explicit discussions that are critical of the concept, but also, implicitly, in many theories that simply do not make democratic values an issue (this is the case for large swaths of economic theory, but also of management studies, organizational theory, or economic sociology). Arguments against economic democracy can be separated into arguments from the logic of the economy, arguments from efficiency, and arguments from futility.

3.1 Arguments from the logic of the economy against economic democracy

A first set of arguments would reject the step, suggested by defenders of intrinsic arguments for economic democracy, of widening the organizing principle of democracy to other spheres of society, and specifically to the economy. One might hold, for example, that the economy is a sphere in which private property rights matter more than democratic participation. This leads to further questions about how to understand private property, and why it should be given such priority in the economic realm. If private property rights are understood as a kind of natural right, then no further justification is required. But such an understanding is not very plausible, especially given the complex forms of property in modern economies, where value is created in interdependent systems that also include the provision of public goods (e.g. Murphy and Nagel 2002). On the other hand, if one understands private property as justified in an instrumental way, as leading to good consequences, then one can ask in what ways exactly it is supposed to bring about these consequences, and whether these could still be achieved in a democratic economy.

Here, a second, related reason for rejecting the call for a democratization of the economy comes in: the claim that markets are the best instrument for efficiently allocating goods and services and thereby increasing overall welfare. As noted earlier, however, some economic democrats accept arguments in favor of markets and see well-regulated markets as part of a democratic economy; relatedly, they can also admit certain forms of private property (though many of them have different views about private property in capital, see e.g. Schweickart 2011, chap. 3). Thus, arguments based on the benefits of markets are not arguments against economic democracy per se, but rather against versions of it that do not give any role to markets. However, economic democrats can emphasize, in response, that even though we speak of “market economies,” many economic activities take place in the hierarchies of corporations, where individual freedom and dignity are much more directly at risk than in voluntary market interactions (e.g. Anderson 2017). This may explain the strong focus on workplace democracy in the recent debate (see §5.1 below), although critics hold that providing exit options from corporate hierarchies through flexible labor markets can attenuate the risks in this context as well (e.g. Cowen 2017, 110–112; Taylor 2017, 53–54).

A third type of argument against economic democracy focuses directly on hierarchies, holding that managerial authority, rather than democratic participation, is the more appropriate set of norms for workplaces. This argument can be understood in different ways: as an argument about the rights of company owners to rule over workers, based on ownership rights, or as an argument from efficiency (in the latter version, it will be discussed below). In the first reading, it assumes that those who own a company should have the right to manage it, and that workers need to submit to their authority. However, there are at least two problems with this argument. The first is that a major type of company – the modern corporation – is not “owned” by shareholders (even though this is widely assumed in public discourse). Rather, a corporation is a legal entity on its own, with a complex governance structure in which shareholders have certain rights, but not the same rights as the owners of, say, a family business (e.g. Ciepley 2013). The second is that even when there are direct property rights of company owners, it is not clear to what extent property rights, per se, can be the basis of authority over other human beings. As McMahon (1994, 15 and passim) has argued, if one lends a car to friends, one’s ownership does not, per se, give one full authority about everything they do. Rather, it is a matter of public law that corporate managers have power over employees (McMahon 1994; 2013). Understood in this way, the justification is, again, instrumental, referring to efficiency.

Thus, the various arguments that hold that democracy is the wrong logic for the economic realm lead to questions about why exactly that would be so, and whether the underlying reasons speak against economic democracy as such, or against certain versions of it. However, those who want to defend economic democracy can grant that there might be certain social realms in which the introduction of democratic practices would, indeed, not be appropriate after weighing all normative reasons. For example, it might be admitted that within small family businesses, introducing democratic accountability would have too many disadvantages, and risks of rights violations or power abuse must be mitigated in other ways. But this does not mean that the same conclusion holds for large-scale hierarchies, which are the bulk of workplaces in many Western countries. In any case, the question remains why it is that the economic sphere should follow the specific logic that is argued for. Often, the underlying reason is efficiency, which I discuss next.

3.2 Arguments from efficiency against economic democracy

Arguments against economic democracy can also refer to the claim that a democratic economy would be less efficient than a capitalist one (a comparative claim), or insufficiently efficient altogether (an absolute claim) (e.g. Cowen 2017). Efficiency is usually understood, in economic theories, as Pareto efficiency, which describes the avoidance of waste through the realization of all opportunities for mutual improvement. As such, it is not an end in itself, but rather a condition for how best to realize values that are ends in themselves (Le Grand 1990). When efficiency is mentioned, one needs to ask against which baseline it is measured (e.g. Anderson 2017, 143), and what gets included in its calculation, under which background conditions (Braun 2021).

But these conceptual points cannot sweep aside a deeper question that many people probably have in mind when they refer to “efficiency” as an argument against economic democracy: the question of whether a democratic economy would be sufficiently functional and create sufficient welfare. For example, can it avoid involuntary unemployment, does it ensure the production of goods and services that people actually want and need, and does it allow individuals to be productive in their jobs?

There are several reasons why one might think that a democratic economy might not deliver on these counts, mirroring some of the arguments discussed above about the need for accepting the “logic” of the economic system. For example, it might be said that insofar as economic democracy includes common or public ownership, there is a risk of a “tragedy of the commons” (Hardin 1968), with inefficient forms of overuse or neglect. In response, it might be said that there can be various forms of private, public, or shared ownership, following models of governance for “commons” that can avoid such problems (Ostrom 1990). It might also be said that insofar as economic democracy does not rely on markets, it might lead to inefficient outcomes. But as noted above, at least some economic democrats would want markets to be part of a democratic economy. Moreover, one might add that many real-life markets, in contrast to textbook models, are marred by “market failures,” for example because of externalities, that make them less efficient than their defenders hold. The standards of efficiency against which a democratic economy needs to be compared might thus be lower than one would assume if one started from an idealized model of markets.

When it comes to managerial decision-making, it might be questioned whether it is possible to efficiently run organizations in a democratic way. Critics of workplace democracy may have in mind the high costs (especially in terms of employee time) of deliberative meetings, but also the problem of how employees, with highly diverse preferences, might arrive at clear goals for organizations (e.g. Dow 2003, chap. 9). In response, several points can be made. One is that democracy need not always take the form of direct involvement of all workers; there are also elective forms in which workers elect their managers, who then have decision-making authority for a certain period. This can provide them with the authority that might be necessary for coordinating joint production processes (e.g. Kolodny 2017, 102–103).

A second point is that joint deliberation by team members, even if it is taking more time than top-down decisions, might have advantages that make up for this loss of time: it might lead to better decisions if all team members can provide their perspective and expertise, and it might lead to smoother implementation processes later on, because the decisions enjoy greater legitimacy (Gerlsbeck and Herzog 2020). This last argument might be thought to be relevant only for highly-skilled jobs, where efficiency considerations might in fact speak in favor of democratic work organization (e.g. Grandori 2016). But research on participatory decision-making among garbage collectors in France shows that in such a “low skill” (or “practical skill”) setting, as well, deliberation can lead to efficiency improvements (Bonnemain 2025). Democratic firms might, in fact, have efficiency advantages over capitalist firms if one considers the numerous agency problems that arise for the latter when contributions are difficult to measure, and monitoring is costly (Bowles and Gintis 1993).

Thus, defenders of economic democracy can grant that considerations of efficiency – understood in the broad sense described above – are relevant for how to design economic institutions. But they would hold that such considerations can be taken into account within the framework of an economic democracy, by looking for the forms of democratic participation (e.g. team deliberation or election of managers) that work best for a given context.

3.3 Arguments from futility against economic democracy

A last set of counterarguments questions whether economic democracy might fail because it would not realize its own goals. For example, what if employees are not so keen to participate in decision-making, and formally democratic structures in fact lead to a rule by small cliques that is no less authoritarian than the rule of managers?[3] Critics have pointed out that labor unions, the worker-led institutions par excellence, have not always been very democratic, and have historically often excluded workers along lines of gender, race, or migration status (e.g. Pinto 2024). Moreover, a system of economic democracy, e.g. with labor-owned firms, might lead to new forms of domination and exploitation, e.g. of skilled workers and investors by unskilled workers, or impose one specific model of economic organization on everyone, thereby violating liberal neutrality (e.g. Arnold 1994; Thomas 2017, 217; Taylor 2014; for a critical discussion see Braun 2021).

The force of these criticisms hinges on many institutional details. For example, would direct democratic participation in companies be made mandatory or would it be merely encouraged, e.g. through tax incentives, so that those who want to work in democratic companies can do so, but others do not have to (Jacob and Neuhäuser 2018)? A related question, mentioned above, is whether all companies would have to be democratic or whether there might be exceptions, e.g. for small businesses.

What, however, if the futility lies at the systemic level – what if companies that are successful in implementing democratic structures have little scope for decision-making, because the conditions in global markets force them to adopt certain technologies or production priorities?[4] A critic might, for example, point out that co-determined firms that exist in Europe, though not as inefficient as critics might assume, are in fact not so different from capitalist firms. (See e.g. Blandhol et al. 2021 on Norwegian companies with worker representation on boards, finding that there are positive effects for workers, but that these depend mainly on firm size and unionization, not co-determination; Jäger et al. 2022 on German companies, finding that the differences to non-co-determined companies are limited.) In response, it might be asked which other elements of economic democracy, e.g. labor market regulation or collective bargaining, might have stronger effects.

The answers to these questions are likely to depend, again, on many institutional details. Moreover, the interplay between formal structures and the informal culture of democratic institutions is likely to matter, with employees having to unlearn the habits of a capitalist economy and learning those of a democratic one (e.g. Breidenbach and Rollow 2019).

The arguments for and against economic democracy do not leave one with a clear-cut picture, because a lot depends on the design of democratic economic institutions and their interplay. While some arguments raise fundamental objections against economic democracy, most arguments are about potential negative consequences in terms of efficiency or functionality. But it is an empirical question what consequences economic democracy would in fact have. It is therefore important to turn to empirical evidence about the possible effects of democratic economic institutions. A big challenge, however, is that many existing forms of economic democracy which one can study empirically are only partially democratic (e.g. giving only limited voice to worker representatives), thus making it difficult to gain a full picture. In §5, I will consider some of the empirical scholarship, which provides reason for cautious optimism that steps in the direction of more democratic participation need not come at the cost of efficiency, and that democratic economic institutions do not automatically lead to other forms of authoritarianism. Before, however, let me zoom in on a central concern of economic democracy, workplace democracy.

4. Democracy at the workplace and beyond

4.1 Varieties of workplace democracy

“Workplace democracy” is currently at the core of many discussions about democratizing the economy (for an overview see e.g. Anderson 2017; Braun 2021; Frega et al. 2019). In contrast to markets, workplaces rely on the integration of workers into structures of control, with the aim of creating efficiency through collaboration (Coase 1937; Williamson 1973; 1975). This immediately raises questions about power relations within companies.[5] Elizabeth Anderson has argued that companies are “private governments” with vast authority over employees, especially in the US, where “employment at will” is widespread, i.e. employees can lose their job without employers having to provide any reason, and no procedural mechanisms protect them against arbitrariness (Anderson 2017; see also Bowles and Gintis 1993). The fear of losing their job and hence their income can be a threat for individuals that makes them accept not only legitimate authority, but also many forms of power abuse or harassment at work.

The arguments for and against economic democracy discussed above can also be applied to workplaces. Of particular interest is an argument that has been called the “spillover” argument (Pateman 1970, chap. 3; Mason 1982). It presents the hypothesis that the attitudes, habits, and skills that individuals develop at the workplace will “spill over” into their political behavior. The workplace is, after all, the place where grown-up individuals spend a large amount of their waking time, and which must be expected to have a major socializing effect on them. If individuals experience a democratic ethos and democratic structures at work, this prepares them for participation in the political realm as well.[6]

The spillover argument is particularly plausible for participatory forms of workplace democracy, where team members get directly involved in decision-making. Many work teams hold regular discussions about work processes anyway, for functional reasons. From the perspective of workplace democracy, and in particular the spillover argument, what matters is whether these take place on an equal basis, so that all individuals can make their voices heard and are taken seriously. In democratic teams, decisions can be taken consensually, or by voting after a weighing of all arguments. However, as in political democracy, it is important to keep in mind the problem that voting can lead to a “tyranny of the majority,” and therefore needs to be balanced by other mechanisms, e.g. the protection of minority rights.

Such participatory forms of workplace democracy, however, may not always be feasible, because of the size and complexity of economic organizations. As in democratic politics, in democratic workplaces the answer can be to use representative mechanisms of democracy instead, with workers electing representative decision-makers, e.g. as members of the company board. Elected representatives can play a role at various levels within companies. A typical form of such representation is works councils, which in many European countries have certain information and veto rights, e.g. when it comes to personnel planning, and therefore need to be involved in deliberation and decision-making (e.g. see Addison et al. 2004 for an overview of research on works councils).

Workplace democracy in the representative form can bring efficiency advantages, e.g. by allowing faster decision-making, while also ensuring that the interests of workers are taken into account. But it can bring new challenges, for example by creating too much distance between worker representatives, e.g. at company board level, and the “rank and file” workforce. Defenders of workplace democracy might therefore call for combinations of participatory and representative mechanisms. In addition to elected representation, representatives of the workforce can also be selected by lot, for additional forms of deliberation (Pek 2021).

When it comes to the formal constitution of democratic workplaces, different options are possible and indeed exist in real-life instantiations. A classical form, developed already in the 19th century, is the worker cooperative, in which the workers are also the owners of the company as a whole (e.g. Zamagni and Zamagni 2010). John Stuart Mill had expected a natural transition towards worker cooperatives, as individuals would choose to work for such organizations rather than capitalist companies (1848/1873 [2008], book IV, chap. 7). But this prediction has not become true on a large scale, with worker cooperatives mostly existing in niches in particular industries.

From a theoretical perspective, a number of challenges for cooperatives have been discussed, which might explain why they are not widespread. For example, workers often do not have access to capital, because banks are unwilling to lend to them for lack of securities (e.g. Bowles and Gintis 1994; Dow 2003, chap. 8–9). Moreover, investing both one’s work (one’s “human capital”) and one’s financial capital into the same company means that risks are bundled in a way that may be disadvantageous; therefore, John Roemer (1994) has developed a model in which workers own “coupons” of companies that they can use to invest in different companies. On the other hand, the concentration of financial and human capital in one company might also have functional advantages, e.g. a high degree of motivation of workers who benefit directly from profitability improvements.

A famous case, much discussed in the literature, is the Mondragon group of cooperatives in the Basque country, which is larger than many other cooperatives, employing over 70,000 workers in a network of companies (Mondragon 2023 [Other Internet Resources]; for discussions see e.g. Dow 2003, 57–66; Schweickart 2011, 74–79; Flecha and Santa Cruz 2011). However, it has also been criticized for not always living up to the principle of cooperativism, e.g. in the subsidiaries it has acquired over the years (for a case study of a transition process see e.g. Bretos and Errasti 2017).

Worker-ownership can also be organized differently, in forms that try to overcome the challenges of cooperatives. For example, companies can be owned by a trust in which workers own shares (with either the whole trust, or only parts of it, being in the hands of workers) (e.g. Dow 2003, 76–83). Employee stock ownership plans (ESOPs) or employee ownership trusts (EOTs) are used in various countries, and sometimes included in discussions about economic democracy (e.g. Dow 2003, 76–83). Here, workers are given the opportunity to receive part of their salary or retirement benefits in the form of shares, organized in an investment vehicle that holds shares in the company they work for. However, depending on the percentage of shares owned directly or indirectly by workers and the construction of the investment vehicle, the voice of workers may be stronger or weaker. The fact that they have a stake in the company is assumed to align their interests with the company and to motivate good work, but it does not automatically give them democratic control (for a critical discussion see e.g. Ellerman and Gonza 2024).

A different strategy for implementing workers’ voice in governance is to not make them (co-)owners, but to give them a role in firm governance in addition to owners. This avoids certain problems of worker-ownership, such as the availability of capital or the concentration of risks. One might pursue this line of thought even further and ask whether there might be other vulnerable stakeholders that should also be given some voice in firm governance, even though a special role for workers can be acknowledged (for discussions, see e.g. Moriarty 2010; González‐Ricoy and Magana 2024). However, critics have asked whether giving workers (and maybe also other groups) only voice, not ownership, makes such companies vulnerable to a threat of capital flight by the capital owners (e.g. Gonzalez-Ricoy 2020; Vrousalis 2019, 263-267), or whether labor contracts in anything other than fully self-governing firms can ever be legitimate (Ellerman 2021).

In some European countries, “co-determination” gives workers a voice in company governance; this is a mandatory requirement for companies above a certain size in some countries, e.g. the Scandinavian nations and Germany (for an overview see e.g. Page 2011; Hayden and Bodie 2021). However, worker representatives typically hold a smaller number of votes than representatives chosen by shareholders. The only exception, with parity on the supervisory board, is the Montanmitbestimmung of the German steel and mining industry, where shareholders and workers have the same number of votes, and in case of conflict a neutral arbiter has to be called in (Hayden and Bodie 2021, 332–333). In other industries in Germany, formal parity exists, but in case of conflict, an additional, tie-breaking vote is held by the chairman of the board, who is always a representative of capital; this model has therefore been described as “quasi-parity” (ibid., 332).

Another proposal for strengthening workers’ voices, by Isabelle Ferreras, takes inspiration from the history of political democracy and suggests a two-chamber system (“bicameralism”) for sharing power between elites and the population. This would mean that corporations have one chamber for shareholder representatives and one for worker representatives, which would have to come to agreements on all important issues (Ferreras 2017). But it has been questioned how different such a model would be from co-determination with full parity (e.g. Ferretti and Gosseries 2024). For example, one can ask whether the fact that deliberation takes place in two chambers might foster an antagonistic instead of a cooperative attitude (ibid., 173–175). Bicameralism might be seen as a transitional strategy for moving away from the model of unilateral shareholder power (Ferreras 2024). Similar questions might, in fact, also be asked about co-determination: should it be understood as an ideal endpoint of workplace democracy or as an intermediate step on the path towards fuller democratization?

It is important to note, though, that one need not, and arguably should not, expect that one type of democratic constitution would work best for all types of companies. Depending on their size, mission, and other functional features (e.g. the presence or absence of highly specialized expertise), different combinations of participative and representative instruments might be used. As many defenders of workplace democracy emphasize, there is still much to be learned in this area; Anderson, for example, writes (2017, 143): “There is plenty of room to experiment with alternative constitutions that guarantee workers’ voices.”

It should also be noted, however, that in addition to questions about the structure of companies, questions about their culture matter as well. As organizational theory has long emphasized, culture cannot be reduced to structure but is a factor of its own (e.g. Schein 2004). Corporations can exercise considerable cultural power over their employees, for example by determining how the tone is “set from the top” and by deciding which forms of behavior they reward, tolerate, or sanction (Herzog 2020). Companies that have strong mechanisms for worker representation may nonetheless suffer from an authoritarian culture in which workers are expected to obey orders and to bring products to markets at all costs.[7] On the other hand, formally non-democratic companies can, at least up to a point, allow for a democratic culture in the social relations of individuals. Roberto Frega (2020, 36–47) distinguishes three dimensions of workplace democracy, which have to do with formal structures, but also with the lived culture and informal norms:

  1. “relational parity,” i.e. symmetric interpersonal relations that do not, for example, discriminate against certain groups;
  2. “inclusive authority,” in which those affected by decisions are, as much as possible, involved in them; and
  3. “social involvement,” to “promote employee integration and reduce group segregation” (ibid., 45).

To use a concrete example of the latter, shared canteens for employees across all levels of hierarchy can provide public spaces of encounter in which norms and habits of mutual respect can be developed (ibid., 45–6). Companies that aim at realizing democratic values therefore need not only to pay attention o their structures, but also to ensure that their culture also lives up to democratic ideals.

4.2 Economic democracy beyond the workplace

It might be argued that if workplaces were democratized, economic democracy would have achieved its most important goal. However, there is a risk that focusing on the level of the workplace alone overlooks the systemic relations between different dimensions and levels of the economic system. Economic democracy therefore needs to include more than the focus on workers’ voices in the workplace.

A first point, which was also of great importance in the history of the idea of economic democracy, is the role of labor unions, as associations of workers that create counterpower to employers and can make political demands on the part of workers.[8] They have often helped create solidarity among workers, and contributed to articulating an understanding of their own situation, as well as to the sharing of knowledge and expertise, e.g. about workers’ legal rights. From a structural perspective, they thus play a crucial role for preventing domination over workers, which has led some commentators to argue that democratic states should support unions (O’Neill and White 2018) or even make membership universal (Reiff 2020). While some countries, e.g. the US, allow unions to collectively bargain for better working conditions only at the level of individual companies, in other countries unions play a key role in collective bargaining at the sector level (e.g. Block and Sachs 2020, 38–39). Unions can also organize strikes, as an important means to fight for better working conditions (e.g. Gourevitch 2018).

A second point is that democratic workplaces, and in fact also unions, when left to themselves, might take decisions that are problematic from a democratic perspective. One challenge is that they might favor the interests of majorities over those of minorities. For example, part-time workers (often women with care responsibilities) are structurally disadvantaged in many companies because they are less physically present and have fewer opportunities for informal contact; other groups that might suffer disadvantages are migrants or sexual minorities. While democratic companies and unions can themselves take steps to protect such groups, legal protection against discrimination is needed in addition.

Thirdly, democratic companies might take decisions that favor the interests of their own members at the costs of other groups or of society at large. Insofar as these groups are clearly defined – e.g. the patients of a hospital – it may be possible to directly involve them in the governance of organizations. This is of particular importance if they are vulnerable and their interests do not fully align with those of workers, but also when they hold forms of knowledge that are important to run an organization well. However, insofar as these groups are more diffuse, or the effects reach further into the future, general legislation is needed to prevent unjust harms, for democratic as much as for non-democratic companies. This holds, for example, with regard to environmental issues. Even though there is evidence that co-determined companies do better on substantial corporate responsibility issues than non-co-determined ones (e.g. Scholz and Vitols 2019), the protection of the environment and the climate can hardly be left to democratic workplaces alone.

In addition, there are questions about the possibility of realizing the goals of workplace democracy within a system that is otherwise not changed compared to the status quo. Democratic companies might suffer various disadvantages in such a system: cost pressures, difficulties in access to capital, or forms of competition that make it difficult for them to pursue environmental or social goals (e.g. Krahé 2024). Different institutional solutions have been proposed, for example public control over (some or all) investment capital (e.g. Schweickart 2011, 61–66) and the formation of public wealth through “community wealth building,” e.g. through targeted investment of local pension funds into companies that serve the community by creating good jobs and fulfilling public purposes (e.g. Kelly 2019, chap. 8; Guinan and O’Neill 2019). Public or community-owned banks, for which models exist in cooperative or locally owned banks in many countries, can be another element, as can be vehicles for ethical investment (Kelly 2019, 102–107).

Another strategy for those wanting to implement democratic value in the economy is coordination between companies, e.g. at the level of industries, e.g. about product standards. Companies within one industry often have shared interests that have a common good structure, e.g. when it comes to the introduction of shared standards (Herzog 2017). For such issues, agreements at the industry level can help; however, they can also create risks for the competitiveness of the relevant markets. Depending on their view on markets, economic democrats might be more or less willing to accept these risks (or even hope for ways to avoid the market mechanism completely, for example by a system of representation and deliberation that builds from the company up to the sector and the economic system as a whole, e.g. Vrousalis 2019).

Some commentators hold that arguments for workplace democracy have far-reaching implications about other economic institutions, and ultimately the economic system as a whole (e.g. Vrousalis 2019). A lot here hinges on the question, mentioned earlier, of whether markets can and should play a role in a democratic economic system. What theorists of economic democracy agree on, however, is that these cannot be any kind of markets. They need to be well-regulated ones that are in line with basic democratic values, e.g. forbidding exploitative contracts. And a key question is whether capital owners – whether in corporations, or in fact in cooperatives or other models of worker-owned companies – can find ways of “blackmailing” democratically elected politicians, e.g. by threatening not to create jobs anymore or to move capital abroad (Vrousalis 2019). Whether or not this is a credible threat depends, obviously, on other institutional design questions, e.g. whether or not capital can flow freely between countries, and whether there are public sources of investment that could counterweigh the power of private investors. It also depends on what the institutional alternatives are, e.g. whether one thinks that economic planning can be an attractive alternative to markets, or whether, for example, it might have tendencies towards centralization and hence brings its own risks of domination (Kuch 2024).

What should have become clear, thus, is that those who want to defend economic democracy cannot focus on the workplace alone. They also need to consider the broader balance between political and economic forces. In all the dimensions discussed here, it is crucial that the political decisions are taken in genuinely democratic processes. Many democratic societies have, in recent decades, seen political processes undermined by the power of lobbying, with the result that many rules in markets benefit large corporations, while leaving other interests unprotected (e.g. Reich 2020; Parvin 2023). Moreover, international corporations have pushed governments to lower taxes by threatening to remove capital and playing countries against each other, leading to the underfunding of public institutions (e.g. Dietsch 2015). This imbalance between economic and political power, which creates the risk of spiraling into ever-growing inequalities (Claassen and Herzog 2021), is unlikely to be overcome by democratizing companies alone. Rather, it requires changes also at the political level, e.g. when it comes to the role of money in politics (e.g. Christiano 2012).

This last pointcan be endorsed not only from the perspective of economic democracy, but also from general defenses of democracy as a political system. Economic democrats might want to add, however, that the chances for sustainable change in this respect are greater if the many forms of concentrated, unaccountable power that the current economic system creates are addressed, as the root cause of these threats to political democracy.

5. Empirical research on democratic practices in the economy

As the preceding sections have made clear, the arguments for and against economic democracy hinge, to a considerable extent, on the question of what exactly can be expected if one introduces democratic mechanisms into economic practices and institutions. If the goals of economic democracy could be reached without any costs in terms of efficiency and functionality, then it would be hard to reject its normative ambitions. If, on the other hand, it reduced welfare massively, and maybe also had other normative drawbacks, e.g. reductions of individual freedom, or if it failed to reach its own goals, then the arguments against it would prevail. It is therefore important to consider existing empirical research on those democratic institutions and practices that do exist, and to explore what their effects are. It is also important, however, to draw fair comparisons: not between an idealized version of capitalism and existing (and by necessity imperfect) democratic economic institutions, but between realistic versions of economic institutions on both sides.

5.1 Research about the relation between workplace experience and political behavior

The hypothesis that experiences at work influence individuals’ behavior as political citizens has received much attention by empirical researchers, with early studies finding a relation between work task complexity and intellectual capacities (Kohn and Schooler 1983; see also Hauser and Rohn 2017), which must be expected to also affect political behavior. But it is methodologically challenging to explore the link between workplace experience and political behavior directly, given that there are not so many workplaces that live up to the ideals of economic democracy (for an overview of earlier research and a discussion of methodological problems see Carter 2006; see also recently Rybnikova 2022).

However, over time researchers have used various methodologies to explore this connection in detail. As research overviews (Rybnikova 2022; Selenko et al. 2025) show, empirical studies in different disciplines confirm that there are demonstrable effects that go from experiences at work, understood in a broad sense, to political behavior, though they are more complex and multifaceted than one might assume. More empirical research is needed, especially about the concrete mechanisms and causalities at play (Selenko et al. 2025, 19–27).

One line of research explores how positive, egalitarian experiences at work influence political attitudes and behavior by enabling or encouraging workers to get politically engaged, as predicted by the “spillover argument” (e.g. Budd et al. 2018; Decker and Brähler 2020; Timming and Summers 2018). For example, working in companies with more democratic structures has been found, in a study of European cross-country data, to increase political trust and participation (Ryan and Turner 2021); for male (but not female!) employees in Germany, the presence of works councils increased their political interest (Jirjahn and Lee 2024). Overall, there is robust evidence that higher skill use, higher autonomy, and positive social relations at work are correlated with greater political participation (Selenko et al. 2025, 9–13, 17–18).

Another line of research asks whether the experience of grievances at work, for example job insecurity, might motivate workers to engage in political behavior. This leads to the prediction that it might be negative, rather than positive, working conditions that increase political participation, for which there is also some evidence (Selenko et al. 2025, 3, 8). Finally, as Schlachter and Ársaelsson (2024) argue on the basis of a qualitative study, there can also be a reversed causality, in the sense that politically engaged individuals choose to work for democratic companies.

5.2 Research about European co-determination models and cooperatives

Corporate governance scholars had long predicted that the European models of co-determination – with worker representation at the board level – would fail to be competitive against purely shareholder-oriented corporations in international markets (e.g. Jensen and Meckling 1979; for a discussion see Hayden and Bodie 2021). But these companies continue to exist, and recent studies show that they are successful in many respects (e.g. Harju et al. 2021 on Finnish companies; Jäger et al. 2022 on German companies). However, the size effects of the differences to conventional companies are not large. This might be the case because the co-determination does not go far enough to, for example, negotiate a genuine wage premium for employees, or it might reflect the fact that in order to compete in global markets, worker representatives need to keep their demands at bay. It is thus difficult to predict, on the basis of existing studies, how the situation would change if worker representatives were given a greater share of power (and very likely, this would also depend on changes happening in other parts of the economic system, e.g. in financial markets).

Cooperatives present a purer form of economic democracy, with the principle of “one person, one vote” among worker-owners. Studies have shown that once they have been founded, they are equally as likely to survive as comparable non-democratic companies (e.g. Olsen 2013; Penceval 2012; Pérotin 2016 [Other Internet Resources]). They do not automatically “degenerate” into capitalist companies: a recent review of 77 qualitative studies of 83 democratic companies over a period of 50 years shows that over 60% of them showed no sign of degeneration (Unterrainer et al. 2022). This is in line with earlier research (e.g. Levine and Tyson 1990) that found no negative impact of employee participation on the productivity of companies. An important question therefore is why cooperative firms do not get started more often, or why existing firms are not more often transformed into worker cooperatives later on, e.g. at the point when the founder retires. Some countries, such as Spain and Italy, offer tax support for workers to buy out companies in such situations, which has led some researchers to propose such models for other countries as well (Gonza et al. 2021).

5.3 Open research questions

One obvious limitation on empirical research is that they cannot study the effects of a fully developed economic democracy, because none currently exists. Current studies of specific democratic institutions or practice in otherwise non-democratic economic systems cannot easily answer questions about the systemic effects of, say, a mandatory transition, for all companies, to co-determination or bicameralism.

Absent the possibility of such studies, there are other lines of empirical research that are relevant for the philosophical discussion about economic democracy. An important question is the impact of digital technologies, including AI, on workplaces: how can such technologies be used to empower workers? (See, e.g., on platform cooperatives, Scholz 2016; or for an overview of strategies to democratize the digital economy, Muldoon 2025.)

For a better understanding of the feasibility of democratic workplaces, a key question is the behavior of workers within such companies and its effects on efficiency. Experimental studies suggest that participation in governance has a positive effect on work effort (Mellizo et al. 2014; 2017). More research could help to explore, for example, whether democratic workplaces show higher levels of trust, better sharing of information, or other mechanisms that could improve efficiency, but also what negative effects one might see, e.g. concerning the risk of political polarization, the formation of informal power structures, or conflict among employees.

Another avenue for research is the relation between economic democracy and the (theoretical and practical) reconceptualization of the nature, function, and legal status of business corporations, e.g. through new legal forms that “incorporate purpose,” such as “benefit corporations” (US) or “sociétés à mission” (France) (Segrestin et al. 2025). Can “purpose” be determined in non-democratic ways or does this require the participation of workers (see e.g. Davis 2020)?[9]

Another question is how democratic practices can be realized under conditions of informal work, as it prevails in many parts of the so-called “Global South.” If workers do not have employment contracts and companies do not have formal constitutions, what are possible ways of giving workers more voice in how their work is organized, and who would benefit from it (e.g. through associations that can make political demands – for a case study on waste pickers in Brazil, see Gomes et al. 2023)?

Last but not least, an important question is to what extent more democratic forms of decision-making about economic issues, at various levels, could contribute to moving the economy onto a more environmentally sustainable path. Here, discussions about economic democracy connect to broader questions about a reorientation of the economic system, away from a focus on GDP growth, towards the satisfaction of human and non-human needs and capabilities within planetary boundaries (e.g. Kallis et al. 2025).

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