Notes to Analytic Philosophy in Latin America

1. Philosophers with Latin American roots who have developed their philosophical work outside the area include Ignacio Angelelli, Horacio Arló-Costa, José Luis Bermúdez, Cristina Borgoni, Felipe De Brigard, Otávio Bueno, Héctor Neri-Castañeda, Alberto Coffa, Juan Comesaña, Marcelo Dascal, Catarina Dutilh Novaes, Jorge Gracia, Linda Martín Alcoff, Susana Nuccetelli, Agustín Rayo, Gonzalo Rodríguez-Pereyra, Víctor Sánchez Valencia, Carolina Sartorio, Ernesto Sosa, among others. Many of them have contributed to the development of analytic philosophy in Latin America by participating in academic events, facilitating academic exchanges with institutions outside the region, and supporting Latin American journals.

2. According to Gracia:

What we have then is a family structure not based on a genetic but on an intellectual lineage, an intellectual pedigree, which in turn is based on practices that have been passed and amended within a family context. In fact, we continue to organize in families and tribes and there are exclusions and fiefdoms. Mankind is primarily composed of communities, and philosophy does not differ from other human endeavors. This explains why cultural, political, and ethnic considerations play a role in human projects, including the academic ones (Gracia 2010, 29).

3. An academic community is consolidated as an analytic community when it satisfies most of the following conditions: 1) texts from the analytic canon figure in the philosophical curricula at various universities in the country; 2) students from those universities typically acquire the abilities to successfully interact with other students from other analytic communities; 3) in those universities, there is a critical mass of philosophers whose teaching and research displays (many of) the family traits of analytic philosophy; 4) those philosophers have created and maintained research groups and associations that favor the practice of analytic philosophy and they regularly organize events to discuss their work; 5) those philosophers regularly publish their work in outlets devoted to (or open to) contributions from the analytic tradition; and 6) their philosophical output has reached a recognizable degree of originality and rigor. Section 3 spells out the concept of originality.

4. Many of Kimovsky’s ideas and lectures were published at the end of his life with the assistance of his closest students (Klimovsky and Boido 1994, 2005; Klimovsky and Schuster 2000; Klimovsky and Hidalgo 1998). His autobiography appeared in 2008.

5. A special issue of Crítica (vol. 27, no. 79, 1995) and Moretti, Orlando, and Stigol (2015) are dedicated to Formas Lógicas.

6. Orayen (1992) offers two possible solutions to the paradox. There have been other attempts at solving the paradox by Anglo-American philosophers like Putnam, Quine, and Hart and many Latin American philosophers. See Moretti and Hurtado (2003) and García de la Sienra (2008).

7. An issue of Análisis Filosófico (vol. 13, no. 1, 1993) is dedicated to Orayen’s work. See also Ezcurdia (2007).

8. His best-known disciples are Cecilia Hidalgo and Verónica Tozzi, who edited a book on Schuster’s work (Hidalgo and Tozzi 2010).

9. Other philosophers from this first generation include Alberto Coffa (who emigrated to the United States), Ricardo Gómez (who also emigrated to the United States), Gladys Palau, Cristina González, Nora Stigol, Eduardo Flichman, Juan Rodríguez Larreta, and Diana Maffía. Maffía carried out research on the intersection between the analytic and phenomenological traditions, focusing on knowledge. Later, she turned to gender theory and feminist epistemology (Maffía 2003). She was one of the first feminist philosophers in the region.

10. Although both were trained as phenomenologists, they introduced logic and analytic tools from ordinary language philosophy in their seminars. They sponsored, from 1964 to 1969, Notas de Filosofía del Derecho, a journal that published many analytic papers.

11. Such as Carlos Alchourrón, Eugenio Bulygin, Jorge Bacqué, Ernesto Garzón Valdés, Roberto Vernengo, and Andrés Raggio. Later generations from this group include Carlos Nino, Martin Farrell, Antonio Martino, Ricardo Caracciolo, and Ricardo Guibourg.

12. He became a member of the Supreme Court of Justice during the recovery of democracy in 1983.

13. There was a special session on Rabossi’s work at the 74th Annual Meeting of the APA Pacific Division with Donald Davidson and Richard Rorty. Pérez and Fernández (2008) is dedicated to Rabossi’s work.

14. Volumes 26 and 33 of Análisis Filosófico are devoted to the work of each of them respectively.

15. In subsequent years, Alchourrón and collaborators worked on non-monotonic logic, defeasible reasoning, the formal representation of belief, the logic of conditionals, the logic of action, and AI. Eleonora Cresto is perhaps the main representative of this tradition currently working in Argentina. Her work is presented in the entries Formal Epistemology and Epistemology in Latin America.

16. Volume 35 of Análisis Filosófico (2015) and Alegre et al. (2008) are dedicated to Nino’s work.

17. Among the first members of SADAF were Eugenio Bulygin, Genaro Carrió, Alberto Coffa, Juan Carlos D’Alessio, Cecilia Hidalgo, Ronaldo García, Ricardo Gómez, Cristina González, Gregorio Klimovsky, Diana Maffía, Raúl Orayen, Gladys Palau, Eduardo Rabossi, Félix Schuster, Thomas Moro Simpson, and Nora Stigol.

18. SADAF is still the most important center for analytic philosophy in Argentina. For an up-to-date list of researchers at its research institute (IIF-SADAF-CONICET), see its website.

19. Scotto was the first woman to be appointed rector (2007–2013) of the Universidad Nacional de Córdoba. She kept doing philosophy during that period.

20. After the recovery of democracy in 1983, SADAF’s members also exerted influence on other Argentinian universities: Manuel Comesaña and (later) Federico Penelas at Universidad Nacional de Mar del Plata; Alberto Moretti and Gladys Palau at Universidad Nacional de La Plata; Sandra Lazzer and Cristina González at Universidad Nacional de Rosario; Eleonora Orlando and Ezequiel Zerbudis at Universidad Nacional del Litoral; Pablo Lorenzano at Universidad Nacional de Quilmes; Oscar Nudler at Universidad Nacional de Comahue, among others.

21. The Spanish philosophers were José Gaos, Eduardo Nicol, Eugenio Ímaz, Adolfo Sánchez Vásquez, Joaquín Xirau, and Juan David García Bacca. In 1946, García Bacca moved to Venezuela, where he developed most of his work. Section 2.5.5 explains García Bacca’s role in Venezuelan analytic philosophy. Some of the first professional Mexican philosophers were Antonio Caso, Ezequiel Chávez, Alfonso Reyes, Samuel Ramos, and José Vasconcelos (García Máynez 1966).

22. Molina defended logical positivism in his 1954 book Matemática y filosofía (Reflexiones para la delimitación del territorio filosófico). He was close to Trotsky and tried to reconcile logical positivism with Marxism. He translated, among others, Ayer (1959) and Carnap (1937).

23. At the end of the 1970s, Rossi switched to literature. His literary essays are collected under the title Manual del distraído (1978). González and Olivé (1994) and Hansberg and Hurtado (2012) are devoted to Rossi’s work.

24. Emilio Uranga and Luis Villoro also played important roles in the development of Mexican analytic philosophy. Villoro’s work is discussed below and in Section 3.2.

25. This editorial program led to the foundation of Diánoia in 1955 and a translation of Moore’s Principia Ethica in 1959. The translator of Moore’s book was Adolfo García Díaz, who had been working in close collaboration with Rossi in the late 1950s. Shortly after, García Díaz went to Zulia in Venezuela. Section 2.5.5 discusses Adolfo García Díaz’ role in Venezuelan analytic philosophy.

26. Although most of García Máynez’ writings belong to the phenomenological tradition, his book Los principios de la ontología formal del derecho y su expression simbólica (1953) is a fairly analytic book. It uses Russell and Whitehead’s formalism to develop a novel logic for legal norms. However, it does not employ any modal operators, which were key to subsequent developments. For an illuminating discussion of García Máynez’ role in Mexican analytic philosophy, see Hurtado (2007).

27. Salmerón was also helped by other analytically oriented philosophers like Hugo Padilla and Javier Esquivel.

28. Trejo left two years later. His book, Fenomenalismo y Realismo (1987), was published posthumously. Villoro left in 1974 for Universidad Autónoma Metropolitana-Iztapalapa and came back to IIFs in 1982. Otero, Bunge, and Moulines organized the weekly seminar Filosofía e Historia de la Ciencia that provided an important forum for interdisciplinary research in the years to follow. Moulines trained many students in the structuralist program in philosophy of science. Bunge left for McGill in Canada, Moulines for Bielefed in Germany, and Otero returned to Uruguay after the dictatorship.

29. After his period as chair, Salmerón published, with Rabossi, a series of translations of analytic works in ethics. Olivé and Villoro (1996) is dedicated to Salmerón’s work.

30. Villanueva published a book on Wittgenstein’s private language (Villanueva 1984) and articles in metaphysics, philosophy of mind, philosophy of history, and moral, legal, and political philosophy. He also founded the journal Philosophical Issues. From 1988 to 2017, he organized many international conferences in Latin America and Spain for the Sociedad Filosófica Iberoamericana (SOFIA), a society of which he was one of the co-founders.

31. Álvaro Rodríguez Tirado worked on theories of meaning, rule following, and the first-person concept (Rodríguez Tirado 1986, 1987). Mauricio Beuchot worked at IIFs from 1979 to 1991. He conducted a dialogue between Thomist philosophy and analytic philosophy of language, logic, and metaphysics (Beuchot 1981). Lourdes Valdivia worked in philosophy of language (Valdivia 1985, 1987). Margarita Valdés conducted research in applied ethics, philosophy of language, philosophy of mind, and epistemology. Section 3.2 presents some of her work. Paulette Dieterlen focused on political philosophy, mostly human rights, poverty, and distributive justice (Dieterlen 1984). Salma Saab worked on perception and the mind-body problem; she defended a naturalist outlook based on biological functions (Saab 1978, 2007). Olbeth Hansberg worked on the mind-body problem, psychological explanation, perception, and phenomenal consciousness. She defended a form of cognitivism about the emotions (Hansberg 1996). Alejandro Tomasini worked on the history of analytic philosophy, mostly Russell and Wittgenstein (Tomasini 1986). Section 2.1 introduces Raúl Orayen’s work.

32. For discussion of Villoro’s work, see Garzón Valdés and Salmerón (1993), Ramírez (2014), and Stepanenko (2017).

33. That program only took off, however, during Hansberg’s administration (1993–2000).

34. Pereda developed these ideas in various books (1994a, 1994b, 1999). His broad conception of reason resonates with Vaz Ferreira’s broad concept of logic. See Section 2.5.4.

35. Since the 1990s, many analytic philosophers have joined IIFs. For an up-to-date list of researchers at IIFs, see its website. There have also been analytic philosophers working at FFyL (UNAM), Universidad Autónoma de San Luis Potosí, Universidad Autónoma Metropolitana (Iztapalapa and Cuajimalpa), Mérida, Universidad Autónoma del Estado de Morelos, and Universidad Autónoma de la Ciudad de México.

36. For reasons of space, this entry focuses on one single lineage of logicians that directly impacted the development of analytic philosophy.

37. Leônidas Hegenberg studied philosophy at USP from 1955 to 1958. His interests in the foundations of mathematics led him to explore set theory and mathematical logic, which he initially studied under Farah’s supervision.

38. Da Costa had read Quine’s 1944 logic book, and the writings of Descartes, Poincaré, Carnap, and Russell (Moraes 2007).

39. A deductive system is inconsistent just in case it has a formula and its negation as theorems. A deductive system is trivial just in case every formula of that system is a theorem, i.e., if all its formulae are demonstrable within that system. A deductive system is paraconsistent just in case it includes inconsistencies, but it is not trivial. In classical logic, whenever there is a contradiction in a language, one can derive any formula of that language as a theorem. This triviality result follows from an inference rule known as ex contradictione quodlibet. Paraconsistent logics reject that inference rule and avoid triviality by introducing restrictions elsewhere. For further details, see the entry Paraconsistent Logic. The Peruvian philosopher Miró Quesada coined the term “paraconsistent logics”. He also offered one of the first philosophical interpretations of paraconsistent logic (Dussel et al. 2009). See Miró Quesada (1982).

40. Da Costa previously published two papers that discussed the philosophical motivations to develop paraconsistent systems: Nota sobre o conceito de contradição (1958) and Observações sobre o conceito de existência em matemática (1959) (Arruda 1989). Before him, the Polish logician Jaškowski and the Argentinian logician Asenjo developed paraconsistent systems. Da Costa was not initially acquainted with those works. For the history of paraconsistent logics, see Arruda (1989), Carnielli and Coniglio (2016), D’Ottaviano (1990), D’Ottaviano and Gomes (2011), and the entry Paraconsistent Logic.

41. Since this is not an entry on logic in Latin America, it cannot present the specific contributions of various members of da Costa’s group. But see Arruda (1989), Carnielli and Coniglio (2016), Moraes (2007), and D’Ottaviano and Gomes (2011). Arruda was perhaps da Costa’s brightest student. She worked for twenty years with him on the development of paraconsistent systems. She was also the first logician to formalize Vasili’ev’s systems and obtain paraconsistent systems. For an analysis of Arruda’s role in the development of logic in Brazil, see Secco and Álvarez (2022).

42. Since then, many Brazilian and foreign researchers have obtained results on the semantics and decidability of those calculi, their associated algebraic structures, the theories of paraconsistent sets, higher-order logics, model theory, differential paraconsistent calculi, and many applications to computer science, engineering, medicine, and technology (D’Ottaviano and Gomes 2012). In philosophy, there have been numerous applications to ethics, doxastic, epistemic, and deontic logics, probability theory, the foundations of quantum mechanics, AI, cognitive science, the foundations of infinitesimal calculus, and the foundations of science (Arruda 1989; D’Ottaviano 1990).

43. There have been many special issues on da Costa’s work. See Studia Logica (vol. 97, no. 1, 2011), Manuscrito (vol. 34, no. 1, 2011), Principia (vol. 15, no. 1-2, 2011), and Synthese (vol. 125, no. 2, 2000). For other special issues and volumes devoted to paraconsistent logic, see D’Ottaviano and Gomes (2011, 2012) and the entry Paraconsistent Logic.

44. From 1993 onwards, the Unicamp group created by Arruda (who passed in 1983) joined da Costa and his collaborators, consolidating a research area in logic and the foundations of formal sciences at the USP Philosophy Department.

45. The dictatorship prevented this early interest in Wittgenstein from having greater influence at USP. During those years, many philosophy professors were compelled to a “forced retirement”.

46. Two other foreign philosophers contributed to the teaching of logic at USP. Andrés Raggio spent a few years at USP between 1964 and 1971. He defended a constructivist approach to mathematics and logic. In Raggio (1962), he argued that logical knowledge is synthetic. Inspired by Gentzen, he held that the Frege-Tarski tradition mistakenly ignored the role of cognitive processes in the construction of logical concepts. This led him to develop a formulation—in Gentzen’s style—of some paraconsistent systems (Raggio 1968). Hugh Lacey was also a visiting professor at USP from 1969 to 1972. He published A linguagem do espaço e do tempo (1972), where he employed a logical symbolism to analyze space and time.

Besides them, João Paulo Monteiro contributed to the dissemination of Hume’s work through several translations and texts. In the 1970s, he was interested in Popper and the problem of induction. Monteiro founded Ciência e Filosofia in 1979 (Dascal 1984), an interdisciplinary journal devoted to the theory of knowledge, philosophy of science, history, sociology, and the methodology of science. Some articles in that journal discussed problems of logic and philosophy of language.

47. See Smith (2018) for further discussion of Porchat’s role in the development of Brazilian analytic philosophy. The entry Skepticism in Latin America discusses Porchat’s neo-Pyrrhonism.

48. Two members of CLE deserve a special mention. Balthazar Barbosa Filho published some fine works on the first Wittgenstein (Barbosa Filho 1981, 1995) and the second Wittgenstein (Barbosa Filho 1972). Faria et al. (2004) is dedicated to his work. Luiz Henrique Lopes dos Santos taught mostly philosophy of logic and philosophy of language, but also theory of knowledge and philosophy of science. He supervised many students.

49. Porchat was its editor (1978–1983). The next editor was Marcelo Dascal (1983–1998), who had pursued his academic career in Israel since the mid-1960s. Dascal contributed to the development of Brazilian analytic philosophy through frequent visits.

50. Its first editor was Newton da Costa. After the 8th volume, the journal merged with the Journal of Applied Non-Cassical Logics.

51. In addition to those developments in philosophy, there were two additional threads outside of philosophy (Dascal 1984). Chomsky’s program sparked considerable interest at linguistics departments in the 1960s and 1970s. As in Argentina and Mexico, some philosophers of law also employed philosophical analysis to study legal arguments. Miguel Reale at the Faculdade de Direito at USP and Franco Montoro at PUC-SP worked on deontic logic and the logic of law (Hegenberg 1978).

52. The main Brazilian funding agencies are the Conselho Nacional de Desenvolvimiento Científico e Tecnológico (CNPq) and the Coordenação e Aperfeiçoamento de Pessoal de Nível Superior (CAPES). From 1951 to 1979, these two agencies together distributed 879 scholarships. From 1970 to 1998, they distributed together around 17,000 scholarships (Mazza 2009).

53. At Universidade Federal do Rio Grande do Sul (UFRGS), Rejane Maria de Freitas Xavier taught logic, philosophy of language, philosophy of science, and Goodman’s constructivism. In some of her works, she argued that the logical-positivist view of scientific theories as mathematical calculi should be supplemented with historical and psycho-genetic approaches (Xavier 1991).

Oswaldo Chateaubriand joined PUC-RJ in 1978 and has been an emeritus professor at that university since 2012. He specializes in philosophy of logic, philosophy of mathematics, and philosophy of language, with interests in ontology, the nature of logic, the theory of descriptions, and the theory of truth. His most notable contributions are collected in Chateaubriand (2001, 2005). A special issue of Manuscrito is devoted to his work (vol. 22, no. 2, 1999) and two others to his books Logical Forms I (vol. 27, 1, 2004) and Logical Forms II (vol. 31, no. 1, 2008).

Raul Landim Filho joined the UFRJ Philosophy Department in 1978. He worked on predication and judgment in classical philosophy, truth, predication and existence, and the concept of analysis (Landim Filho 1995). From 1982 onwards, he coordinated the Seminário de Filosofia da Linguagem.

Guido Antônio de Almeida—previously based at PUC-RJ—joined UFRJ in 1982. He published articles on the relationship between phenomenology, linguistic analysis, and communication (Almeida 1981, 1985). He mentored several students who pursued graduate studies abroad and returned to Rio de Janeiro. They include Danilo Marcondes (speech acts, skepticism, applied ethics) (Marcondes 1984), Wilson Mendonça (phenomenal knowledge, mental causation, moral fictionalism) (Mendonça 2002), and Roberto de Sá Pereira (epistemic justification, consciousness, perception). See Section 3.1.

Luiz Carlos Pereira joined PUC-RJ in 1983. He has led the Instituto de Lógica e Filosofia da Linguagem.

Marco Ruffino worked at UFRJ from 1997 to 2013. He is currently appointed at Unicamp. Section 3.1 presents some of his work.

Nelson Gonçalves Gomes joined the Universidade de Brasília (UnB) in 1976. He produced work on the Vienna Circle (Gomes 1975).

54. Balthazar Barbosa Filho, who had been based at Unicamp (1977–1986) and USP (1973–1977), supervised Paulo Faria’s PhD at UFRGS. Faria in turn has become a leading figure at UFRGS. He has worked on the history of analytic philosophy, skepticism, the epistemology of reasoning, the philosophy of time, and memory. He has a book on cognitive dynamics (Faria 2021). He has mentored many students.

55. Canadian philosopher André Leclerc worked at Universidade Federal da Paraíba (UFPB), Universidade Federal do Ceará (UFC), and UnB. He has worked in philosophy of language and mind. Section 3.1 presents some of his ideas.

56. There has been analytic philosophy at Universidade Federal da Bahia (UFBA) at least since the 1980s, where João Carlos Salles has worked mostly on Wittgenstein (Salles 2012) and Waldomiro Silva Filho on Davidson, Wittgenstein, neo-Pyrrhonism, epistemology, and philosophy of mind (Silva Filho and Rocha 2016). Silva Filho coordinates the group Mente, Realidade, Conhecimento: Grupo de Investigações Filosóficas.

At the Universidade Federal de Santa Catarina (UFSC), there has been analytic philosophy at least since the 1980s. Alberto Cupani, Cezar Mortari, Marco Antonio Franciotti, and Alfredo Antonio Fernandes joined UFSC in the 1980s. Much analytic work at UFSC is organized around the NEL – Núcleo de Epistemologia e Lógica.

At UnB, Paulo Abrantes was active in the late 1980s. He has worked on analogic reasoning, evolutionary epistemology, the relations between mind, culture, and evolution, and evolutionary approaches to cooperation (Abrantes 1999).

At UFMG, Paulo Roberto Margutti Pinto worked from 1978 to 2006. He focused on Wittgenstein and pragmatism. Ernesto Perini Santos joined UFMG in 1995. He has worked in philosophy of language since the 2000s.

João Vergílio Cuter joined USP in 1995. He has worked on Wittgenstein from a historical perspective (Cuter 2005). Other analytic philosophers have joined USP since the 2010s.

Maria Clara Dias joined UFRJ in 1997. She works in philosophy of mind and environmental ethics.

57. Although ANPOF was not specifically created to promote analytic philosophy, it was key to the development of analytic philosophy in Brazil.

58. The first national meeting took place in Valinhos, São Paulo in 1991. It was organized by Maria Cecília Maringoni de Carvalho, Danilo Marcondes, and Alberto Oliva. That event was followed by other meetings throughout the 1990s and early 2000s. Some of the founders of SBFA were Adriano Naves de Brito, Cláudio Costa, André Leclerc, Darlei Dall’Agnol, Sofia Stein, Danilo Marcondes, André Abath, Anna Carolina Regner, João Carlos Salles, João Teixeira, Marcelo Dascal, Marco Ruffino, Maria Cristina Távora Sparano, Maria Eunice Gonzales, and Mariana Broens.

59. Sierra’s articles are collected in Apreciación de la filosofía analítica (1987). Their topics are Russell’s theory of descriptions, a priori truth, Popper’s philosophy of science, and Borges’ semantics. Sierra’s most notable contribution is an attempt at characterizing analytic philosophy that combines a conception of analytic philosophy as constituted by family traits with epistemological considerations.

60. They include Carlos Cardona (Carnap, Wittgenstein, history of science) (Cardona 2010) and Raúl Meléndez (Wittgenstein, philosophy of mathematics) (Meléndez 1998). A volume of Holguín’s collected papers on Wittgenstein is currently in preparation by UNAL and Universidad El Rosario.

61. Alfonso Monsalve wrote a PhD thesis on argumentation theory under Gómez’ supervision (Monsalve 1994). However, he switched to political philosophy in subsequent work. Pedro José Posada pursued argumentation theory and analytic philosophy in Cali. He created Analítica: Mente, lenguaje y cognición, a group that gathers students interested in philosophy of language, philosophy of mind, and argumentation theory.

Mauricio Zuluaga has also promoted work in analytic philosophy in Cali from the early 2000s. He has written several texts in analytic epistemology. See the entry Skepticism in Latin America.

62. This seminal work was followed by papers on the naturalization of intentionality (Botero 2001) and psychopathology from an enactivist perspective (Botero 2018). Botero has trained many analytic philosophers.

63. Ramos (2021) discusses the reception of Wittgenstein’s thought in Colombia.

64. Later on, Rosas took a naturalistic turn, and conducted research in philosophy of biology and experimental philosophy (Rosas 2008, 2010).

65. Hoyos has also made contributions to practical rationality and philosophy of action. Most of them are collected in his Ensayos de filosofía práctica y de la acción (2014).

66. All of the above-mentioned philosophers have trained younger generations, many of whom currently work at several Colombian universities.

67. In addition to Páez, this group is currently integrated by Santiago Amaya, Tomás Barrero, and Manuela Fernández. It also includes professors from other universities. Some of their contributions are discussed in the entries Epistemology in Latin America and Philosophy of Science in Latin America.

68. Santiago Arango joined Universidad de Antioquia as a faculty member in 2014. He has trained several students in philosophy of mind and cognitive science. Section 3.1 presents some of his ideas. Other analytic philosophers have recently joined him. Their activities are organized around the group Conocimiento, filosofía, ciencia, historia y sociedad.

69. Like other first-generation analytic philosophers in Latin America, they started their careers as phenomenologists, and saw analytic philosophy as a tool to develop a clear and rigorous philosophy. They joined the first editorial committee of Crítica.

70. In the 1960s, Miró Quesada joined a political movement that proposed socialist reforms underwritten by conceptual analysis and supported by results from empirical sciences (Salmerón 1991).

71. Soon after, Cordero left the country. He pursued his studies at Oxford and then emigrated to the United States.

72. Those essays combined conceptual analysis with experience to develop an account of values as conditions for the possibility of action and human interaction (Dussel et al. 2009).

73. Villanueva and a group of young researchers have created Theorema: Sociedad Peruana de Investigación Filosófica, a group that seeks to develop a Peruvian philosophical community with international reach.

74. In 1956, they created the Asociación Chilena de Lógica y Filosofía de las Ciencias.

75. For example, Guido Vallejos and Marcelo Díaz Soto.

76. Tugendhat also visited Colombia in 1984 (Salmerón 1991) and Perú in 1987 (Sasso 1994).

77. Section 3.1 presents Fermandois’ work.

78. Pereira created the Sociedad Chilena de Filosofía Analítica in 2008. He has also introduced contemporary debates in the philosophy of perception into the Spanish-speaking world (Pereira 2019, 2021).

79. Although Schajowicz did not develop the analytic tradition in the country, he introduced logical positivism in Schajowicz (1964).

80. A special issue of Revista de Humanidades de Valparaíso (vol. 8, 2016) is devoted to Torretti’s work.

81. For example, Dennis Alicea (philosophy of science, epistemology, pragmatism) and Pierre Baumann (philosophy of language, symbolic logic).

82. Vaz Ferreira’s most celebrated work, Lógica viva (1910), has no links to mathematical logic, and it ignores the most important developments from the analytic movement (Gracia 1984). The book focuses on the way in which we actually reason, offering an analysis of the most common confusions and reasoning mistakes one can find in everyday practice. This approach is at odds with the anti-psychologism that dominates early analytic treatments of logic. In later work, Vaz Ferreira (1940) criticized the analytic movement.

83. Heymann emigrated to Venezuela in 1974.

84. Nuño went to Cambridge, where he became familiar with logical positivism. He returned to Caracas in 1953, and joined the School of Philosophy as an assistant professor. In 1955, the general Marcos Pérez Jiménez closed down the university, and Nuño was compelled to work at an English company. He was able to return to the university in 1958, when Pérez Jiménez was overthrown. In 1962, Nuño earned his PhD with a thesis on Plato under García Bacca’s supervision. Later on, he went to Fribourg in Switzerland, where he improved his knowledge of logic with Bochensky.

85. Nuño joined the first editorial committee of Crítica and published analytic works in Diánoia and Crítica about the distinction between formal and dialectical logic (Nuño 1967), formalization in Tarski’s and Carnap’s semantics (Nuño 1969), and proper names (Nuño 1987).

86. Franklin Galindo, from this group, promoted the teaching of first-order logic, its metatheory, and the philosophy of mathematics. His students Randy Alzate and Ricardo Da Silva have continued this work.

87. Vaz Ferreira played an important role in his change of interests. Like Vaz Ferreira, Piacenza saw the philosophical study of argumentation as a way of showing the relevance of philosophy to everyday concerns.

88. The group is led by Corina Yoris.

89. In his posthumously published PhD thesis, Sasso (1998) argues that ordinary language philosophy could be used to develop a new narrative of the history of Latin American philosophy. More specifically, ordinary language philosophy could help historians of ideas identify the intentions, stylistic and lexical conventions, and suppositions of the practices underlying the production of philosophical texts in Latin America.

90. They are Randy Alzate (philosophy of mathematical practice, set theory) and Ricardo Da Silva (set theory, relations between philosophy and mathematical logic).

91. There has been some analytic work outside of Caracas. Adolfo García Díaz emigrated to Zulia in 1959, where he created the School of Philosophy at the Universidad del Zulia, Maracaibo (Beuchot n. d.). García Díaz led the school from 1963 to 1970. During that period, he kept strong ties with Mexican philosophers from IIFs and developed—like Beuchot—a dialogue between Medieval philosophy and analytic philosophy. He also knew Wittgenstein well. Some of his papers are collected in Investigaciones metafísicas (1992). His students Ángel Muñoz García and Sabine Knabenschuh have published work at the intersection of Medieval philosophy and analytic philosophy. Knabenschuh has also published articles about Wittgenstein. She created the Círculo Wittgensteiniano in 2006.

92. Even if they developed their philosophical work in the United States, Héctor Neri-Castañeda (Guatemala) and Ernesto Sosa (Cuba) have played a decisive role in the development of analytic philosophy in Latin America. They have published several essays in Latin American journals, regularly attended conferences in Latin America, contributed to the development of philosophy journals such as Crítica and Análisis Filosófico, and helped many students from Latin America pursue graduate studies at the University of Indiana and Brown University respectively.

93. The metaphysical side of Gómez-Torrente’s approach is reflected in his treatment of the referents of Arabic numerals. On his view, their referents are not Platonic entities inhabiting a third realm but finite plural cardinality properties like the property that some things have of being four. In the case of color adjectives, he describes them as denoting values in appropriate intervals in the chromatic dimensions, especially hue. In the case of nouns for natural kinds, he rejects the Putnam-Kripke view according to which they single out highly precise scientific kinds. Instead, a noun like “water” denotes the ordinary kind water, a kind formed by samples not too different from some paradigms. The epistemic side of Gómez-Torrente’s approach is apparent in his treatment of demonstratives, which many referentialists have explained via descriptions analogous to Kaplan’s (1977) characters. In the case of Arabic numerals, Gómez-Torrente has rejected the tendency to explain their reference via descriptions that can only be formulated with some sophisticated resources of set theory. There are symposia on Gómez-Torrente (2019) in Manuscrito (vol. 34, no. 4, 2020) and Philosophical Studies (vol. 179, no. 3, 2022).

94. Note that Ruffino’s explanation does not rely on the phenomenon of indexicality. Hence, if Kaplan’s (1977) “I am here now” is a contingent a priori truth, the two types of examples require separate treatments. Furthermore, Ruffino’s account entails that contingent a priori truths and necessary a posteriori truths are not, pace Davies (2006), two aspects of the same phenomenon. After all, the latter can be adequately explained with no reliance on speech-act theory. Ruffino also suggests (contra Stalnaker 2001) that contingent a priori truths are not a rare phenomenon but central pieces of social and scientific practices. Contingent a priori stipulations constitute the framework in which we discover scientific identities and create civil institutions. For an application of this approach to mathematical language, see Ruffino, San Mauro, and Venturi (2020).

95. García-Ramírez and Shatz (2011) marshal empirical evidence from cognitive science to reject descriptivist accounts of reference fixing. Still from an empirical perspective, García-Ramírez (2011) develops a unified semantic treatment of empty names that is ontologically parsimonious.

Latin American analytic philosophers have discussed other issues in philosophy of language. Chateaubriand (2001) offers a novel response to Church’s (1956) and Gödel’s (1944) slingshot arguments. He thinks that Church’s version of the slingshot introduces a change of aboutness, and Gödel’s version relies on a principle that is not obviously a priori. He has also developed an original account of Fregean senses (Chateaubriand 2007). He departs from Frege in thinking of senses as identifying properties. Gómez-Torrente (2006) offers an influential account of rigidity. Teixeira (2022) argues—against orthodoxy—that epistemic analyticity does not carve the semantic at the semantic joints. Onofri develops Fine’s (2007) account of coordination to defend a conception of thoughts as public (Onofri 2018) and to challenge the widespread view of successful communication as requiring a shared content (Onofri 2022). Freund (2018) defends a picture of predication as a cognitive act that essentially requires sortal concepts. On his view, concepts are intersubjectively realizable abilities that fulfill cognitive roles like classification, categorization, individuation, and referring.

There has been some work on context-dependence. Perini-Santos (2023) develops a new framework for unarticulated constituents, i.e., components of utterances that contribute to their truth-conditions but do not correspond to any uttered morpheme. Mena (forthcoming) argues that it is fruitful to treat the different ways in which language could be interpreted as parameters in circumstances of evaluation.

96. As occurs in other dualistic models, Orlando and Saab defend the identity thesis, namely, that the truth-conditional meaning of a slur is equivalent to the truth-conditional meaning of its neutral counterpart. Although “Latin American” lacks expressive meaning, it has the same truth-conditional meaning as “spic”. Other dualistic models include Potts (2005), Predelli (2013), and Gutzman (2015).

97. Capitalized words name concepts.

98. This view entails that competence with slurs comes in degrees (depending on how many of the constituent concepts of stereotypes a speaker knows), and different speakers may grasp different subsets of those concepts. Orlando and Saab (2019, 2020a) offer a pragmatic account of uses of slurs in insults.

99. Other Argentinian analytic philosophers have investigated dualistic accounts of slurs. See the texts included in Orlando and Saab (2020c). For further discussion of this topic, see the entry Hate Speech. From the same group, Lo Guercio and Caso (2022) offer a novel analysis of what they call “overt intentional dogwhistling”, i.e., a communication strategy used by politicians to send, along with the explicit content of their speech, concealed messages that seek to secure the approval of some groups without alienating the rest of the electorate.

100. This category comes from Black (1993). Fermandois (2010) modifies Black’s taxonomy.

101. A consequence of this view is that SLU is not underwritten by an informationally encapsulated and domain specific module. Leclerc also thinks that radical forms of context-sensitivity do not jeopardize our ability to understand an indefinite number of new utterances.

102. In his dialogue Cratylus, Plato opposes the view according to which words refer by convention to the view that they bear an imitative relation to their referents (Sedley 2003). For Scotto, there is rather a continuum from iconicity to conventionality that human languages exploit. Thus, her view comes close to Peirce’s (1931–1958), who insists on the complementary character of various types of signs. Another consequence is that we should revise the sharp contrast between phonological, syntactic, semantic, articulatory, and pragmatic levels. Scotto thinks that her approach is easier to reconcile with theories of the evolution of human languages. She has also extended her approach to elucidate our understanding of faces (Scotto 2022a) and the second-person perspective (Scotto 2022b).

103. Other Latin American philosophers have challenged the orthodox view of language. García-Ramírez (2019) develops a new account of compositionality that reflects a conception of natural languages as highly interactive capacities that allow humans to engage in complex forms of cognition.

Skidelsky (2009) criticizes certain defenses of the hypothesis that humans use natural languages as vehicles of thought. Skidelsky (2013) defends the claim that Chomsky’s faculty of language can be conceived as a causal mechanism. Skidelsky’s work in the philosophy of cognitive science is discussed in the entry Philosophy of Science in Latin America.

Building on empirical findings from ethology, Danón (2013, 2022) argues that Evans’ (1982) generality constraint for conceptual thought is not an all-or-nothing affair but comes in various degrees of complexity throughout the animal kingdom. Aguilera (2016) challenges the widespread view according to which a linguistic format is necessary for inference. She also submits that many cognitive processes involve representations with different formats (Aguilera 2021). In a similar vein, Barceló (2022) explores the iconicity of images, diagrams, pictures, and maps. Barceló (2012) argues that images play a substantial role in argumentation.

104. For further discussion of Pérez and Gomila (2022), see the special issue in Teorema (vol. 41, no. 2, 2022). A book symposium is also forthcoming in Diánoia.

105. Quintanilla (2019) follows an alternative approach to Pérez and Gomila’s (2022). He develops Davidson’s idea of triangulation as involving three interdependent poles: the interpreter (the human community), the agent (other or others), and a shared world (shared traditions and languages).

Emotions have also sparked considerable interest in the region. Loaiza (forthcoming) defends a functionalist approach to the emotions that responds to three main challenges, namely, that it is inherently teleological, that it does not offer a scientifically fruitful taxonomy of emotions, and that it is immune to empirical falsification.

106. Arango-Muñoz and Bermúdez (2018) hold that metacognitive feelings enable one to exert control over episodic remembering, thereby challenging the received view of remembering as a ballistic, non-agential process.

107. Perceptual experience has been an important topic in the region. Krempel (2021) argues that empirical findings do not support the claim that color experience is linguistically penetrable. Carvalho (2021) offers a new account of the influence of fear on object perception that avoids objections to Gibsonian accounts. De Sá Pereira (2020) suggests that visual hallucinations lack content. In his 2019, he offers an inference to the best explanation in favor of the claim that we perceptually experience tropes. Kalpokas (2022) combines the view that perception is relational with the claim that it has conceptual content. Taking a different line, Abath (2008) rejects the conceptualist claim that a subject’s possession of perceptual beliefs requires that she has (subjective) reasons for those beliefs.

Many Latin American analytic philosophers have been influenced by enactivism. Carvalho (2021) develops a new approach to epistemological disjunctivism that builds on ecological psychology. Espejo-Serna (2019) contends that radical enactivists should endorse an account of phenomenal properties as partly constituted by the environment. Also, from an enactivist perspective, Rolla (2022) submits that experiments on infant cognition do not support the claim that babies have mental representations.

López-Silva (2019) invokes cases of thought insertion to reject the claim that all conscious experiences involve some form of phenomenal self-awareness.

108. Latin American analytic philosophers have tackled other aspects of action. It is widely held that addiction involves a loss of control. Burdman (2022) develops an account of control according to which there are degrees to which an agent can be responsive to reasons to do otherwise. Bermúdez (2021) offers an account of self-control as a skill that addresses the “guidance problem”, namely, an agent’s transformation of their abstract and coarse-grained intentions into highly context-sensitive, fine-grained control processes. Murillo (2018) argues that, when one performs everyday actions like riding a bike, one’s body and bodily movements must be part of the content that guides those actions.

109. Ortiz-Millán (2009) offers a comprehensive study of the ethical and legal issues about abortion. In Argentina, abortion was legalized in 2021. The Argentinian philosophers Diana Maffía, Florencia Luna, Eduardo Rivera López, and Paola Bergallo played an important role in the debate that preceded the approval of the law. See Luna (2019), Rivera López (2018), and Bergallo (2011).

110. Also in bioethics, Rivera López (2001) addresses the moral problem of selling organs for transplant. Rivera López (2017) is a contribution to the (incipient) debate about the legalization of euthanasia in Latin America. Fernández-Pinto (2019) explores the way in which the recruitment of women and minority patients as subjects of international clinical trials contributes to power imbalances in the Global South. Fernández-Pinto (2018) argues that niche standardization in medical research can have undesirable epistemic and ethical consequences if the social, epistemic, and commercial goals of research are not properly aligned.

111. Nino developed some of that work in the late 1970s. In the early 1980s, he discussed those issues in his seminars at SADAF. A transcription of those discussions was published in Nino (2013).

112. Nino was Alfonsín’s advisor from 1983 to 1989, the coordinator of the Consejo para la Consolidación de la Democracia (a committee for the study and design of institutional reforms) from 1985 to 1989, and a member of the Comisión de Reforma del Código Penal in 1985.

113. From the principle of autonomy one can derive prohibitions of actions that harm the autonomy of persons or their capacity to choose their life plans, such as killing or injuring them. One can also invoke it to derive permissions to impose sanctions on those who violate human rights on the ground that those sanctions lead to an increase of autonomy (Nino 1979, 1989). For a summary of Alfonsín’s human rights policy, see Nino (1985: 218).

114. At the end, CONADEP issued the report Nunca Más (Never Again).

115. A key issue was not to arbitrarily select those who were prosecuted. So, a distinction was made between those who had planned the human rights violations, those who had given the orders, and those who had executed them.

A few months before stepping down, the military government had proclaimed a “self-amnesty law” that exculpated the army from any crime committed between 1976 and 1983. Nino’s conception of human rights as having justification independently of any legal order made it possible to argue that the law had no effect.

116. Villoro traveled many times to the south of Mexico and met the Subcomandante Marcos and other members of the Ejército Zapatista de Liberación Nacional. He had first-hand knowledge of their form of life, social organization, and political views.

117. Eraña (2022) discusses Villoro’s conception of State. Eraña (2021) discusses his concept of community, arguing for a mutual dependency between individual and community.

118. See Rivera López et al. (2020), Emanuel et al. (2020), Emanuel et al. (2021), Mastroleo et al. (2020), and Fernández-Pinto (2022).

119. Rabossi also spells out a set of principles (or “decalogue of maxims”) that guide contemporary philosophical practice, he analyzes the impact of professionalization in other matters, such as the tensions that arise between the globalization of philosophy and the consolidation of regional philosophies (such as Latin American Philosophy), and he contrasts the roles of central and peripheral producers of philosophy.

120. This risk is apparent in Stanley and Williamson’s (2001) linguistic arguments for the claim that know-how is a species of know-that. The closest expressions in Latin languages (“saber hacer”, “savoir faire”) are not obviously equivalent to “know how”. See Rumfitt (2003) and Pérez (2011).

121. The discussion on English as a lingua franca for philosophy appeared later in European analytic philosophy. See the Barcelona Principles for Globally Inclusive Philosophy and the Linguistic Justice Society.

Copyright © 2023 by
Diana Ines Perez <dperez@gmail.com>
Santiago Echeverri <santiago.echeverri@filosoficas.unam.mx>

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