Maria Montessori

Maria Montessori (1870–1952) was one of the most influential pedagogues of the late nineteenth and early twentieth centuries, developing an educational method that currently guides over 15,000 schools in dozens of countries. Montessori was never merely a teacher, however. She was a psychologist, anthropologist, doctor, cultural critic, and philosopher. Her writings span a wide range of philosophical issues, from metaphysics to political philosophy, but she always discusses philosophical issues in ways that make use of insights—what she calls revelations—gleaned from her work with children. In recent years, philosophers have begun to attend to her work. After a short overview of her life and most philosophically important works, this entry discusses Montessori’s philosophy of education, metaphysics, epistemology, moral philosophy, and political theory.

• 1. Life and Major Works
  • 1.1 Montessori’s Life
  • 1.2 Montessori’s Works
• 2. Philosophy of Education
• 3. Metaphysics
  • 3.1 Vital Teleology and the Metaphysics of Life
  • 3.2 Ecological Holism
  • 3.3 Emergent Mind
  • 3.4 Unconscious and Embodied Mind
  • 3.5 God and Nature
• 4. Epistemology
  • 4.1 Interested Empiricism
  • 4.2 Intellectual Virtues
• 5. Moral Philosophy
  • 5.1 Agency and Independence
  • 5.2 Character, Respect, and Solidarity
  • 5.3 Embodied Ethics
• 6. Feminism
• 7. Peace, Education, and the Rights of the Child
• 8. Responses to Montessori
• 9. Montessori’s Influence and Relevance
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Life and Major Works

1.1 Montessori’s Life

Maria Montessori was born in Chiaravalle, Ancona, Italy, on August 31, 1870 and died in Noordwijk aan Zee, the Netherlands, on May 6, 1952. Over the course of her life, she spent prolonged periods in many countries running training courses for teachers who sought to implement her pedagogical philosophy, and she lived for extended periods in Italy, Spain, the Netherlands, and India. Like William James or Sigmund Freud, she did not begin her career as a professional philosopher. Instead, she studied technical engineering in her secondary school and then enrolled at the University of Rome (La Sapienza) in 1890, where after two years of study in the natural sciences and then supplementary exams in Latin and Italian, she was admitted as a third-year medical student, becoming one of the first women in Italy to attend medical school (see Matellicani 2007 for detailed discussion of her years at the University of Rome). According to one biographer, early in her life she wanted to be “anything but a teacher” (Standing 1957: 23), and she always identified more as a scientist of human nature than as a teacher per se. During the year that she graduated from medical school (1896), Montessori also represented Italy at the International Women’s Congress in Berlin, evidence of her important role in feminist and progressive political circles.

After graduating from medical school, Montessori established a medical practice and was appointed as a co-director of a new “Orthophrenic School”, which treated children with a range of disadvantages, from poverty to what we would now call intellectual disability to severe mental illness. In that context, Montessori argued—against biological theories such as those of Cesare Lombroso—that the problems faced by these children are “more…educational than medical” (MS 2:21,^[1] cf. 1903). She was interested in the psychological and pedagogical work of Édouard Séguin and Jean-Gaspard Itard and in 1899, in conjunction with her work at the Orthophrenic school, she traveled to Paris to study their work.

In 1903, Montessori returned to the University of Rome, being admitted as a third-year graduate student in philosophy, despite not having the classical diploma that was technically a prerequisite for admission (De Stefano 2020 [2022, 73]). As she explained, “wishing to undertake the study of normal^[2] pedagogy and of the principles upon which it is based, I registered as a student of philosophy at the University” (2:23; 1909 [1912: 33]). While there, she took courses in the history of philosophy, ethics, metaphysics, and the philosophy of education with philosophers such as Antonio Labriola and Luigi Credaro, though she was also drawn to both pragmatist and positivist currents that were influential at the time (see Matellicani 2007; James 1906; Santucci 1963). One contemporary reported that during this period,

she saw the “two camps” very plainly—the professors of the humanities sneering at science; and the scientists laughing at the philosophers, and she thought to herself that some day the teacher would come who would unite these two opposed interpretations of life into one. (Radice 1920: 3)

During this period, Montessori herself held teaching positions, first as a Chair of “Hygiene and Anthropology” at the Women’s Magisterial Institute in Rome (a position she held from 1899–1917) and then, after 1904, as an instructor of anthropology in the Faculties of Medicine and of Physical, Mathematical and Natural Sciences. Her 1910 Antropologia Pedagogica [Pedagogical Anthropology], based on these courses, arguably begins to bridge the gap she had identified between scientific method and philosophical insight into the human condition.^[3] During this period, Montessori also continued writing and speaking on empirical scientific work and was involved with various progressive causes, including a student group called Pensiero e Azione (Thought and Action), which, among other things, advocated for women’s suffrage.

The pivotal event in Montessori’s life was an invitation by Edoardo Talamo, a developer of a progressive real estate association renovating tenement housing in the slum district of San Lorenzo in Rome. Talamo wanted to provide childcare and education to residents of his new buildings and invited Montessori to oversee the endeavor. Montessori used this opportunity to create a model classroom in which she could study the effects of various educational materials and pedagogical methods on ordinary children. This provided the foundation for what Patrick Frierson has called a “pedagogical naturalism”, a project of cultivating materials and prepared environments within which children could flourish in freedom and thereby disclose fundamental truths about human nature, development, and culture (Frierson forthcoming). In 1909, Montessori described the results of her initial work in the “Casa dei Bambini” (Children’s House) in a work entitled Il Metodo della Pedagogia Scientifica applicato all’educazione infantile nelle Case dei Bambini [The Method of Scientific Pedagogy Applied to Children’s Education in the Children’s Houses], which was translated into English in 1912 as The Montessori Method, and which went through a series of substantive revisions over the next forty years (see Trabalzini 2003, 2011, 2023). This initial experiment garnered Montessori international attention and enabled (indeed, required) a shift away from her medical practice towards a full time focus on developing, teaching, and spreading her pedagogical methods. Over the rest of her life, she gave over fifty teacher training courses in several countries, including Italy, England, Spain, the United States, and India. Throughout her life, she continued to weigh in on topics of public importance, though her emphasis increasingly shifted from feminist and broadly progressive political concerns to a focus on children’s right and the role of children in the rehabilitation of society and the future of humankind.

A full discussion of Montessori’s life would go beyond what is necessary or appropriate here; instead, see Kramer 1976 or Moretti 2021. Even a brief discussion of her life cannot leave out, however, one of its more controversial episodes, namely Montessori’s willingness to work with Benito Mussolini during the period of Italian fascism. As Mussolini rose to power in Italy in the late 1920s and 1930s, Montessori was an international sensation living and working in Barcelona, Spain. Starting with its inclusion in Giovanni Gentile’s school reforms in 1923, Montessori’s education method was included in discussions of reforming education in Italy, and in the early years of his reign, Mussolini offered “official recognition and extensive establishment of Montessori schools” throughout Italy (Moretti 2023: 292). Montessori reciprocated by inviting him to be, for example, President of the Opera Nazionale Montessori and offering that, as Quarfood puts it, “her character-building method is entirely in line with the regime’s intentions to improve the population’s morale” (Quarfood 2022: 176). By 1936, however, Montessori and Mussolini severed their relationship, as Mussolini went to war in East Africa, the Nazis shut down all Montessori schools in Germany, and Montessori and her colleagues were being surveilled by the fascists for anti-fascist activity. The Opera Nazionale Montessori was shut down and Montessori education not supported (though not officially banned) in Italy. Scholars disagree about how best to assess the relationship between Montessori’s philosophy and that of the fascist regime in Italy. Some have claimed that Montessori’s pedagogy was “well equipped to serve the fascist regime of Mussolini” (Engelmann 2022: 527; see too Leenders 2001). The more common reading is that the relationship was marriage of convenience, in which at first each “heard what [they] wanted to hear” (Kramer 1976: 282, see too 302–3), but eventually “the fundamental differences between the principles of Montessori’s work and…the fascist regime brought the relationship to a predictable halt” (Moretti 2023: 293). Christine Quarfood offers an overview of debates about Montessori’s fascism (Quarfood 2022: 129–167), including intermediate views such as Luisa Lama’s suggestion that “fascism’s attention to the problems of childhood may have deceived Montessori” (Lama 2002: 325, quoted and translated in Quarfood 2022: 184; see too Marazzi 2000). Quarfood herself highlights certain features of fascism that Montessori would have found congenial, such as Mussolini’s suggestion that “ignorant parents” are the “‘main obstacle’ to the regime’s eugenics program” or that the right kind of education could enhance the human race and promote “the moral and physical health of the lineage” (see Quarfood 2022: 203, 208). Nonetheless, Montessori’s commitments to peace, cosmopolitanism, and especially to expanding liberty for children and ultimately for all people put her fundamentally at odds with fascist ideology. At a time when illiteracy was still a serious problem in Italy, Montessori and the fascists shared an interest in the role of education in human progress, but fundamental differences led them to take this shared interest in very different directions in the end.

1.2 Montessori’s Works

Over the course of her life, in addition to extensive lecture courses (for many of which we have transcripts) and concrete pedagogical materials, Maria Montessori wrote nearly two dozen books and hundreds of essays and articles. During her early years as a student and shortly thereafter, she actively wrote scientific articles and papers such as “Sul significato dei cristalli del Leyden nell’asma bronchiale” (“On the significance of Leyden crystals in bronchial asthma”; Montessori 1896), “Sulle cosidette allucinazioni antagonistiche” (“On supposed antagonistic hallucinations”; Montessori & De Sanctis 1897) or “La teoria lombrosiana e l’educazione morale” (“The Lombrosian theory and moral education”; Montessori 1903). Throughout her life, too, she wrote short articles on various topics ranging from specific pedagogical practices to broader cultural critique.

By far Montessori’s most important work during her lifetime was Il Metodo della Pedagogia Scientifica applicato all’educazione infantile nelle Case dei Bambini (1909), first translated into English as The Montessori Method (1912) and then later translated (based on a new edition) as The Discovery of the Child. In this work, she describes the philosophy and specific pedagogical practices underlying her initial experiment at the Casa dei Bambini in the San Lorenzo district of Rome. The work underwent substantive revisions over the course of five major distinct editions.

For studying Montessori’s philosophical ideas, several other books are particularly valuable. Her second book, Antropologia Pedagogica (1910), translated as Pedagogical Anthropology (1912), is based on her lectures at the University of Rome. This book situates Montessori’s method in the context of trends of Italian anthropology in the early twentieth century, and it includes her discussions (including critiques) of figures such as Darwin, Lombroso, and her mentor Guiseppe Sergi. L’autoeducazione nelle Scuole Elementari (published in Italian in 1916 and variously translated as Spontaneous Activity in Education or as The Advanced Montessori Method) includes extensive discussions not only of her method but also of her epistemology (especially in chapters on “Imagination” and “Intelligence”), philosophy of mind, conceptions of agency and moral philosophy (especially in the chapter on “Will”), and philosophy of religion. Perhaps her most popular book today, and one that gives an excellent introduction to her philosophy, is The Absorbent Mind, a book originally published in English in 1949 based on her lectures in India, but substantially revised by Montessori and republished as La mente del bambino: Mente assorbente in 1952. This book focuses on education and development for children during the first six, and especially first three, years of life. Beyond specific claims about child development, it provides some of Montessori’s most polished articulations of the role of embodied movement in cognition, the nature of volition and character, the importance of social solidarity in political organization, and the role of love in human life.

In addition to published books, many of Montessori’s smaller speeches and articles are important for understanding her philosophy. Some of these lectures have been collected and published in their entirety; her 1913 Rome Lectures (MS 28) and 1946 London Lectures (MS 27) are particularly valuable not only for the explicit discussion of philosophical themes such as freedom, morality, and the nature of the world, but also because they span virtually her entire career, making it easy to see development in her ideas. Articles such as “Norme per una classificazione dei deficienti in rapporto ai metodi speciali di educazione” (Montessori 1902) or “La teoria lombrosiana e l’educazione morale” (Montessori 1903) help situate her philosophical ideas in the context of intellectual developments in early twentieth-century Italy. “The Unconscious in History” (Montessori 1948 [1973]) and “Cosmic Education Lectures” (Montessori 1935–6 [2007–9]) provide crucial insights into her metaphysics. Among the most important set of writings are those collected in the volume Education and Peace (MS 10). These discuss her vision of peace and the role of education in fostering peace (see Moretti 2021, and §7 below) and also provide insight into her political philosophy more broadly and her insightful philosophy of technology.

Others of Montessori’s books have important contributions to make to understanding her philosophy. The Secret of Childhood (MS 22), for example, discusses the nature of children’s and adults’ work, the role of guiding instincts, and various psychic deviations and repressions that arise from repression of those instincts. Psychogeometry and Psychoarithmetic (MS 16 & 20) give insight not only into Montessori’s philosophy of mathematics but her cognitive theory more broadly. Her works on art and music (especially MS 2: 299–314; MS 13: 283–354; MS 23: passim) elucidate the role of beauty and art in human life. And she has several works—including The Child in the Church (Montessori 1929 [1965]), The Mass Explained to Children (MS 19), and the lectures collected as Montessori. Dio e il bambino e altri scritti (De Giorgi 2013)—that are important for understanding her theology and philosophy of religion.

Notably, none of these works are devoted exclusively to topics one might consider “philosophical” in the narrow sense, and with the exception of William James (e.g., 9:116–7, 158) and some smatterings of Freud (1:75n, 22:4–7, 59, 81), Bergson (1:75n), or Nietzsche (9:257–8; 1909 [1912: 68]), there is relatively little direct engagement with figures considered central to customary canons within philosophy. Reading Montessori’s works as a philosopher—like reading the works of Freud or Darwin or even Nietzsche—thus often requires willingness to attend to the philosophical claims that Montessori advances while she is articulating her vision of human life for other, especially pedagogical or cultural-critical, purposes. Still, as this entry will show, her philosophical insights are important, far-reaching, and well-articulated once one knows where and how to look for them.

2. Philosophy of Education

Andrew Colgan has rightly noted “an unfortunate absence of Montessorian thought in our modern education and philosophy of education literature” (Colgan 2016: 137), and others have remarked that the Montessori “movement remains largely unstudied by educational researchers” (Whitescarver & Cossentino 2008: 2571). Montessori’s pedagogy is discussed among Montessori educators in professional trade publications such as The AMI Journal (from the Association Montessori Internationale) and Montessori Life (from the American Montessori Society), but academic philosophers of education have, thus far, given her remarkably little attention. The Journal of the Philosophy of Education, for example, has published only two articles that take Montessori as a focus (Frierson 2016a; 2021a) and only a handful that discuss her in any significant way (e.g., Engelmann 2022).

This neglect is not due to a lack of philosophical richness within Montessori’s thought. When Montessori returned to the University of Rome to study philosophy, she explicitly did so “wishing to undertake the study of normal pedagogy and of the principles upon which it is based” (Montessori 1909 [1912, 33]). She studied philosophical pedagogy with Luigi Credaro, the founder of a journal devoted to the philosophy of education (the Rivista Pedagogica, 1908–39) and an important Italian popularizer of Johann Friedrich Herbart’s pedagogy (Credaro 1900 [1915]; see Matellicani 2007: 221–3; D’Arcangeli 2021). Even while seeking to disclose broader philosophical insights from the study of children, Montessori saw herself as following Credaro’s lead, with a goal “to raise Pedagogy from the inferior position it has occupied as a secondary branch of philosophy, to the dignity of a definite science” (Montessori 1909 [1912: 5]).

Montessori is often seen as part of a broader tradition of progressive or child-centered pedagogy that includes Rousseau, Pestalozzi, and Dewey (see Kilpatrick 1914; Kazepides 1979; Mili 2018; Tonner 2022; Whitescarver & Cossentino 2008; but cf. L’Ecuyer 2023), and she has also been described as a constructivist about education and child development (see Ültanir 2012). During her own life, her pedagogy often suffered the twin fates of being condemned both as overly liberal for giving children too much freedom and also overly constrained or disciplined (see discussion in Quarfood 2022: 76–85).

Montessori’s philosophy of education has two central tenets that necessarily operate in tandem: the freedom of the child and the prepared environment. On the one hand, “that freedom is the basis of pedagogy is…not the outcome of a theory, but of human nature itself” (18:74). For this reason, children must be “free to choose their own work”,

free…from the constant external influence of one who wishes to instruct them…in order that they may be spontaneously free with regard to the laws of their inner nature. (17:76)

On the other hand, “the conditions of freedom” require that the child be provided with

the conditions most favorable to…development,…an environment which will allow the child to express himself spontaneously…, and…such material as is necessary and sufficient for auto-education. (17:78)

Christine Quarfood connects this interest in creating idyllic prepared environments with Michel Foucault’s concept of the heterotopia, wherein “the utopia of the autonomous child could be realized” (Quarfood 2022: 57; cf. Foucault 1984 [1997: 335]). Montessori’s philosophy of education emphasized providing children with rich environments within which they would not only find child-sized furniture and tools for practical life, but also carefully designed materials enabling them to follow various “guiding instincts” towards development (22: 178). She identified an innate desire for persistent concentration on self-chosen tasks, a “vital instinct” oriented towards “work”, “for without work his personality cannot organize itself and deviates from the normal lines of its construction” (22: 165). Her pedagogy is grounded on the construction of environments within which children can find activities that engage their attention and then the protection of the independence of the child once in those environments: “human beings placed in the most favorable conditions should be left free to develop themselves” (18:9). In these contexts, Montessori describes a process she calls “normalization”, which is not a standardization of children to a pre-given norm, but rather “a psychological recovery” whereby “a unique type of child appears, a ‘new child’; but really…the child’s true ‘personality’ allowed to construct itself normally” (1:134, 183).

Gesine Dörnberg has related the “inner creative powers” that Montessori sees as guiding free children with Schiller’s accounts of the “Spieltrieb und Bildungstrieb” (drives towards play and towards development), rightly pointing out that for both Montessori and Schiller, children’s development occurs in response to free activity in environments conducive to development (see Dörnberg 2006). Unlike Schiller, however, Montessori’s account of children’s self-directed activity conceptualizes that activity as “work” rather than play, though Dörnberg interestingly suggests that the difference in focus might be due a difference between the education of children (Montessori) and that of adults (Schiller). For the experience of freedom, “play” might—somewhat ironically—be more important for adults, for whom work typically has instrumental and productive connotations.

Relatedly, Tiziana Pironi has shown how Montessori “seems to take up Ellen Key’s challenge”, referring to the Nietzsche-inspired challenge issued by early twentieth century feminist philosopher Ellen Key, the challenge of developing early educational programs capable of raising humanity to a higher level. Pironi argues that while Key emphasized the important role of maternal love in this elevation and was pessimistic about formal schooling, Montessori shows how to develop institutions that can free women to engage in the workplace while providing children with liberty and love to flourish and develop (Pironi 2010).

Montessori’s commitment to children’s freedom gave rise to other important features of her pedagogy. Through observing children, she identified various “sensitive periods” during which children are particularly prone to developing various capacities because of special interest in work related to those developments. Given this “developmentalist” view of learning (see Colgan 2016: 132), many of Montessori’s central philosophical insights—e.g., about ethical life—play out in different ways at different stages. For example, as we will see in §5.1, Montessori rejects the view that agency requires adult capacities for reflection or deliberation, but she does not deny that those capacities transform the nature of human ethics. One of Montessori’s more controversial educational claims relates to the role of fantasy in children’s education: “for children under age 6, Montessori came to believe that fantasy had no place” (Lillard 2005: 183), and even in elementary years, when the “imagination” comes to play an important role in development, such imaginative exploration must be grounded in truth (see Lillard 2005: 186). For discussion of imagination in her pedagogy, see MS 1:161, 9:179–202; Lillard 2005: 183–90; Lillard: 2013.

Other important features of Montessori’s philosophy of education include her emphasis on sensory education (see, e.g., Montessori 1909 [1912: 167–223] and §4.1 below) and on embodied movement within pedagogy (see, e.g., 1:123–140 and §3.4 below). Moreover, given the centrality of concentrated work, Montessori sees interruption of children as antithetical to proper pedagogy (9:16–17), and she vehemently rejects not only punishment but also praise within education (1909 [1912: 21–7, 101–4]). In order to facilitate auto-education, Montessori materials make use of what she calls a “control of error”, namely mechanisms for self-correction built into materials. For example, one material—the cylinder blocks—consists of

a set of cylinders…which fit into corresponding sockets in a block of wood…The child begins by fitting them in one at a time, but finds when he comes to the end that he has made a mistake [because] one cylinder is left which is too large for the only remaining hole. (1:225)

Consistent with this principle of auto-education, Montessori teaches social and moral virtues through creating a classroom context within which children must activity solve problems of social coordination. For instance,

There is only one specimen of each object, and if a piece is in use when another child wants it, the latter…will wait for it to be released…The child comes to see that he must respect the work of others, not because someone has said that he must, but because this is a reality that he meets in his daily experience. There is only one between many children, so there is nothing for it but to wait…We cannot teach this kind of morality to children of three, but experience can. (1:202–3)

Montessori classrooms are also mixed-age classrooms, in which younger and older children work together and learn from one another. The teacher, in these Montessori contexts, prepares the environment, observes the children and modifies their environment in response to their needs, and gives short—and mostly non-verbal—presentations on how to use various specialized materials.

Importantly, Montessori never saw her philosophy of education as merely a philosophy of education. Andrew Colgan has argued that Montessori provides a quasi-Aristotelian response to Samuel Scheffler’s “Is-Ought Objection” within the philosophy of education. On Colgan’s account, Montessori’s scientific pedagogy provides a basis for distinguishing between accidental and essential human qualities where “accidental qualities are not likely to inform education, while the essential aspects of humans are the most applicable” (2016: 137). In what Montessori calls “normalization”, children left in freedom in healthy environments disclose what is truly essential for human flourishing. In that sense, Montessori developed a “pedagogical naturalism” (see Frierson forthcoming) within which observant and caring teacher-scientist-philosophers, through observing free children in healthy environments, discover fundamental truths about the human condition.

3. Metaphysics

Montessori’s metaphysics emphasizes life and spirit as active forces in the universe, in ways that Steven Gimbel and Anne Emerson have compared with G. W. F. Hegel’s teleological metaphysics (2009), Harriet Hunt has connected with Bergson’s concept of creative evolution (1912), and Patrick Frierson has called a “metaphysics of life” (2018). Several texts provide good entry points for her metaphysics, including the introduction and first chapters of Montessori’s Pedagogical Anthropology (1910 [1913]), where she directly tackles the evolutionary theories of her contemporaries; her elementary materials as described in From Childhood to Adolescence (MS 12) and To Educate the Human Potential (MS 6; see too Regni 2023: 99–102), where she outlines how the universe should be described to elementary children; and occasional essays that directly tackle metaphysical themes, such as “The Unconscious in History” (1948 [1973]) or “Lectures in Cosmic Education” (1935–6 [2007–9]).

This section briefly discusses four main themes of Montessori’s metaphysics, namely her vital teleology, what we might call a cosmic holism or metaphysical ecology, her philosophy of mind (especially as emergent, embodied, and enacted), and her theology (as it bears on God and materialism).

3.1 Vital Teleology and the Metaphysics of Life

In her Pedagogical Anthropology, Montessori invokes “final causes” as fundamental to life:

The term final causes refers to a series of phenomena that are met with only where there is life, and that tend towards a definite purpose or end. Living organisms take nutriment from their environment, to the end of assimilating it, that is, transforming it … into a … living part of themselves … [F]or example, [consider] the transformation of the fertilized ovum into the fully developed individual … Another form of final cause is seen in the actions of living creatures, which reveal … a consciousness that even in its most obscure forms guides them towards a destined end. (1910 [1913: 40])

Drawing not only from philosophical influences like Hegel, Schopenhauer, and Nietzsche but also from her contemporaries’ biology and especially embryology (e.g., Naegeli and De Vries), Montessori describes the “life” or “spirit” of humans and other beings in ways that reflect a broader spirit operative in world history (see Montessori 1:39).^[4] An emphasis on intrinsic, teleological principles in organic, psychological, and historical development permeates Montessori’s philosophy. Teleology is both individual and species-level, as life and spirit lead living things (including human beings) to cultivate their full development and to drive their species towards progress. This teleological “creative energy” is

the urge of life for the normal development of the individual. This is not a casual energy, like the energy of a bomb that explodes. It has a guide, a very fine directive—an unconscious directive—the aim of which is to develop a normal person [or other organism]. (17:225)

Montessori’s vital teleology is not limited to living things. Life not only “can be regarded as an energy that maintains life itself”, but it also “creates rocks and soil and … sustains the harmony of the earth” (10:62, 61); it is “the force that creates the world” (10:90) and “upon which depend not only the different forms of living beings but also the evolution of the earth itself” (7:104; see too 10:90; 1:49).

The trees … purify the air, … the coral … filters the sea … to keep the water pure[. T]he animals that populate the earth are unconscious of their cosmic mission, but without them the harmony of creation would not exist. (10:111n)

She refers to “the purpose of nature” (e.g., 17:89) and a “cosmic task” or “purpose” (e.g., 17:89; 1:49–50, 131) and describes “the cosmic function of each living being, and even of inanimate natural objects” (6:24, emphasis added). She claims that “Nature is … a harmony, a plan of construction”, and adds, “Everything fits into the plan: rocks, earth, water, plants, man, etc” (17:89; see too 6:70; 1948 [1973: 10]). She even suggests that life itself emerged to meet a need for harmony that preceded—both metaphysically and temporally—the origin of life itself:

Besides the hydrosphere and the atmosphere there is also the immense multitude of vital energies that forms the biosphere. Were it not for these, were the earth abandoned to the mercy of non-living energies, it would soon be plunged into the primitive chaos, into the confusion of the elements. (1948 [1971: 17]; see too 6:17–18)

3.2 Ecological Holism

As suggested by Montessori’s invocation of a plan of nature, Montessorian teleology—like Hegel’s (cf. Gimbel and Emerson)—is not limited to internal teleology within each organism. Rather, individuals’ teleological orientations serve a more holistic end:

[p]lant life and animal alike now have to be considered from two points of view, and the more important is that of their function in the cosmic plan. (6:24; see too 17:29)

While

one side of evolution deals with…individual and species perfection, [a]nother—and stronger—factor in evolutionary processes is concerned with the cosmic function of each living being, and even of inanimate natural objects, working in collaboration for the fulfillment of the Purpose of Life in the whole. (6:24)

The emphasis on biological interdependence present from her earliest works (e.g., 1910 [1913: 39]) anticipates the emergence of ecology as a fundamental component of biology, a connection Montessori explicitly cites in 1949, when she described “Ecology” as

a study…[that] reveals that [animals] are not here to compete with each other, but to carry out an enormous work serving the harmonious upkeep of the earth,

linking this point with her metaphysical claim that

The purpose of life is to obey the hidden command which ensures harmony among all and creates an ever better world. We are not created only to enjoy the world, we are created in order to evolve the cosmos. (1949: 89–90; see too 17:87–90, 165)

Some of Montessori’s ecological principles are now familiar facts. Organisms exist in ecosystems and fill various niches within those ecosystems, niches that both serve eco-systemic purposes and provide what is necessary for the organisms. Montessori’s account of adaptation shows how individual/species-level fitness and the ecological fitness are integrated. Organisms adapt to their environments by serving functions within those environments. But unlike most contemporary ecologists, Montessori sees a more basic teleology underlying these processes. For her, the ecological function of the organism is not merely the result of efficient-causal processes of selection and (consequent) adaptation. As in the individual case, teleology is fundamental. Adaptation is central to living organisms because it provides a mechanism for directing evolution in a way conducive to the promotion of ecological harmony and—in a more Hegelian or Nietzschean vein—the “evolution” of the cosmos (cf. Gimbel & Emerson 2009).

3.3 Emergent Mind

Given an overarching teleological and progressive metaphysics within which new forces arise to bring harmonious unity and complexity to conflicts at lower levels of organization, Montessori positions herself well to see the emergence of mind as a natural process. The mind is a “telluric force”, to use terminology Montessori adopts from the geologist Antonio Stoppani (Montessori 1936 [2008/1: 6]; see Stoppani 1898: 68). This force makes use of but supersedes biological forces in something like the way that biological forces make use of and supersede chemical forces. The mind marks a higher, more complex, and more agile form of teleologically-oriented agency than mere life, and it has laws of its own that are irreducible to mere biology, but mind is ultimately an aspect of the life of (conscious) organisms. This biologically-grounded account of consciousness arguably addresses the so-called hard problem of consciousness in a way akin to that hinted at by Thomas Nagel’s Mind and Cosmos (Nagel 2012) and also, as we will see, in a way consonant with her contemporary Henri Bergson (see especially Bergson 1907 [1911] and Hunt 1912) and with more recent emergentist and enactive concepts of mind developed by thinkers such as Francisco Varela, Eleanor Rosch, and Evan Thompson in The Embodied Mind (1991). Montessori’s emphasis on a “biological concept of freedom” (18:54) even contributes to understanding meaning and value in naturalistic terms.

Within Montessori’s teleological metaphysics, more complex ordered structures give rise to higher-order forces or powers in nature. Life emerged as a telluric force from complex order within and among organic molecules, and in a similar way, mental powers emerge in complex biological systems. Moreover, higher order powers emerge teleologically, to meet needs implicit in the functioning of the world; life arose to deal with geological forces that were insufficient to maintain harmoniously ordered complexity, and psychic forces arise in response to limits on the part of merely biological structures. After referring to the “hydrosphere… atmosphere…[and] biosphere”, Montessori adds,

Humanity … contribut[ed] a new energy: the additional envelope of a psychosphere, which participates in the perfecting of nature … A new energy … has come on our planet, to remove the tardiness of physical [including merely biological] energies and to give new impetus to the evolution of life. (1948 [1971: 17, 20])

Beyond her vitalist metaphysics, Montessori contributes to philosophy of mind through her pedagogy. She argues that in children’s development in utero and early infancy, we directly observe the development of conscious organisms from unconscious physical states. We see the “creation of faculties, the creation of consciousness” (17:31) from complex but not-yet-conscious life. Through her lifelong study of how conscious thought and action emerge in children, Montessori formulated a conceptual apparatus that emphasizes the “creative power of life” and the continuity between life and mind. The infant is a “spiritual embryo” (e.g., 1:53ff.; 17:102, 138), and Montessori’s philosophy lays out specific mechanisms by which this embryo develops into an intelligent and self-conscious human being. She details, for example, how a child must be “exposed to its environment” many times in order to come to conscious awareness of its features (17:37), how cognition of something depends upon a “transfer [of] information to the subconscious” that provokes the “interest” required in order for “the intelligence [to] accept it” (17:78–9), and how different “psychic organs … develop independently [and a]fterwards unite” (17:138). Even “[c]onsciousness develops bit by bit from the beginning. It starts out like a tiny membrane that grows in the course of time” (17:65).

3.4 Unconscious and Embodied Mind

Given her theory of how mind emerges from biological life, Montessori offers a sophisticated discussion of unconscious cognition, and—like many contemporary philosophers and scientists who participate in the embodied cognition research program—she sees mindedness as a kind of embodiment rather than something distinct from the moving body.

With respect to the unconscious, Montessori defines two central unconscious powers: horme—a kind of unconscious volition—and Mneme—a kind of unconscious cognition (or memory) (see 1:54n, 75).

Horme is the fundamental force of unconscious life, a “vital force within [each living thing] that guides [its] efforts towards their goal”, a “force” that “might be likened to will power” (1:75). She compares horme, albeit merely by “resembl[ance]”, to Bergson’s élan vitale or Freud’s libido, but says the concept was “first proposed” by the British educationalist Percy Nunn (1:75n). On the one hand, “Horme belongs to life in general” (1:75) and can even be called a “a great universal power” (1:229); “the will of nature” can be “called horme” and even “the roots of every plant” manifest something like a “power to choose that … which is conducive to its life” (1:246). Animal instincts and the teleological tendencies of all living things are recognizably continuous with the “interests” of the newborn in features of its environment conducive to its development (cf. Thompson 2007: 57–8). On the other hand, human infants’ horme lies on a developmental continuum that includes adult willing. Unconscious horme is not identical to its conscious manifestation. Following Nunn, Montessori defines the “will” as “conscious horme” (1:75; Nunn 1930 [2010]: 23). But the unconscious horme intrinsic to the life of the human animal in infancy organically and gradually develops into the conscious (and even self-conscious) willing of the adult, though a series of “successive stages…like the gradual rising of the sun whose light increases until midday” (17:38).

Horme, the most fundamental unconscious structure in Montessori’s philosophy of mind changes through adaptation to its environment. The susceptibility of horme to modification by experience is a kind of unconscious memory, to which Montessori (again following Nunn) gives the name “Mneme”, described by Percy Nunn in order to explain unconscious cognition:

[W]e shall bring together under a common designation all the varied phenomena referred by [Samuel] Butler to memory, conscious or unconscious. Following the German biologist Richard Semon, we shall speak of such phenomena as mnemic and shall give the name mnemé to the property of living substance which they exemplify. Memory, then, is conscious mneme just as conation is conscious horme. (Nunn 1930 [2010: 23])

Mneme, in its most general form, is a tendency to preserve effects of environmental interactions in future hormic (conative) tendencies. Just as “life has a tendency to activity” (horme), so too “it has the power to acquire and retain impressions” (6:17). As Montessori explains, “The impulse to activity leads to experience, which is retained in the mental organism” (6:17). The concept of Mneme thus links epistemic concepts of knowledge or cognition, the psychological concept of memory, and the biological concept of adaptation. Cognition extends basic biological adaptive tendencies, as Montessori observed in how infants and young children adapt through an “absorbent mind” that is a kind of unconscious memory, but also a psychological version of organismic adaptation. Both willing and cognition thus have unconscious correlates that are grounded in the biological life of human beings and studied in experimental pedagogy.

Montessori also emphasizes how cognition and volition are essentially embodied not merely in human brains but in the entire life of the human organism. The brain is one organ in a network of organs and processes that together manifest humans’ minds in the world. For example, “the movements of the vocal organs in language and those of the hand in … working out an idea” are “true ‘motor characteristics’ connected with mind” (22:67). With respect to pedagogy in particular, Montessori develops an approach that sees cognition as essentially embodied and enacted:

When we wish to make physical observations [related to intellectual development], why should we pay attention to the organ that only has some relation to the development of the intellect, when we can directly follow the intellect by observing the whole child? It is the whole body that concerns us. (18:62, emphasis shifted)

Like contemporary embodied cognition theorists, Montessori sees cognition as exercised by the whole body rather than merely the brain, though her emphasis is on the practical pedagogical task of making bodies minded through education.

Given the emphasis on embodied cognition in practice, Montessori emphasizes cognition as something active (what we would now call “enactive cognition”): “mind and movement are part of the same entity” (1:126), “by the most intelligent being we do not mean only the one who gathers most but also the being who moves the most” (18:165), and “Only by action can the child learn” (1:154). Arguably, “the first true Montessori revolution” was the claim that “movement and cognition [are] deeply intertwined” (Foschi 2012: 132; see 1:126, 154). Similarly, contemporary philosophers of mind who advocate embodied approaches to cognition often also encourage replacing conceptions of the mind as a representational or computational process with thinking of the mind as a kind of embodied activity. Alva Nöe, for example, says that “consciousness is more like dancing than it is like digestion” (2009: xii).

Both Montessori’s metaphysics of life and her pedagogical practice directed her attention to an embodied and enactive philosophy of mind within which unconscious cognitive structures of horme (unconscious volition) and Mneme (unconscious memory or cognition) play important roles.

3.5 God and Nature

In Mind and Cosmos, Thomas Nagel calls for a metaphysics that might include teleology and that would provide a plausible account of mind, consciousness, and values; Montessori’s metaphysics provides just such an account. Nagel, however, explicitly seeks a “secular conception” (2012: 22), while Montessori often freely connects nature’s purpose with a “governing intelligence” or “Divine Spirit” (see 6:28, 22:169). Moreover, Montessori was a practicing Catholic throughout her life, explicitly discusses God in several of her published works, and applied her pedagogical theories to religious instruction (see especially 1929 [1965: 3–20]; MS 19). Within contemporary scholarship on Montessori, the role of theism and religious (Catholic) concepts has become a significant issue, with views ranging from describing “the religious and Christian sensibility of Montessori” (Honegger Fresco 2018: 112; see too De Giorgi 2013, 2018, 2019) to those that emphasize her “series of open conflicts with the Catholic Church” (Romano 2020: 204; cf. Foschi & Cicciola 2019; Moretti & Dieguez 2018, 2019). Others emphasize her connections to theosophy (Giovetti 2009), including claiming that “Montessori was a theosophist” (Wilson 1985; see too Wylie 2008). Giacomo Cives helpfully describes the overall tenor of the debate:

the interpretation of Montessori’s [religious] thought…in De Giorgi and Foschi…[is] fundamentally dialectical, in a primarily Catholic key for the former and secular for the latter. (2015: 123)

Meanwhile Patrick Frierson (forthcoming) argues that Montessori’s philosophy of religion can contribute to debates about the hiddenness of God, the role of embodiment and liturgy in religion, and the connection between a moral sense and divine commands; and Natalie Carnes (2015: 319)

continues the work of feminist and liberationist theologians by noting the importance of children to theological reflection…by establishing Montessori as a figure worthy of theological consideration,

particularly in what Carnes calls her “supple theological anthropology that offers a sophisticated and persuasive approach to original sin”.

Ultimately, Montessori uses the concept of God to direct attention back to her philosophy’s methodological and ethical core: the child. She emphasizes “the child’s own powers, given to him by the Creator” (1929 [1965: 4]) the “wonderful powers of divine creation in the child’s soul” (1929 [1965: 5]), and the ways that “children in spiritual freedom disclose the will of God” (in De Giorgi 2013: 325–6, my translation). When she seems to theologize pedagogy, saying “we must not just see the child, but God in him”, she immediately makes this theology immanent and naturalized within the child: “We must respect the laws of creation in him. We must not think we can make him; if we do, we are spoiling the Divine work” (7:96). Her personal faith in God and her theistic statements in writings directed towards religious believers thus primarily serve to enhance the dignity of the child.

4. Epistemology

4.1 Interested Empiricism

As Andrew Colgan notes,

Montessori’s Method presents the conditions of an epistemologically-sensitive education, a philosophy contingent on epistemological questions of the validity of the senses and induction. (2016: 127)

Her broadly pragmatist epistemology is “hierarchical” in that “perceptual knowledge (or lower-order concepts) are the building blocks of higher-order concepts” (Colgan 2016: 128, see too Lillard 2005: 21). Her epistemology is hierarchical or empiricist in that she identified the senses as “the foundation of the entire intellectual organism” such that “there can be neither ideas nor imagination, nor any intellectual construction, if we do not presuppose an activity of the senses” (18:260, cf. 17:193–4). While Montessori shares with empiricists such as John Locke and David Hume a conviction that all ideas have their origin in the senses, however, she differs from them in (at least) four important ways.

First, Montessori’s empiricism is interested, in the sense that sensory processes are volitional:

In the world around us, we do not see everything … but only some things that suit us … We do not concentrate our attention haphazardly, … but according to an inner drive. (18:185)

Consistent with her enactive view of the mind (§3.3), perception is a modification of a dynamic, embodied system actively engaged with a world.

Second, and following from the way senses are interested, Montessori rejects the broadly Lockean notion that senses are passive. Partly because of her conviction that life is essentially active, but primarily through her work actually educating the senses of young children, she recognizes even raw sensory experience as requiring an “attention which…is not passive, but corresponds to an activity” because

stimuli will appeal in vain to the senses, if the internal cooperation of attention be lacking … It is not enough that an object should be before our eyes to make us see it; it is necessary that we should fix our attention upon it; an internal process, preparing us to receive the impression of the stimulus, is essential. (15:229; 9:172)

An infant “sees only a part, determined by his feelings and interests” (22:49), and even among mature epistemic agents, “untrained persons” cannot see “stellar phenomena by means of the telescope or the details of a cell under the microscope” (9:99). As Colgan puts it, in this “active consciousness view”,

the child must begin to discriminate the sensations and link them to their sources by way of acting in the world and awaiting feedback (from sensations to perceptions). (2016, 134n18, 131)

Third, Montessori sees sensory awareness as trainable and cultivatable. Unlike Locke, for whom sensory distinctions are accomplished “without … labour; but at first view, by [a] natural power” (Locke 1689: IV.i.4 [1975: 526]), Montessori observed that even the most basic sensory discrimination requires, for its development, cultivation through “sensory gymnastics” or “sensory exercises” (Montessori 1909 [1912: 168–76]). Her more thoroughgoing empiricism provides an answer to David Hume’s famous missing shade of blue, which Hume raises as a possible counter-example to strict empiricism. Hume suggests that if one experienced a range of colors “except one particular shade of blue” (1748: §2.8), one would be able imagine this shade and thereby form an idea one had never experienced. Montessori, however, found that discrimination among shades is not merely a passive capacity but an acquired skill. She developed a series of color tablets of different shades on which students train their sensory discrimination through a series of increasingly difficult distinctions. As it turns out, it is quite difficult even to properly distinguish shades of colors physically present to one’s senses; even “many…adults” are often unable to “distinguish shades of color” (17:195). To develop the ability to see colors, much less to imagine them, requires not only experience, but sensory exercises in which one “keep their attention fixed in these exercises in such a way that they will continue the exercises … until they have developed the ability to distinguish the shades” (18:160).

Fourth and finally, Montessori’s empiricist epistemology holds open substantial space for a broadly empiricist account of unconscious intelligence. Not only are many of the interests that guide attention unconscious, but “every human being does his most intelligent work in the subconscious, where psychic complexes … organize themselves to carry out work which we are unable to do consciously” (6:13). Given the broadly empiricist notion that cognitive activity consists largely of “associative or reproductive activities” (9:147; see Hume 1740 [1978: 12–13]), and given a philosophy of mind within which conscious ideas and beliefs are just forms of unconscious “Mneme”, Montessori can extend “what used to be called the Association of Ideas” to the association of what Montessori calls “engrams” (borrowed from Richard Semon) and describes as unconscious “traces of [experiences] left behind in the mneme” which traces “make a mind powerful” when “sub-conscious … association[s] of engrams [that are] spontaneous…organize themselves to carry out work which we are unable to do consciously” (6:11–13).

Overall, then, Montessori develops a distinctive empiricist epistemology, informed by her pedagogical naturalism. The senses are the foundation of intelligence, knowledge, and understanding, and further developments occur by means of principles of association amongst ideas formed in the light of experience. (For more specifically on concept development, see Colgan 2016: 131–4. For a critique of her epistemology for not taking sufficiently seriously the Bergsonian idea of an innate human “tendency to relate”, see Hunt 1912: 19–20; and for critique of her sensory gymnastics as “based on an outworn and cast-off psychological theory”, see Kilpatrick 1914: 42–62). Her view is empiricist, though she focuses more on the cultivation of the senses as elements in an embodied cognitive system than on sense data as brute input. Moreover, her treatment of senses as active, interest-governed, and cultivatable capacities, and her emphasis on unconscious processing, distinguish her empiricism from that of philosophical predecessors like Locke and Hume.

4.2 Intellectual Virtues

In the context of her interested empiricism and concern with cognitive development, Montessori elaborates a distinctive virtue epistemology. Like virtue reliabilists such as Ernest Sosa (1991; 2007) or John Greco (2002; see too Battaly 2008), Montessori sees basic cognitive faculties as faculties the reliable exercise of which is epistemically excellent, but like virtue responsibilists such as Linda Zagzebski or Jason Baehr (Zagzebski 1996; Baehr 2011; 2016), she affirms that agents must be able to be responsible for genuine intellectual virtues. She reconciles these views by showing that even apparently basic capacities such as sensation are cultivatable and due to exercises of agency.

Beyond this theoretical contribution to virtue epistemological theory, Montessori has important insights that deepen our understanding of particular traits often considered intellectual virtues. Patrick Frierson (2016b; 2020) has discussed Montessori’s distinctive accounts of epistemic character, intellectual love, sensory acuity, intellectual patience and quickness, intellectual humility, and intellectual courage. Moreover, consistent with Montessori’s emphasis on embodied cognition, she also sees physical dexterity or excellence in intelligent movement as a kind of intellectual virtue (see, e.g., 1:123–140). Beyond those virtues, Montessori’s emphasis on “deeply engaged states of concentration”, as well as her specific pedagogical practices, enhance what has come to be known as flow (Rathunde 2023: 271; see too Rathunde 2001; Rathunde & Csikszentmihalyi 2005). Montessorian freedom and flexibility can also contribute to creativity (Fleming et al. 2019; Lillard 2005: 163–4). Angeline Lillard provided, and regularly updates, the most comprehensive discussion of Montessori’s method in relation to contemporary psychological appraisals of development and proper functioning (see Lillard 2005 and subsequent editions).

5. Moral Philosophy

In the context of her pedagogical work, Montessori sought in “the study of the child” an “infinitely wider influence, extending to all human questions” and in particular the “unknown quantity, the discovery of which might enable the adult to solve his individual and social problems” (22:1). This work disclosed a “new child” and new possibilities for human flourishing. In particular, Montessori came to see that children have a sort of agency that strives to do challenging work independently and that, when placed in conditions conducive to flourishing, gives rise to several crucial Montessori virtues, including what she calls “character” (1:174), “respect for the work of others and consideration for the rights of others” (9:70), and a deep sort of unity she calls “social solidarity” (1:237). Moreover, by focusing on the development of moral life in children, and particularly young children, Montessori drew attention to the essentially embodied and enacted nature of (moral) agency and ethical life.

5.1 Agency and Independence

As noted in §2, freedom lies at the core of Montessori’s pedagogical practice. Children must be left in freedom to make their own choices about what activities to engage in and what work to do. Given her conception of horme as continuous with self-conscious volition, this pedagogy involves a deference to agency—even when unconscious—as worthy of direct respect. Human beings have a natural teleological orientation and when given freedom in conditions conducive to flourishing, we naturally pursue that flourishing. Thus, rather than disciplining supposedly unruly inclinations, Montessori seeks to open up space for children’s “guiding instincts” to direct them. Unlike other animals, however, the human child “must construct his own adaptation” (17:82). Children’s “absorbent mind” (1: passim; 17:85) allows for psychological adaptation to the cultures in which they develop in a way that is consistent with their own agency and requires no coercion, and that eventually gets incorporated into the self-conscious agency of the adult. Given opportunities to exercise agency, children seek a “conquest of independence” by which they “aim directly and energetically at functional independence” (1:75).

In her context, Montessori’s emphasis on children’s agency also came into conflict with prevalent views about original sin; many saw Montessori as denying the presence of original sin infecting the agency of young children (see Giovetti 2009: 59; Cives 2019: 229; Quarfood 2022: 194), to which she responded that while she did not deny the presence of original sin, children’s agency was actually less corrupted than adult agency because it lacked the negative effects of accrued self-conscious sins (see De Giorgi 2019: 78–9; Quarfood 2022: 195).

With respect to recent philosophy of action and philosophy of childhood, Montessori’s views set herself apart from dominant trends that take adult agency as paradigmatic for the nature of agency and that view paternalism towards children as prima facie acceptable (e.g., Schapiro 1999). Rather than seeing second-order reflection and/or rational deliberation as essential for the sort of agency worthy of direct (non-paternalistic) respect, Montessori sees these features as adult modifications of a more basic and respect-worthy sense of autonomous agency, one that consists of persistent work on self-chosen tasks governed by (first-order) norms of excellence. Relatedly, Montessori’s view on childhood can be seen in terms of Nussbaum’s notions of internal and external capabilities:

children’s incapacities for autonomy are best understood as the consequence of an absence of external conditions necessary for children to exercise capacities they already have internally, rather than intrinsic limitations based on their stage of life while many think that children lack the internal capability for self-direction. (Frierson 2016a: 332)

Montessori’s child-centered pedagogy respects children’s agency and resists approaches to education that emphasize externally-imposed discipline and correction (see, e.g., Montessori 1909 [1912: 86–106]).

5.2 Character, Respect, and Solidarity

Montessori refers to free children in environments conducive to freedom as “normalized” (see 1:202, 22:133), by which she does not mean that they are brought to conform to some pre-given set of norms or that they come to be identical in some way, but that they undergo “a psychological recovery, a return to normal conditions” (22:134). Whereas children subject to discipline, oppression, or deprivation have to repress natural expressions of their agency, children in conditions of freedom can be fully human and thereby flourish as human beings. This process provides Montessori with a naturalistic means for identifying conditions of human excellence (see Colgan 2016: 136–7). Three key pillars are central to Montessorian ethical life: character, respect, and solidarity.

Montessori introduces an extensive discussion of character in The Absorbent Mind by explaining that “ideas remain vague in all parts of the world as to what character really is” (1:173). In the context of that discussion, she applies to the concept of character elements that she elsewhere associates with normalization, work, or independence. Character in this sense involves the capacity and tendency to pursue self-chosen and norm-governed work in ways that involve persistence, concentration, and a striving for increased perfection. Unlike Aristotelean character, which is a matter of habit and, if virtuous, of the substantive “correctness” of one’s habits, Montessorian character is virtually identical with agency as such, or with attentive work, or with a certain sort of independence. In important respects, her concept of character draws from Nietzschean notions of self-perfection and elevation of the individual, as emphasized by Martin Simons (1988, passim). To have character is to be attracted by self-elevation towards excellence, or what Montessori often calls “perfection”. Character is this sense is arguably the preeminent Montessorian moral value.

Montessori’s second component of ethical life, namely “respect”, is specifically “for the work of others” (9:70, see too 1:202). Respect takes as its object not others’ mere choices or preferences or pleasures but their self-directed and norm-governed work. This respect for others is both a moral requirement and a natural psychological tendency of those with character. The obligatory nature of respect shows up with children who have not yet established character, for whom a teacher or caregiver may need to “be a policeman” to protect the free activity of other children (17: 229). More fundamentally, however, character is a natural outgrowth of character: “after these manifestations” of character

a true discipline is established, the most obvious results of which are closely related to what we will call “respect for the work of others and consideration for the rights of others”. (9:70)

Respect is not a limitation of one’s own agency but the natural fruit of its development. Gimbel and Emerson link this fulfillment of individual in the social whole to similar themes in Hegel (2009: 48), while Frierson shows how it responds to Nietzsche’s overly egoistic conception of the Übermensch (see 2022: 71–2). Perhaps because the paradigmatic forms of respect involve leaving one another to complete their work without interruption, William Kilpatrick (see §8 below) objects that Montessori does not sufficiently emphasize social cooperation in her classrooms.

Montessori does have a place for more substantive forms of social cooperation, however. She calls the third element of ethical life “social solidarity” or “society by cohesion” (1:237, 17:233). Consistent with broadly Hegelian notions of individual in society (cf. Gimbel & Emerson 2009), she advocates a social unity that goes beyond mere respect, one within which different individuals unite into a shared will or shared agent. There are other elements of a fully developed Montessorian ethic, including the role of obedience and hierarchy in social organization (see 1:229–38, 12:8). Character, respect, and solidarity, however, form the most basic pillars of human flourishing and ethical life.

5.3 Embodied Ethics

One relatively unique feature of Montessori’s moral theory is her emphasis on the embodied nature of ethical life. Her pedagogical concerns and embodied notion of cognition included an embodied approach to moral virtue. To even have a “will” at all, “some mastery of the body is also necessary”, and “Voluntary action … increases in degree as its dependent muscles perfect themselves and so achieve the necessary conditions for seconding its efforts” (9:137, 140).

Montessorian virtues are thus embodied virtues. “Character formation” is like learning the piano (17:236–7) and requires that one “make a selection among the muscular coordinations of which he is capable, persist in them, and thus begin to make such coordinations permanent” (9:129). Likewise with respect and solidarity, “When [one] begins to respect the work of others”, one must be able to “walk about without knocking against his companions, without stamping on their feet, without overturning the table” (9:129–30; cf. 17:139). A child who must “wait for [a work material] to be released … every hour of the day for years … respecting others and … waiting one’s turn”, learns bodily practices of mutual respect, such as standing, diverting attention to avoid interruption, speaking softly if necessary to get attention, and lifting the replaced material with care. Eventually, embodied ethical practices “become a habitual part of life” (1:202). Moreover, concrete bodily movements constitute forms of “grace and courtesy”, “exactitude and grace of action” that is a kind of “will-power” (see Bettman 2003; Montessori 1912: 84, 353, 365–66; cf. 17:139). This emphasis on embodied grace and courtesy adds important embodied dimensions to contemporary discussions of the role of politeness in moral life (e.g., Buss 1999).

6. Feminism

Montessori was a feminist before becoming a pedagogue and before starting formal study in philosophy. From her childhood, she broke barriers for women in Italy, such as by attending a science and engineering school traditionally reserved for male students and then becoming one of the first women to attend (and graduate from) medical school (see Kramer 1976: 32–51; Babini & Lama 2000: 31–43). She represented Italy at major international women’s congresses in 1896 in Berlin, where she argued for equal pay for equal work and represented Italian women’s opposition to colonialism, and then again in 1899 in London (see Kramer 1976: 55; Moretti 2021: 105). As a student and young professor, she supported feminist organizations such as Associazione per la Donna (Association for the Woman) and Pensiero e Azione (Thought and Action), including working with the latter to promote women’s suffrage (see Moretti 2021: 34–38, 104; Babini & Lama 2000: 164–81, 231–37; Babini 2023: 23). We could even

go so far as to assert that feminism, understood in the broadest sense as a concern with the condition of women in social, political, and even private political life, was the guiding thread of the intellectual and scientific formation of the young Montessori. (Babini 2023: 21; cf. Babini & Lama 2000).

Although “her involvement with feminist associations ceased to be a major active influence on her, … it would continue to resonate with her work for years to come” (Moretti 2021: 68; see too Babini & Lama 2000: 155–7).

Montessori’s feminism fits within moderate nineteenth-century Italian “practical feminism” (Babini 2023: 21; cf. Babini & Lama 2000: 85–90; Moretti 2021: 36; Buttafuoco 1988). Rather than primarily focusing on political power (e.g., suffrage), practical feminists emphasized women’s capacities to take on active roles within civil society. Montessori’s success as a doctor, researcher, co-director of a major psychiatric institution, and university professor fit well within this practical feminist agenda:

the particular form of her feminist militancy…was always focused on demonstrating the professional capacities of women in traditionally masculine fields. (Babini & Lama 2000: 240)

Relatedly, when she developed her pedagogy, Montessori created classroom contexts in which both boys and girls explored their interests and developed freely in healthy environments that did not distinguish gender roles, and in which children of all genders demonstrated intellectual and moral development beyond expectations of contemporary psychologists and pedagogues (see too Pironi 2010, regarding how this approach was influenced by Ellen Key’s calls for more liberatory education).

At the same time, Montessori took practical feminism in a specifically scientific direction, developing a “scientific feminism”, or “science understood as a form of feminist militancy”, with several dimensions (Babini & Lama 2000: 85 and passim; Babini 2023: 23). Most obviously, Montessori showed how women contribute to scientific fields, including medicine, anthropology, and properly scientific pedagogy. She also direct tackled misogynistic anthropological theories that purported to show women’s essential/biological inferiority to men. She cites

a very widespread belief of long standing that is confirmed in the name of science: that woman is biologically, in other words totally, inferior, that the volume of her brain is condemned by nature to an inferiority against which nothing can prevail (1910 [1913: 256])

and, without endorsing phrenological methodology as such, she shows how the best phrenological research available at the time “arrived at an opposite conclusion: namely, that they can demonstrate a greater development of brain in woman” (1910 [1913: 257]). She highlights the “contradiction between existing anthropological and social conditions” (1910 [1913: 258]) and argues for elevating women’s status.

In addition to these scientific contributions, Montessori’s scientific feminism promoted scientific literacy as a means for elevating women’s status in society. Montessori reportedly said, “my wish is for women to fall in love with scientific reasoning” (Kramer 1976: 80) and Babini explains,

With this unusual but intentional wording Maria Montessori sought to identify rationality itself as a guide to female conduct, even in the most personal and intimate choices, including marriage…The choice of motherhood was thus referred back to a female consciousness “illuminated” by science. (Babini 2023: 22)

Montessori hoped to elevate women’s authority in both social life and their own personal lives through equipping them with the scientific fluency by which they could demonstrate rational bases for their claims.

In specifically promoting scientific education in areas related to motherhood and sexuality, Montessori advocated a kind of “maternal” feminism, consistent with an overall trend within Italian feminism wherein “women were encouraged to fight for their rights without relinquishing the putatively defining traits of their gender, especially their reproductive functions” (Moretti 2021: 36), and also influenced by Ellen Key’s feminist emphasis on the value of maternal love and the tensions between maternity and freedom (see Key 1909; Pironi 2010). Montessori warns that women ignorant of science lack both knowledge and power and can be “made the instrument for the birth of weak [and] diseased children” (1910 [1913: 473]). Conversely, as early as 1902, Montessori said,

Women’s social victory will be a maternal victory, one destined to ameliorate, to render stronger the human species. [A woman,] after having gone on to conquer social labor, will take a further step: she will conquer her biological labor, which is the true goal of feminism: the victory of her own children. (quoted in Babini 2023: 22)

This passage has been “criticized by Italian feminist historians” (see Babini 2023: 22), and Montessori’s invocation of broadly eugenic ideas of “weakly, diseased, or degenerate children” (Montessori 1910 [1913: 473]) is equally subject to criticism. In promoting this maternal feminism, Montessori also risks “biologism” or “biological determinism”, which “discounts a history of personal, social, and political efforts that aim at affirming women’s diversity” (Moretti 2021: 37; see too Botti 2007: 39–40). Consistent with her teleological vision of humanity, Montessori emphasizes women’s role in the development of the human species, though her maternal feminism is not entirely as traditional as it might seem. While not challenging the gender essentialism that links femininity and maternity, not only do her classrooms and pedagogical writings consistently challenge gender stereotypes, but even within her association of women and reproduction, her primary emphasis remains squarely on empowering women over their reproductive capacities. Her “Sexual morality in education”, for example, presented at the National Congress of Italian Women in 1908 (Montessori 1912), sought to empower women within domestic and social life (see Babini & Lama 2000: 240–244), and she even condemned marriage as a patriarchal institution in which “the wife is a slave, for she has married in ignorance and has neither…knowledge nor…power” (1910 [1913: 473]).

Montessori’s feminism was also, from the start, a pacifist feminism (see §7). At her first international women’s conference, she combined advocacy for women’s rights with condemnations of colonialism, and her work with Associazione per la Donna starting in 1896 included “launch[ing] a petition against the colonial occupations in East Africa” (Moretti 2021: 104–5). As Moretti shows,

these early political efforts [on behalf of women] were intertwined with the educator’s pedagogical work and prompted her to start thinking of an approach to education that could transform children into proponents of peace. (Moretti 2021: 105)

Unsurprisingly, within a maternal feminism oriented towards equipping women to foster the improvement of humanity, Montessori saw peace as one of its greatest fruits:

As soon as she [woman] becomes a free human being with her own social rights, she will begin to work for peace; she will know how to ignite the divine light among the minds that lose it in selfishness, and instill in hearts the holy love of humanity—which is widespread maternal love in the world. (Montessori 1899 [2019: 7], quoted in Moretti 2021: 34)

Before closing this section, it’s worth adding one final contribution of Montessori’s feminism to her broader philosophy. Fundamental to her philosophical methodology is profound awareness of often-invisible oppressions of children, as adults paternalistically care for them in ways that ultimately undermine their dignity and development. In those contexts, she often draws on struggles for women’s rights as analogies for children’s rights.

Some time ago, a very important question arose—that of the role of women…The same kinds of things were said at that time about women as are now being said about children and their role in society. In those days, too, it seemed absurd to speak of women as forgotten human beings. “We’ve neglected women, you say? How can that be, when we do everything possible for them, when we love them so much, when we protect them and are ready to die for them, when we work all our lives for them”. (10:45)

Just as patronizing, paternalistic treatment of women wore a veneer of love while utterly neglecting dignity, so too with children:

Yes, of course, we all love children, we love them a great deal, but we do not appreciate them for what they really are…We do not do what we should for them, because we have no idea what it is we should do, what place they should occupy in society…The adult commits a serious error when he takes himself for the child’s creator and believes he must do everything for him…And all he succeeds in being is a dictator, whose wishes the child must blindly obey. The adult has considered this very kind of dictatorship to be one of his own social problems, but he has never regarded it as a social problem of children. (10:45–6)

Montessori was a feminist before she was an advocate for children, and feminism provides a lens through which she saw the intense oppression of children. Maternal feminism showed her the severe stakes of women’s oppression in ways that highlighted the importance of advocating for children. Scientific feminism provided a context for pursuing and propagating the knowledge needed to identify and overcome tyrannies that destroy women’s and children’s lives. Pacifist feminism highlighted the role that improved conditions for women and children will ultimately play for the future of humanity itself.

7. Peace, Education, and the Rights of the Child

One of Montessori’s most oft-quoted claims is that “establishing peace is the work of education” (10: 21), and one of the most important recent developments in Montessori scholarship is Erica Moretti’s The Best Weapon for Peace (2021), in which she shows in detail the extent to which Montessori’s pedagogy was developed with peace-work in mind. (See too Parkin 2024, who defends the view that Montessori is what he calls an “educational pacifist”.) For Montessori, the “goal was peace; teaching was the method” (Moretti 2021: 4), and this interest in peace extended from feminist struggles that preceded her work in education through nominations of Montessori for the Nobel Peace Prize near the end of her life. Throughout,

the educator repeatedly reconceived her theory of peace, with each revision expanding to include a larger set of relationships and agents. Her vision evolved in concentric circles of influence, first as a form of harmony between the child’s own body and immediate environment, then with the family, and then further outward with the nation-state and the world. (Moretti 2021: 12)

Many of Montessori’s writings on peace are held in archives with curated access, particularly in the Association Montessori Internationale archives in Amsterdam; the best published collection of philosophical works on peace is her Education and Peace (Montessori MS 10). This work lays out a detailed diagnosis of the state of the world when the speeches collected there were delivered (1932–9, cf. Van Hook 2023). There Montessori highlights the fundamental interconnectedness of human beings and the irrationality of war, emphasizing, for example, that “The impoverishment of one nation does not make another nation richer” and pointing out how

The [first world] war in Europe has already shown that the victors have not gained new energies and benefits from their victory, as victors did in the past. An entirely new phenomenon has occurred: defeated peoples have become a danger, a burden, an obstacle. The victors must aid them and help them get back on their feet. (10:22)

She discusses how mass communication, rapid transportation, and economic interdependence have transformed human beings into a “single organism, one nation”, though this unity is something of which “we are not yet fully aware” (10:22–3).^[5]

Into this context, Montessori offers education as a means to peace. Contrary to much contemporary “peace education”, however, which is often “content-oriented” (Moretti 2021: 5), she argues that a system of education within which children are able to work together freely is the only way to promote a lasting human peace.

Achieving peace was a twofold process: first, the child would be called to develop an internal peace, a harmony with the environment, and a moral sense to guide her acts. Competition, injustice, and abuse of power found no place in a Montessori classroom. Thanks to an innovative pedagogy, the child would grow in response to her own bodily and intellectual needs, fulfilling her own potential. Second, having developed into a satisfied adult, she would be gratified by her own work and would be able to find a place within the larger ecology of the world. The resulting adult would have a natural propensity toward peace; she would find joy in her work and in her relationships with people. Montessori’s progressive approach would produce self-determining adults naturally opposed to war. (Moretti 2021: 4)

From the start, Montessori’s pedagogical approach was oriented towards avoiding the oppressions and influences that steer children towards fearful, egotistic, and violent ways of relating towards their world. In conditions of freedom, and particularly in conditions where children engage with their environment in accordance with their guiding instincts, but also where ordinary social problems arise amongst those free children, the character, respect, and solidarity that naturally arise create a solid foundation on which peaceful cooperation among adults can become a reality. Just as Montessorian classrooms are spaces wherein conflict does not help children freely work on materials that satisfy their needs, so too the world is a place within which conflict does not reward the victors. What Montessori identified as necessary was not didactic exhortations or instruction related to peace, but the creation of prepared environments wherein peaceful freedom became a lived reality incorporated into the psyches of future adults.

Beyond that pedagogical project, Montessori also advocated for specific humanitarian and political changes, primarily through emerging international organizations. Two of the most important such efforts were the “White Cross” and the “Social Party of the Child”. The inspiration for the White Cross came from Montessori’s efforts, especially during the First World War, to provide safe educational environments for child victims of war. She worked closely with American philanthropist and educator Mary Rebecca Cromwell, who set up Montessori-inspired schools for refugees from Belgium and northern France. From this work came the idea for the White Cross.

Whereas before World War I she had envisioned educating children to peace through a prepared environment and scientifically trained teachers, she now observed the traumatizing effects of war and realized that her approach—and even education per se—was not enough. The war had such a profound and long-lasting impact on the child’s psyche that new practices were needed in order to restore his mental and physical capacity and bring him back to being a collaborative individual, able to live harmoniously within society. (Moretti 2021: 70)

The fundamental idea was to create an organization that would meet the spiritual and intellectual needs of victims of war, especially children, in much the way that the Red Cross worked to meet their physical, medical needs. (White in this context refers to the color of the nerves, in contrast to the red color of blood.)

As noted in §6, Montessori’s feminist attention to the paternalistic treatment and denial of rights of women made her attuned to similar violations of children’s dignity. Just as she fought for women’s suffrage early in her life, so later she advocated the creation of a “Ministry of the Child” and a “Social Party of the Child”, going so far as to refer to the need for “a second French Revolution aimed at promoting the rights of children” (Moretti 2021: 173). Montessori went as far as “drafting the statutes of the Social Party of the Child”, in which she argued that “far from needing to be sheltered from the ills of the adult world, children should in fact take an active role in political and civic debates” (Moretti 2021: 174–5), and she established the Social Party of the Child as an independent organization to “ensure the moral, social and economical rights of all that part of humanity which is in the process of development” (Montessori, October 1937 AMI circular letter, available through the AMI archives in Amsterdam).

Consistent with her pedagogical emphasis on freedom and a philosophical approach that sought to learn from children, these organizations would serve to create contexts within which children were personally empowered: having control over their own actions within the safe environments of the White Cross or having the power to effect political change through the Social Party of the Child.

8. Responses to Montessori

Early response(s) to Montessori’s work reflect the tumults of the times in which she lived. On one hand, she was received with international acclaim during her early career. Her participation in feminist conferences in Berlin and London was hailed in international media. Throughout her life, educators around the world sought her trainings and her insights. She was nominated three times (1949, 1950, 1951) for the Nobel Peace Prize (see Moretti 2021: 217). Her works were and are widely translated and disseminated throughout the world.

On the other hand, particularly after the outbreak of the First World War and then with the rising prominence of Dewey in the United States and other progressive educators in Europe, not to mention the widespread adoption of so-called “factory” or “banking” models of education in the U.S. and U.K. and fascist suppression of liberatory education in Germany and also (after initial support) in Italy, Montessori’s thought as educator, scientist, and philosopher was increasingly marginalized over the course of the twentieth century. Her choice to leave the university and focus practitioners informed by her philosophy played some role in this marginalization, but we should not underestimate the role of her sex, nationality, and advocacy on behalf of children. Freud, an Austrian man who built a movement around analysis of adults, had little trouble gaining academic attention even from outside the academy. Montessori, an Italian woman focusing her energy on the insights disclosed by children, was rapidly sidelined. Thus, recent responses to Montessori are relatively few. Most philosophers of education treat her as a marginal member of a line of progressive pedagogues from Rousseau through Freire or bell hooks. Particularly among Anglophone philosophers, Dewey rather than Montessori is emblematic of early twentieth-century progressive education. In other fields of philosophy, she has been virtually ignored, for many of the reasons other women have been marginalized in the history of philosophy (see Shapiro 2016).

Christine Quarfood (2022) has detailed how various European philosophers and educators, particularly in Italy before and during the rise of Mussolini, responded to Montessori’s ideas. She highlights the vibrant debate during the fascist years about whether or not Montessori’s pedagogical and especially philosophical ideas were compatible with fascism, ultimately ending with the dismissal of Montessori from Italy after her speeches on peace became known to Mussolini. However, the rest of this section briefly focuses on the two most important early critiques of Montessori from U.S.-based philosophers of education: John Dewey (1859–1952) and William Heard Kilpatrick (1871–1965).

Dewey’s criticism is straightforward. In Democracy and Education, he says of Montessori,

Even the kindergarten and Montessori techniques are so anxious to get at intellectual distinctions, without “waste of time,” that they tend to ignore—or reduce—the immediate crude handling of the familiar material of experience, and to introduce pupils at once to material which expresses the intellectual distinctions which adults have made. But the first state of contact with any new material, at whatever age of maturity, must inevitably be of the trial and error sort. An individual must actually try, in play or work, to do something with material in carrying out his own impulsive activity, and then note the interaction of his energy and that of the material employed. This is what happens when a child at first begins to build with blocks, and it is equally what happens when a scientific man in his laboratory beings to experiment with unfamiliar objects. (1916: 180–81)

Dewey offers this critique in the context of a broader description of educational approaches whose “fundamental fallacy” is “in supposing that experience on the part of pupils may be assumed” (1916: 180). In Montessori’s case, the supposed assumption is not warranted, but the underlying critique aptly gets at a fundamental distinction between Dewey’s and Montessori’s methods, one Dewey reiterates later in terms of what he identifies as an “unconscious suspicion of native experience and consequent overdoing of external control” that are “shown…in the material supplied…[in the] Montessori house of childhood” (Dewey 1916: 232).

It was noted in §2 that one of Montessori’s fundamental pedagogical principles is the prepared environment. Based on observations of children, Montessori found that children preferred materials with clear and discrete order and what she came to call “control of error” (1:224) whereby materials themselves offer a means for self-correction. (For an intuitive albeit non-Montessori example, consider how a jigsaw puzzle that is not assembled correctly will reveal its error because it does not resemble the picture on the box cover.) For Montessori, promoting the freedom of children requires attending to what materials enable children to engage in sustained, self-directed attention, and then carefully constructing environments filled with those materials. For Dewey, this preparation of environment constitutes a “fear of raw material” and excessive adult control over children’s choices; “external control” takes place “as much in the material…as in…the teacher’s orders” (1916: 232). Instead, Dewey sought to give children freedom in natural and ordinary environments, a freedom involving more open-ended exploration and creative response to their environment.

William Heard Kilpatrick (1871–1965) was a protégé of Dewey’s and a leading voice in American progressive education for the first half of the twentieth century. In 1914, as enthusiasm for Montessori’s method was taking off in the United States, Kilpatrick published The Montessori System Examined (1914). He aimed his book, not towards “heroic enthusiasts that become…partisan leaders and followers of a new propaganda”, but at “the leaders and teachers of the rank and file” who “want to know how far the theory of Madam Montessori departs from the best philosophy that the American profession knows” (1914: ix). Kilpatrick’s assessment is that Montessori’s philosophy is partly old news, partly outdated errors, with one possible (but not yet tested to his satisfaction) concrete contribution. He praises Montessori’s “doctrine of liberty”, which is valuable, albeit only—like her lessons on practical life—as “corroboration of a doctrine long and widely preached, but too often disregarded” (1914: 26, 40). One possible new contribution is Montessori’s “technique of writing” (1914: 67). Whereas he dismisses much of her success with teaching young children to read and write as being due to the relative ease of the Italian language (1914: 53–5), her approach to teaching writing through isolating the relevant bodily motions and then combining them into writing is a proposal that “experimentation only can decide” (1914: 58).

Kilpatrick offers many criticisms, but the two most important are these:

First, Kilpatrick objects that Montessori “does not provide situations for more adequate social cooperation” (1914: 20). Kilpatrick’s opposition may be based on his emphasis on “shared responsibility” and “collective democra[cy]”, in contrast to what Kilpatrick perceived as a “individualistic, almost anti-social Montessori approach” (Simons 1988: 341). As we have seen (§3.2, §5.2, §7), Montessori strongly affirms the value of social solidarity, human interconnectedness (with each other and the broader ecosystem), and cooperation; but especially in her early writings, she emphasized the importance of mutual respect for individual liberty and individual work. Her classrooms promote social and moral development, but Kilpatrick rightly notes that cooperation per se is secondary to mutual respect and the possibility of independent work.

Second, consistent with Dewey’s central critique, Kilpatrick objects to the artificiality and especially rigidity of Montessori materials: “The didactic apparatus which forms the principal means of activity in the Montessori school affords singularly little variety” and thus “affords but meager diet for normally active children” (1914: 27–8). Instead of such material, we should offer “life itself and the situations that arise therefrom” (1914: 34).

In the end, he says, “in the content of her doctrine, she belongs essentially to the mid-nineteenth century, some fifty years behind the present development of educational theory” and “if we compare the work of Madame Montessori with that of…Professor Dewey”, we find that Dewey’s ideas

include all that is valid in [her] doctrines…, afford the criteria for correcting her errors…and…go vastly farther in the construction of an educational method. (1914: 63, 65)

Kilpatrick was influential within the U.S. educational establishment and helped push Montessori’s method out of the spotlight. While there was a significant revival of interest in Montessori with the founding of the American Montessori Society by Nancy Rambusch in 1960, Montessori has still not been incorporated into mainstream educational theory in the U.S. With Kilpatrick’s critique of Montessori, “For the first time in modern history of American public education, a genuine lay enthusiasm had been engendered but died in the face of professional opposition” (Beck 1960: 162).

9. Montessori’s Influence and Relevance

Montessori’s most significant impacts over the past hundred years have been the tens of thousands of schools throughout the world in which children develop in classrooms overseen by teachers trained in her pedagogical philosophy, methods, and materials. In addition, many of Montessori’s ideas about children and childhood—such as “sensitive periods” in child development, the need for environments designed and sized for children, children’s rights, and freedom in education—have all become widespread. Some of Montessori’s most important political ideals, such as her advocacy for a Social Party of the Child or a White Cross that would deal with psychological trauma in wartime, have yet to materialize. But her overall role in making the twentieth century the “Century of the Child” (see Key 1909) was substantial and lasting.

Her pedagogical work gave rise to several national and international organizations that continue her legacy in both theory and practice. The Association Montessori Internationale (AMI), which was established by Montessori in 1929 and is currently headquartered in Amsterdam, maintains a publication—The AMI Journal—and archives and works with the Montessori-Pierson Publishing Company (a publishing company established by Montessori’s heirs) to put out editions of Montessori’s works and lectures in multiple languages, sometimes in collaboration with other publishers. The American Montessori Society (AMS) is the largest professional association of Montessorians in the United States and has its own trade publication—Montessori Life—and sponsors an academic journal: The Journal of Montessori Research. Other Montessori-related organizations abound, many with their own publications. Increasingly, Montessorians have sought to bring Montessori’s ideas into richer conversation with other educational, psychological, and philosophical ideas. Within psychology, Angeline Lillard’s research program examines Montessori in the light of contemporary psychology (see Lillard 2005 and subsequent editions and links at Montessori-Science.org). The Bloomsbury Montessori Handbook (Murray et al. 2023) pulls together recent research on Montessori from a variety of fields (including philosophy).

Among philosophers, Montessori has been largely neglected, though there are some signs of new interest in applying her work to ongoing philosophical problems not only in the philosophy of education but also, as this entry has shown, to a wide range of philosophical issues. Andrew Colgan’s work (2016) shows the relevance of her epistemology for her philosophy of education. Patrick Frierson has shown how she speaks to current issues in virtue epistemology (2018; 2020), moral philosophy (2021b; 2022), technology studies (2024), and other fields (forthcoming). Laura Di Paolo shows the anticipation of embodied/enactive/extended mind in Montessori work, and the ongoing relevance of that work for a range of issues in the philosophy of mind (Di Paolo et al. 2024). Erica Moretti’s work on the central role of peace in Montessori not only provides a new historical perspective on Montessori but opens room for developing Montessorian alternatives to contemporary approaches to peace studies and peace education (2021), and Nicholas Parkin draws on Montessori to defend what he calls “educational pacificism” (2024). De Giorgi has done historical work on Montessori’s religious works (see especially 2013; 2018; 2019), while Natalie Carnes’s excellent article on Montessori’s “theological anthropology” shows how Montessori’s approach to children provides new ways of thinking about oppression, the human condition, original sin, and other important topics in a feminist-liberationist theological context (2015). Like other marginalized figures in the history of philosophy, Montessori’s contemporary relevance outstrips her influence, and research on her philosophical contributions is still in its infancy.

Bibliography

Works by Montessori

• Montessori, Maria, 1896, “Sul Significato dei Cristalli del Leyden nell’Asma Bronchiale”, Bullettino della Società Lancisiana degli Ospedali di Roma, 16: 69–72.
• –––, 1899 [2019] “La questione femminile e il Congresso di Londra,” in Per la causa delle donne, Milan: Garzanti, 7. Originally published in L’Italia Femminile, no. 38, October 1, 1899, 298–299; no. 39, October 8, 1899, 206–207.
• –––, 1902, “Norme per una classificazione dei deficienti in rapporto ai metodi speciali di educazione”, in Atti del Comitato Ordinatore del II Congresso Pedagogico Italiano 1899–1901, Naples: Trani.
• –––, 1903, “La teoria Lombrosiana e l’educazione morale”, Rivista d’Italia, 6(2): 326–331.
• –––, 1909 [1912], Il Metodo della Pedagogia Scientifica applicato all’educazione infantile nelle Case dei Bambini, translated as The Montessori Method, Anne E. George (trans.), New York: Frederick A. Stokes, 1912.
• –––, 1910 [1913], Antropologia Pedagogica. translated as Pedagogical Anthropology, Frederic Taber Cooper (trans.), New York: Frederick Stokes, 1913.
• –––, 1912, “La morale sessuale nell’educazione”, in Atti del I Congresso Nazionale delle donne italiane, Rome 24–30 April 1908, Rome: Stabilimento Tipografico della Società Editrice Laziale, 272–281.
• –––, 1929 [1965], The Child in the Church, Mortimer Standing (ed.), The Catechetical Guild, originally published by Madonna and Child Atrium.
• –––, 1935–6 [2007–9], “Six Lectures on Cosmic Education”. Reprinted in Communications (AMI), in six parts: 2007/1:53–8; 2007/2:5–9; 2008/1:5–9; 2008/2:52–58; 2009/1:33–38; 2009/2:39–43.
• –––, 1948 [1973], The Unconscious in History, India: Theosophical Publishing House, 1948. Reprinted in AMI Communications, 1973, 2/3. Reprinted in The NAMTA Journal, 2012, 37(2): 7–25.
• –––, 1949, The Absorbent Mind, Adyar: Theosophical Publishing House. Expanded in Italian as La mente del bambino: Mente assorbente, 1952. Translated and reprinted in MS 1.
• –––, 1950, La scoperta del bambino, Milano: Garzanti, a new edition of Montessori 1909 (retranslated as MS 2).
• [MS] –––, 2007–, The Montessori Series, 24 volumes, Amsterdam, Montessori-Pierson Publishing. Works that are cited in this entry are listed here by volume number:
  • 1: The Absorbent Mind, Claude A. Claremont (trans.);
  • 2: The Discovery of the Child, Fred Kelpin (ed.);
  • 6: To Educate the Human Potential;
  • 7: The Child, Society, and the World, C. Juler and H. Yesson (trans);
  • 9: The Advanced Montessori Method, volume 1, formerly entitled Spontaneous Activity in Education, F. Simmonds and L. Hutchinson (trans);
  • 10: Education and Peace, H. Lane (trans.);
  • 12: From Childhood to Adolescence;
  • 13: The Advanced Montessori Method, volume 2, A. Livingston (trans.);
  • 15: The California Lectures of Maria Montessori, 1915, R. Buckenmeyer (ed.);
  • 17: The 1946 London Lectures, A. Haines (ed.);
  • 18: The 1913 Rome Lectures, S. Feez (ed.);
  • 19: The Mass Explained to Children;
  • 22: The Secret of Childhood.
• Montessori, Maria and De Sanctis, Sante, 1897, “Sulle cosidette allucinazioni antagonistiche”, Policlinico: Sezione Medica, 4(2): 68–71.

Secondary Literature

• Babini, Valeria Paola, 2000, “Science, Feminism and Education: The Early Work of Maria Montessori”, Sarah Morgan and Daniel Pick (trans), History Workshop Journal, 49(1): 44–67. doi:10.1093/hwj/2000.49.44
• –––, 2023, “The Scientific Feminism of Maria Montessori”, in Murray, Ahlquist, McKenna, and Debs 2023: 21–28 (ch. 2).
• Babini, Valeria Paola and Luisa Lama, 2000, Una “donna nuova”: il femminismo scientifico di Maria Montessori (FrancoAngeli storia 270), Milano: FrancoAngeli.
• Baehr, Jason S., 2011, The Inquiring Mind: On Intellectual Virtues and Virtue Epistemology, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199604074.001.0001
• ––– (ed.), 2016, Intellectual Virtues and Education: Essays in Applied Virtue Epistemology (Routledge Studies in Contemporary Philosophy 75), New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9781315714127
• Battaly, Heather, 2008, “Virtue Epistemology”, Philosophy Compass, 3(4): 639–663. doi:10.1111/j.1747-9991.2008.00146.x
• Beck, Robert H., 1960, “Kilpatrick’s Critique of Montessori’s Method and Theory”, Studies in Philosophy and Education, 1(4–5): 153–162. doi:10.1007/BF00367848
• Bergson, Henri, 1907 [1911], L’évolution créatrice, Paris: Félix Alcan. Translated as Creative Evolution, Arthur Mitchell (trans.), New York: H. Holt and Company, 1911.
• Bettmann, Joen, 2003, “Grace and Courtesy: The Basis of a Normalized Community Nurturing the Respectful Community through Practical Life,” lecture, The Child as Builder of Humanity Conference, 26–28 September 2003, Sydney, Australia.
• Botti, Caterina, 2007, Madri cattive: Un riflessione su bioetica e gravidanza, Milan: Il Saggiatore.
• Buss, Sarah, 1999, “Appearing Respectful: The Moral Significance of Manners,” Ethics 109(4): 795–826.
• Buttafuoco, Annarita, 1988, “La filantropia come política: Esperienze dell’emancipazionismo italiano nel Novecento”, in Ragnatele di rapporti: patronage e reti di relazione nella storia delle donne (Soggetto donna 4), Lucia Ferrante, Maura Palazzi, and Gianna Pomata (eds), Torino: Rosenberg and Sellier, 166–187.
• Carnes, Natalie, 2015, “We in Our Turmoil: Theological Anthropology through Maria Montessori and the Lives of Children”, The Journal of Religion, 95(3): 318–336. doi:10.1086/681109
• Cives, Giacomo, 2015, “Maria Montessori tra scienza spiritualità e laicità”. Studi sulla Formazione, 17(2): 119–147. doi:10.13128/STUDI_FORMAZ-16184
• –––, 2019, “Il Destino di Maria Montessori e la Storia dell’Educazione in Italia”, in Foschi, Moretti, and Trabalzini 2019: 226–237.
• Colgan, Andrew D., 2016, “The Epistemology Behind the Educational Philosophy of Montessori: Senses, Concepts, and Choice”, Philosophical Inquiry in Education, 23(2): 125–140. doi:10.7202/1070459ar
• Credaro, Luigi, 1900 [1915], La pedagogia di G.F. Herbart, Roma: Società Editrice Dante Alighieri. Fourth edition, Torino: Stamperia Reale G.B. Paravia e Comp, 1915.
• D’Arcangeli, Marco Antonio, 2021, “Le projet libéral-démocrate d’« éducation nationale » de Luigi Credaro (1860–1939) et la Revue pédagogique (1908–1939)”, Cahiers de Narratologie, 40: 12854. doi:10.4000/narratologie.12854
• De Giorgi, Fulvio (ed.), 2013, Montessori. Dio e il bambino e altri scritti, Brescia: La Scuola.
• –––, 2018, “Maria Montessori tra modernisti, antimodernisti e gesuiti”, Annali di storia dell’educazione e delle istituzioni scolastiche, 25: 27–73.
• ––– (ed.), 2019, Montessori. Il peccato originale, Brescia, Italy: Scholè.
• Dewey, John, 1916, Democracy and Education: An Introduction to the Philosophy of Education, New York: Macmillan.
• Devi, Rukmini, 1946, “Dr. Montessori’s Ideals”, The Young Citizen (Adyar), 21: 29.
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Acknowledgments

Many thanks to Erica Moretti, Laura Di Paolo, Emma Perrone, Joke Verheul, and Kristin Gjesdal for helpful suggestions on a penultimate draft of this entry.