Supplement to Quantum Logic and Probability Theory

What follows is the briefest possible summary of the order-theoretic notions used in the main text. For a good introduction to this material, see Davey & Priestley (1990). More advanced treatments can be found in Grätzer (1998) and Birkhoff (1967).

1. Ordered Sets

A partial ordering—henceforth, just an ordering—on a set $$P$$ is a reflexive, anti-symmetric, and transitive binary relation $$\unlhd$$ on $$P$$. Thus, for all $$p, q, r \in P$$, we have

1. $$p \unlhd p$$
2. $$p \unlhd q$$ and $$q \unlhd p$$ only if $$p = q$$.
3. if $$p \unlhd q$$ and $$q \unlhd r$$ then $$p \unlhd r$$

If $$p \unlhd q$$, we speak of $$p$$ as being less than, or below $$q$$, and of $$q$$ as being greater than, or above $$p$$, in the ordering.

A partially ordered set, or poset, is a pair $$(P, \unlhd)$$ where $$P$$ is a set and $$\unlhd$$ is a specified ordering on $$P$$. It is usual to let $$P$$ denote both the set and the structure, leaving $$\unlhd$$ tacit wherever possible. Any collection of subsets of some fixed set $$X$$, ordered by set-inclusion, is a poset; in particular, the full power set $$\wp(X)$$ is a poset under set inclusion.

Let $$P$$ be a poset. The meet, or greatest lower bound, of $$p, q \in P$$, denoted by $$p\wedge q$$, is the greatest element of $$P$$—if there is one—lying below both $$p$$ and $$q$$. The join, or least upper bound, of $$p$$ and $$q$$, denoted by $$p\vee q$$, is the least element of $$P$$—if there is one—lying above both $$p$$ and $$q$$. Thus, for any elements $$p, q, r$$ of $$P$$, we have

1. if $$r \unlhd p\wedge q$$, then $$r \unlhd p$$ and $$r \unlhd q$$
2. if $$p\vee q \unlhd r$$, then $$p \unlhd r$$ and $$q \unlhd r$$

Note that $$p\wedge p = p\vee p = p$$ for all $$p$$ in $$P$$. Note also that $$p \unlhd q$$ iff $$p\wedge q = p$$ iff $$p\vee q = q$$.

Note that if the set $$P = \wp(X)$$, ordered by set-inclusion, then $$p\wedge q = p\cap q$$ and $$p\vee q = p\cup q$$. However, if $$P$$ is an arbitrary collection of subsets of $$X$$ ordered by inclusion, this need not be true. For instance, consider the collection $$P$$ of all subsets of $$X = \{1,2,\ldots ,n\}$$ having even cardinality. Then, for instance, $$\{1,2\}\vee \{2,3\}$$ does not exist in $$P$$, since there is no smallest set of 4 elements of $$X$$ containing $$\{1,2,3\}$$. For a different sort of example, let $$X$$ be a vector space and let $$P$$ be the set of subspaces of $$X$$. For subspaces $$\mathbf{M}$$ and $$\mathbf{N}$$, we have

$\mathbf{M}\wedge \mathbf{N} = \mathbf{M}\cap \mathbf{N}, \textrm{ but } \mathbf{M}\vee \mathbf{N} = \textrm{span} (\mathbf{M}\cup \mathbf{N}).$

The concepts of meet and join extend to infinite subsets of a poset $$P$$. Thus, if $$A\subseteq P$$, the meet of $$A$$ is the largest element (if any) below $$A$$, while the join of $$A$$ is the least element (if any) above $$A$$. We denote the meet of $$A$$ by $$\wedge\, A$$ or by $$\wedge_{a\in A}\, a$$. Similarly, the join of $$A$$ is denoted by $$\vee\, A$$ or by $$\vee_{a\in A}\, a$$.

2. Lattices

A lattice is a poset $$(L, \unlhd)$$ in which every pair of elements has both a meet and a join. A complete lattice is one in which every subset of $$L$$ has a meet and a join. Note that $$\wp(X)$$ is a complete lattice with respect to set inclusion, as is the set of all subspaces of a vector space. The set of finite subsets of an infinite set $$X$$ is a lattice, but not a complete lattice. The set of subsets of a finite set having an even number of elements is an example of a poset that is not a lattice.

A lattice $$(L, \unlhd)$$ is distributive iff meets distribute over joins and vice versa:

$p \wedge (q\vee r) = (p\wedge q) \vee (p\wedge r),$

and

$p \vee (q\wedge r) = (p\vee q) \wedge (p\vee r)$

The power set lattice $$\wp(X)$$, for instance, is distributive (as is any lattice of sets in which meet and join are given by set-theoretic intersection and union). On the other hand, the lattice of subspaces of a vector space is not distributive, for reasons that will become clear in a moment.

A lattice $$L$$ is said to be bounded iff it contains a smallest element 0 and a largest element 1. Note that any complete lattice is automatically bounded. For the balance of this appendix, all lattices are assumed to be bounded, absent any indication to the contrary.

A complement for an element $$p$$ of a (bounded) lattice $$L$$ is another element $$q$$ such that $$p \wedge q = 0$$ and $$p \vee q = 1$$.

In the lattice $$\wp(X)$$, every element has exactly one complement, namely, its usual set-theoretic complement. On the other hand, in the lattice of subspaces of a vector space, an element will typically have infinitely many complements. For instance, if $$L$$ is the lattice of subspaces of 3-dimensional Euclidean space, then a complement for a given plane through the origin is provided by any line through the origin not lying in that plane.

Proposition:
If $$L$$ is distributive, an element of $$L$$ can have at most one complement.

Proof:
Suppose that $$q$$ and $$r$$ both serve as complements for $$p$$. Then, since $$L$$ is distributive, we have

\begin{align} q & = q \wedge 1 \\ & = q \wedge (p \vee r)\\ & = (q\wedge p) \vee (q\wedge r)\\ & = 0 \vee (q\wedge r)\\ & = q\wedge r\\ \end{align}

Hence, $$q \unlhd r$$. Symmetrically, we have $$r \unlhd q$$; thus, $$q = r$$.

Thus, no lattice in which elements have multiple complements is distributive. In particular, the subspace lattice of a vector space (of dimension greater than 1) is not distributive.

If a lattice $$is$$ distributive, it may be that some of its elements have a complement, while others lack a complement. A distributive lattice in which every element has a complement is called a Boolean lattice or a Boolean algebra. The basic example, of course, is the power set $$\wp(X)$$ of a set $$X$$. More generally, any collection of subsets of $$X$$ closed under unions, intersections and complements is a Boolean algebra; a theorem of Stone and Birkhoff tells us that, up to isomorphism, every Boolean algebra arises in this way.

3. Ortholattices

In some non-uniquely complemented (hence, non-distributive) lattices, it is possible to pick out, for each element $$p$$, a preferred complement $$p'$$ in such a way that

1. if $$p \unlhd q$$ then $$q' \unlhd p'$$
2. $$p'' = p$$

When these conditions are satisfied, one calls the mapping $$p\rightarrow p'$$ an orthocomplementation on $$L$$, and the structure $$(L, \unlhd ,')$$ an orthocomplemented lattice, or an ortholattice for short.

Note again that if a distributive lattice can be orthocomplemented at all, it is a Boolean algebra, and hence can be orthocomplemented in only one way. In the case of $$L(\mathbf{H})$$ the orthocomplementation one has in mind is $$\mathbf{M} \rightarrow \mathbf{M}^{\bot}$$ where $$\mathbf{M}^{\bot}$$ is defined as in Section 1 of the main text. More generally, if $$\mathbf{V}$$ is any inner product space (complete or not), let $$L(\mathbf{V})$$ denote the set of subspaces $$\mathbf{M}$$ of $$\mathbf{V}$$ such that $$\mathbf{M} = \mathbf{M}^{\bot \bot}$$ (such a subspace is said to be algebraically closed). This again is a complete lattice, orthocomplemented by the mapping $$\mathbf{M} \rightarrow \mathbf{M}^{\bot}$$.

4. Orthomodularity

There is a striking order-theoretic characterization of the lattice of closed subspaces of a Hilbert space among lattices $$L(\mathbf{V})$$ of closed subspaces of more general inner product spaces. An ortholattice $$L$$ is said to be orthomodular iff, for any pair $$p, q$$ in $$L$$ with $$p \unlhd q$$,

$\tag{OMI} (q\wedge p')\vee p = q.$

Note that this is a weakening of the distributive law. Hence, a Boolean lattice is orthomodular. It is not difficult to show that if $$\mathbf{H}$$ is a Hilbert space, then $$L(\mathbf{H})$$ is orthomodular. The striking converse of this fact is due to Amemiya and Araki (1966):

Theorem:
Let $$\mathbf{V}$$ be an inner product space (over $$\mathbf{R}, \mathbf{C}$$ or the quaternions) such that $$L(\mathbf{V})$$ is orthomodular. Then $$\mathbf{V}$$ is complete, i.e., a Hilbert space.

5. Closure Operators, Interior Operators and Adjunctions

Let $$P$$ and $$Q$$ be posets. A mapping $$f : P \rightarrow Q$$ is order preserving iff for all $$p,q \in P$$, if $$p \unlhd q$$ then $$f(p) \unlhd f(q)$$.

A closure operator on a poset $$P$$ is an order-preserving map $$\mathbf{cl} : P \rightarrow P$$ such that for all $$p \in P$$,

• $$\mathbf{cl}(\mathbf{cl}(p)) = \mathbf{cl}(p)$$
• $$p \unlhd \mathbf{cl}(p)$$.

Dually, an interior operator on $$P$$ is an order-preserving mapping $$\mathbf{int} : P \rightarrow P$$ on $$P$$ such that for all $$p \in P$$,

• $$\mathbf{int}(\mathbf{int}(p)) = \mathbf{int}(p)$$
• $$\mathbf{int}(p) \unlhd p$$

Elements in the range of $$\mathbf{cl}$$ are said to be closed; those in the range of $$\mathbf{int}$$ are said to be open. If $$P$$ is a (complete) lattice, then the set of closed, respectively open, subsets of $$P$$ under a closure or interior mapping is again a (complete) lattice.

By way of illustration, suppose that $$\mathcal{O}$$ and $$\mathcal{C}$$ are collections of subsets of a set $$X$$ with $$\mathcal{O}$$ closed under arbitrary unions and $$\mathcal{C}$$ under arbitrary intersections. For any set $$A \subseteq X$$, let

\begin{align} \mathbf{cl}(A) & = \cap \{C\in \mathcal{C} \mid A \subseteq C\}, \textrm{ and}\\ \mathbf{int}(A) & = \cup \{O\in \mathcal{O} \mid O \subseteq A\} \end{align}

Then $$\mathbf{cl}$$ and $$\mathbf{int}$$ are interior operators on $$\wp(X)$$, for which the closed and open sets are precisely $$\mathcal{C}$$ and $$\mathcal{O}$$, respectively. The most familiar example, of course, is that in which $$\mathcal{O}, \mathcal{C}$$ are the open and closed subsets, respectively, of a topological space. Another important special case is that in which $$\mathcal{C}$$ is the set of linear subspaces of a vector space $$\mathbf{V}$$; in this case, the mapping span :$$\wp(\mathbf{V}) \rightarrow \wp(\mathbf{V})$$ sending each subset of $$\mathbf{V}$$ to its span is a corresponding closure.

An adjunction between two posets $$P$$ and $$Q$$ is an ordered pair $$(f, g)$$ of mappings $$f : P \rightarrow Q$$ and $$g : Q \rightarrow P$$ connected by the condition that, for all $$p \in P, q \in Q$$

$f(p) \unlhd q \textrm{ if and only if } p \unlhd g(q).$

In this case, we call $$f$$ a left adjoint for $$g$$, and call $$g$$ a right adjoint for $$f$$. Two basic facts about adjunctions, both easily proved, are the following:

Proposition:
Let $$f : L \rightarrow M$$ be an order-preserving map between complete lattices $$L$$ and $$M$$. Then

1. $$f$$ preserves arbitrary joins if and only if it has a right adjoint.
2. $$f$$ preserves arbitrary meets if and only if it has a left adjoint.

Proposition:
Let $$(f, g)$$ be an adjunction between complete lattices $$L$$ and $$M$$. Then

1. $$g \circ f : L \rightarrow L$$ is a closure operator.
2. $$f \circ g : M \rightarrow M$$ is an interior operator.