1. See Thakur 1975a: 14, Mimaki 1992, and Ruegg 1981: 110 for some notes on Ratnakīrti’s life.

2. These dialectics constitute what is often called a commentarial tradition. See McCrea and Patil 2006: 303–305 for a characterisation of such a commentarial tradition. In a similar vein, McClintock 2010: 91–95 emphasises the balance that Buddhist authors had to maintain between tradition and innovation. The forces driving the development of the theories are difficult to assess due to the lack of historical information. An influential assessment of Buddhist philosophers as authors primarily motivated by the defense of core Buddhist beliefs is found in Eltschinger 2014, the first chapter of which

[…] argues that the rise of Buddhist epistemology (or equivalently, the “epistemological turn” of the Buddhist dialectical tradition) was due, not so much to a few individuals’ belief-neutral search for philosophical truth but to a socio-historical matrix of growing Brahmanical hostility toward the non-Vedic, mainly Buddhist, Jaina, Sāṅkhya, Pāśupata and Pāñcarātrika religio-philosophical and/or socio-religious denominations. (Eltschinger 2014: 32)

3. See the passage from A Theory of Multifaceted Non-Dual Appearance (CAPV) quoted and translated in Krasser 2002: 74.

4. Ratnakīrti’s two works on “momentary cessation” were studied several times after Mookerjee 1935: McDermott 1969 (see the discussion in Ruegg 1971, Steinkellner 1972, and McDermott 1972), Feldman and Phillips 2011, and Woo 2019.

5. See the references for a more extensive bibliography.

6. This arrangement follows the SEP entry for Dharmakīrti (Tillemans 2011 [2026]). We will see that for Ratnakīrti’s idealist theories, the distinction between metaphysical and epistemological theories is blurry. See McAllister 2022 for a different approach.

7. See Feldman and Phillips 2011: 30, 67. The position that existence is the ability to produce an effect is already evident in Dharmakīrti’s writings, see Eltschinger 2010: §5b.

8. What is called “the causal relation” here is not a general cause-effect relation, but the actual case of a particular cause producing a particular effect. Of course, Ratnakīrti admits that there are also common-sense notions of causes, effects, and their relations. For example, an opponent states that it is correct to say that the seed in the granary is capable of producing a plant, even if it does not produce the seed immediately. Ratnakīrti responds that this is just a “metaphorical” (aupacārika) use of the term “capability”. See KBhSA 68, 26–30, translated in Feldman and Phillips, 2011: 56 and Woo 2019.

9. Mortensen 2002 [2020]: §5 characterises the Buddhist theory of momentariness as “essentially an ontology of instantaneous temporal slices”.

10. See Perrett 2004 for a closer analysis of Ratnakīrti’s argument, and Feldman and Phillips 2011: 28–37 for a detailed study of it.

11. See Mimaki 1976: 176, 6–9 (corresponding to SSD, 127, 14–16), and the translation on the opposing page. In KBhSA, an opponent appeals to the commonly accepted point about the seed and the sprout:

For it is so: the seed is a principal cause with regard to the sprout; it is a secondary cause with regard to the [other causal factors involved,] soil and so on. (Woo 2019: 27*, 12–13, corresponding to KBhSA 79, 29–30: tathā hi bījasyāṅkuraṃ praty upādānatvam. kṣityādikaṃ tu prati sahakāritvam)

In this passage, the seed is classified as a secondary cause for whichever effects the other elements produce. The reverse also holds, namely that these other elements are the secondary causes for whichever effect the seed produces. Ratnakīrti’s answer makes it clear that this classification into primary and secondary causes is only a conceptual distinction:

[…] because, notwithstanding that different natures such as being a primary cause and so on are imagined based upon this or that differentiation, in reality it is only by a single nature that multiple effects are produced. (Woo 2019: 31*, 8–9, corresponding to KBhSA, 81, 19–21: tattadvyāvṛttibhedam āśrityopādānatvādikālpanikasvabhāvabhede ’pi paramārthata ekenaiva svarūpeṇānekakāryaniṣpādanād […])

12. Proponents of Nyāya and Vaiśeṣika types of ontology characterise causality as a sort of natural relation (svabhāvikasambandha). Ratnakīrti explicitly argues against natural relations, asserting that causality either reduces to the Buddhist analysis or cannot be established. See the explanations in Patil 2009: 118–122. See also Halbfass 1992: 195 for a short comment on the situation in Nyāya works that Ratnakīrti explicitly quotes, and see Halbfass 1992: 203, n.111 for references to Mimaki 1976, who discusses Ratnakīrti’s criticism of various attempts by Nyāya opponents to link causality to permanent entities.

13. CAPV 129, 22–24: yat prakāśate, tad ekam, yathā citrākāracakramadhyavartī nīlākāraḥ. prakāśate cedaṃ gauragāndhāramadhurasurabhisukumārasātetarādivicitrākārakadambakam iti svabhāvahetuḥ.

14. See Saccone 2018: 67–71 for a post-Dharmakīrti discussion of external objects as composed of atoms; and see Saccone 2018: 230–236 for Śāntarakṣita’s rebuttal of an external object as something that is grasped by awareness. In both cases, Śāntarakṣita makes use of what look like stock arguments: the mereological arguments have been simplified, and a dream-argument can be employed without further explanations.

15. Ratnakīrti appeals to Dharmakīrti’s sahopalambhaniyama argument, PV 3.387–397 and PVin 1.54–58. See Taber 2020: 442–445 for an accessible summary of how Dharmakīrti’s argument was understood not only as proving that an awareness and its object are not different from each other, but also as proving that there are no mind-external objects. Ratnakīrti’s argument, however, does not rely on the latter interpretation.

16. Ratnakīrti classifies Ratnākaraśānti’s position as “false-form” (alīka), see Seton 2022: 590.

17. This maxim is presented on the basis of Kellner and Taber 2014: 710, even though they do not call it a maxim. See Taber 2020 for a philosophical analysis of this position in Dharmakīrti.

18. Suffice it to say that even for the philosophical works central to Ratnakīrti’s tradition, the opponents did not agree on whether the analysis of conceptual awareness in those works committed the tradition to “mind-external objects” (bahirartha).

19. See SAD 146, 13:

We do not assume that there is no doubt in any way at all about [the existence of] other mental continua. Rather, what is explained [here in this text] is an awareness that accords to reality. For this proof that other mental continua do not exist is similar to the proof of non-duality. (na khalu santānāntaraviṣayaḥ sarvathā sandeho nāsty evety abhimatam asmākam, api tu paramārthagatir iyam upadarśitā. idam hi santānāntarābhāvasādhanam advayasādhanena sādhāraṇam iti.)

See Kajiyama 1965: 420 and Ganeri 2012: 212 for other translations. The point about the similarity between the two proofs is this: just as the proof of variegated, non-dual awareness does not oppose our mistaken belief in continuous and even material objects, so the proof that there are no other minds does not oppose our everyday mistaken belief in the existence of other minds.

20. Ratnakīrti is here simply following the standard model already present in Dharmakīrti. See the description of the path taken by a yogic practitioner (yogin) in Steinkellner 1978: 127, and the following summary in Eltschinger 2010: 411:

By first resorting to correcting inferences (such as that of momentariness […]) and then subjecting true […] intellectual contents to intensive and uninterrupted mental cultivation, a yogin gradually increases his conceptual familiarity with the true features of reality (which correspond to the Buddhist Four Noble Truths); his cognitive sharpness progresses up to the point at which he finally perceives the said features in an immediate and non-conceptual way. At this point, the yogin—now a perfectly enlightened Buddha—has rid himself of nescience and conceptuality, and rests with his immaculate (but, according to Dharmakīrti, inconceivable) perception of true reality.

21. Some authors in Dignāga’s tradition call this form an “exclusion” apoha, equating it with the Buddhist substitute for real universals. Ratnakīrti accounts for this identification, but does not agree to it (see Section 3 in the main text). See Ishida 2011; Okada 2017.

22. Ratnakīrti holds that one is directly aware of, or perceives by reflexive awareness, the indistinct form that arises in conceptual awareness. See Patil 2009: 256.

23. See McCrea and Patil 2006 for a detailed study of how this analysis evolved in the Buddhist philosophical tradition.

24. See Kobayashi 2011 and McAllister 2020a for studies of Prajñākaragupta’s position. Modern scholars have analysed this differentiation of objects in two slightly different ways. Simplifying a bit, one could say that one group (McCrea & Patil 2006) analyses it according to Dharmottara’s explanations: perception’s determined object is actually the object of a conceptual awareness that immediately follows a perception. This conceptual awareness is often called “perceptual judgment” in modern literature (Katsura 1993). Since Dignāga’s tradition is axiomatic about perception not involving any conceptual construction, perception as such cannot have a “determined” object—it lacks concepts and hence cannot judge. An alternative interpretation, posited by the present author (see McAllister 2020b: 258–259), holds that Ratnakīrti is closer to the distinction as upheld by Prajñākaragupta: on this reading, the determined object is present in any awareness only insofar as that awareness will let a person act toward that object. That means that there is only one grasped element—the form, vivid or not, that is manifest in awareness—and the other, determined element is only “present” in the weak sense that the awareness can direct activity towards it. It is not manifest in awareness like the grasped element is.

25. See Tillemans 2011 [2026]: §2.1 for an assessment of this idea, as well as for a reflection on the notion of truth that is possible on the basis of this characteristic. As in Tillemans 1999: 6–12, the conclusion is that Dharmakīrti presents a theory of justification rather than of truth. See Eltschinger 2010: 406–409 for a historically oriented overview of the main concepts related to “reliability” in the writings of Dharmakīrti; Krasser 1995: 247–249 provides an overview of Dharmottara’s analysis of reliability, which had a strong influence on later Buddhist thinkers, including Ratnakīrti.

26. This is also a generally accepted criterion of truth or knowledge in Nyāya sources, see Patil 2009: 43 and Nyman 2005. For Prajñākaragupta’s discussion of the term, see McAllister 2020a: 235–237.

27. See Patil 2003, Patil 2009: 197–247, and McAllister 2020b: 189–268 for discussions of Ratnakīrti’s theory of exclusion. Taber 2024 provides an excellent introduction to the theory as developed by Dharmakīrti.

28. See McAllister 2020b: 216–219. Ratnakīrti says that the positive element in the sense of the particular form manifest in awareness cannot be affirmed or negated: as something that appears through reflexive awareness, it is known to exist. The basis for the assumption made here is McAllister 2020b: 84–85, where Ratnakīrti lets an opponent argue that one has no experience of a negation (or other-exclusion) when one thinks, “There is a fire on the hill!” Ratnakīrti’s answer is that not only the positive element is meant (McAllister 2020b: 88–89).

29. Ratnakīrti, unlike some previous authors in the Buddhist epistemological tradition, posits that both perceptual and conceptual awareness have a positive and a negative aspect. See Patil 2009: 251: “According to Ratnakīrti, there are two […] states of awareness, perceptual and inferential/verbal. Each is constituted by two awareness-events and each has a direct and an indirect object”. McAllister 2020b: 235–259 has provided an account of the same position that does not assume that each such state of awareness consists of two awareness-events. McCrea and Patil 2006 have convincingly argued that Jñānaśrimitra and Ratnakīrti are revising Dharmottara’s ideas here.

30. One can illustrate the point with an example that Ratnakīrti does not use: imagine that a person sees the “same” cow twice (really seeing two different moments in a single cause-effect continuum). On each occasion, that person makes a judgement that can be expressed as “This is Betty the cow”. For Ratnakīrti, the cognitive form or positive element that appears in each judgement is unique, being caused by unique perceptions, but non-vivid, since the form is shaped also by habits and other factors. The person will identify these two judgements with each other, saying that they are the same, much in the same way that that person would say that it is the same cow that was seen twice. The person is able to make this judgement because the haecceity of the cognitive forms in each judgement is ignored: they are non-vivid.

31. Also Dignāga, who is generally considered the first author in the Buddhist epistemological tradition, subscribes to this idea, as is evident from PS(V), 5.47 (see Pind 2015: 56–58, 171–175). That the awareness of this problem predates Dignāga is clear from examples like that of the celebrated Buddhist poet Aśvaghoṣa’s “Handsome Nanda” (Saund. 13.52, transl. Johnston 1932: 76):

On seeing a certain form one man is attracted, another dislikes it and a third is indifferent, while yet another feels compassionate disgust for the same object. (dṛṣṭvaikaṃ rūpamanyo hi rajyate ’nyaḥ praduṣyati | kaścid bhavati madhyasthas tatraivānyo ghṛṇāyate ||)

This verse is referred to in Eltschinger et al. 2018: n133. This solution by appeal to repeated experience is not limited to Buddhist thinkers, cf. Rau 2002: 2.117 and see Preisendanz 1994: vol. 2, n84, pp. 304–305.

32. It is not clear whether the ascetic’s response here is supposed to be one that corresponds to “compassionate disgust”, as Johnston 1932: 76 translates the Sanskrit term ghṛṇā. Both “aversion” and “compassion” lie within the semantic range of ghṛṇā.

33. Much has been said on whether Indian philosophy has a theory of knowledge. For an overview, see the remarks in Perrett 2016: 52–55 and Stoltz 2021: 18–20. For the chances of a theory of truth (as opposed to knowledge), see Tillemans 2011 [2026]: §2.1. Sometimes Indian theories of knowledge are referred to even in public discourse, cf. Shulman 2024.

34. This is common to other Indian traditions of philosophy, see Patil 2009: 43 about proponents of Nyāya philosophy:

Knowledge, according to them, is simply warranted awareness (pramā)—that is, presenting-awareness that is in accordance with its object (yathārthānub- hava). Presenting-awareness is usually defined negatively as any awareness-event that is not a memory-episode.

See also the references in note 33.

35. Cf. the example of the dog, the man, and the ascetic (note 31). There is no reason to assume that these dispositions cannot change.

36. “Yet it was established on the basis of the proof of momentary cessation that […] all reality consists only in momentariness and the absence of a [permanent] self” (SJS 19, 19–20: na ca vahnitvaṃ sarvavastutattvam, kiṃ tu kṣaṇikanairātmyam eveti kṣaṇabhaṅgaprasādhanataḥ pratipāditam iti) Momentariness and the absence of a permanent self define the first noble truth, that existence is suffering. For example: “for [the Buddha] Sugata, who taught momentariness and the absence of a self, which are secured through sources of knowledge” (SJS 6, 11: pramāṇopapannakṣaṇikanairātmyavādina eva sugatasya); “if reality is momentary and without a [permanent] self” (SJS 18, 27: kṣaṇikanirātmakavastutattvam). The traditional general situation is characterised by Eltschinger 2010: 422:

Now, what the mystic (here most likely a Bodhisattva) “meditates” upon are precisely those real features of reality (the so-called vastudharmas) which inferences are required to bring out, and which coincide with the various aspects of the Four Noble Truths (āryasatya): impermanence or momentariness (anityatā, kṣaṇikatva), selflessness (nairātmya), painfulness (duḥkhatā) and emptiness (śūnyatā) in the case of the First Noble Truth.

In keeping with the Buddhist epistemological tradition that he subscribes to, Ratnakīrti analyses fundamental nescience as a deeply ingrained, habitual erroneous judgement: we identify things that are not the same, and construe differences where there are none. This nescience corresponds to the second noble truth, which states the cause of suffering. See section 4 and note 38.

37. What has been a difficult point to establish for pre-Dignāga Yogācāra and Vasubandhu (see Szanyi 2024: §3.1), is rather clear in Ratnakīrti’s A Theory of Multifaceted Non-Dual Appearance (CAPV): there is only awareness. Apart from the “set of all insentient physical objects” having been rejected (sakalajaḍapadārtharāśau pratyākhyāte, CAPV, 129) right at the outset of the work, phrases such as “given the complete non-existence of external objects” (sarvathā bahirabhāve, CAPV 132, 24) do clinch the matter. For an appreciation of the competing interpretations of “idealism” in earlier Yogācāra, see Kellner and Taber 2014: 709–714. See also the comments in the section on solipsism here (section 2.1).

38. Both characterisations tie saṃsāra back to a fundamental error that is analysed in different ways depending on whether mind-external objects are accepted or not. This is of course perfectly in line Dharmakīrti’s general theory, see Eltschinger 2010: 424–425, 432. In the final analysis, the two errors are not different:

But [this judgement] is just a mistaken fancy that, caused by a beginningless sequence of nescience, superimposes identity on a preceding and following [moment], and whose continuous operation is uninterrupted even though a permanent self has been rebutted. (SSD 120, 24–25, corresponding to Mimaki 1976: 178, 4–6: sa cānādyavidyāparamparāyātaḥ pūrvāparayor ekatvāropako mithyāsaṅkalpo bādhite ’py ātmany avyāhataprasara iti […].)

Here, Ratnakīrti is saying that any identification (not just that of two moments of a person) is the basic structure of the nescience that causes transmigration.

39. E.g.: “For it is so: One undertakes this conceptually grounded cultivation of the cognitive forms [that show] the four noble truths in order to destroy the excess of suffering that is the nature of saṃsāra”. (SJS 1, 27–2, 1: tathā hi saṃsārasvabhāvaṃ duḥkhātiśayam apanetum iyaṃ saṃkalpārūḍhā caturāryasatyākārabhāvanā prārabdhā.)

40. Ratnakīrti makes this point while considering why mental cultivation leading to omniscience might be impossible. The seventh reason he considers is that one does not know the cause of suffering, and Ratnakīrti says:

Also the seventh [reason] is not [valid], because the reason for suffering is ascertained: it is the [false] view that there is a self, together with the actions whose potency [for producing transmigration] results from error and thirst; for if it were not [the cause] the result consisting in the five constituents [of a person and] belong to saṃsāra would not arise. (SJS 2, 20–21)

with a reading given in Bühnemann 1980: 98, n40: nāpi saptamaḥ, duḥkhe viparyāsatṛṣṇāpravṛtt[a]śaktikarmabhiḥ sahitasyātmadṛṣṭilakṣaṇasya hetoḥ sāṃsārikapañcaskandhalakṣaṇakāryānyathānupapattito niścayāt. The translation here follows the German translation in Bühnemann 1980: 5. See Eltschinger 2010: 424–425 for a summary of this view in Dharmakīrti. The five constituents are listed there as “corporality, affective sensation, identification, conditioning factors, perception” (corresponding to rūpa, vedanā, sañjñā, saṃskāra, and vijñāna).

41. Translation by Chaturvedi and McAllister of CAPV 137, 12: ayam eva ca saṃsāraḥ, tatkṣayo mokṣa iti.  We insert “erroneous judgement” from the context).

42. Translation by Chaturvedi and McAllister of CAPV 138, 26–27: tasmād avicāraramaṇīyo ’tasmiṃs tadgraha eva bhrāntir āropāparanāmā, tatkṣayaś ca mokṣa iti yuktam.

43. As others before him, Ratnakīrti differentiates between a fully omniscient one (sarvasarvajña) and someone who knows all that is necessary to attain liberation (upayuktasarvajña). The latter is the primary focus of SJS. See Bühnemann 1980: ix, xiii–xiv, 92n9, summarised in McClintock 2010: 133. See also Eltschinger 2010: 420–421.

44. See his statement that “The refutation [of yogic perception] which [is found] in [the Naiyāyika Bhāsarvajña’s] Nyāyabhūṣaṇa [and which] relies on Yogācāra [teachings] is not relevant either, because we proceed to prove [yogic perception] only under the assumption of an external object”. (SJS 21, 21–22: nyāyabhūṣaṇasyāpi yogācārāpekṣayā dūṣaṇam aprastutam, bahirarthābhyupagamenaiva sādhanaprakramāt.)

45. Ratnakīrti says:

[Opponent:] If a yogin simultaneously sees [things] through both [faculties,] direct mental perception and direct sense perception, then would it not follow, [contrary to your principles,] that two cognitive forms are manifest [simultaneously]? [Proponent:] True! To begin with, the cognitive form belonging to the awareness of the [first noble] truth cannot be in a different location than the thing [being perceived through the senses,] because [otherwise] one awareness or the other would be erroneous. So who could determine in what manner these two cognitive forms, which do not oppose each other, appear? This was said [also by Dharmakīrti:] “The state of yogin-s is inconceivable”. (PV 3.530d)

I follow the German translation in Bühnemann 1980: 66. SJS, 23, 3–6: nanu yogino manovijñā nendriyajñānābhyāṃ paśyata ākāradvayasphuraṇaprasaṅga iti cet. satyam. satyajñānākāras tāvad vastuno na bhinnadeśo ’nyatarabhrāntiprasaṅgāt. atas tāv ākārāv apratighau kayā gatyā sphurata iti ko nirṇetuṃ kṣamaḥ. yad āha: “acintyā yogināṃ gatir” iti.