1. Views of this kind have been endorsed by, e.g., Carnap (1950), Hirsch (2002, 2009), Thomasson (2007, 2015), and Rayo (2013). We will consider views like this in much more detail in sections 2 and 3.

2. Virtually all nihilists can be interpreted as endorsing something roughly like this view (see, e.g., Rosen & Dorr 2002; Dorr 2005; Sider 2013; and Horgan & Potrč 2000). And while van Inwagen (1990) and Merricks (2001) aren’t nihilists (because they endorse the existence of some composite objects, namely, animals), they endorse a similar pair of views; in particular, they are anti-realists about non-living composite objects, but they are realists (in the senses of the term that’s relevant to this entry) about the question of whether there are any non-living composite objects.

3. It’s worth noting that trivialist tableism is not an instance of the general schema for trivialist views defined above. The relevant instance of that schema—which we can call trivialism about the composite-object question—says that the facts that settle the composite-object question are (a) semantic facts, together with (b) ordinary empirical facts that are entirely uncontroversial. Trivialist tableism is a version of this more specific view; it says that (i) the semantic fact in question is that the existence of simples arranged tablewise is already sufficient for the truth of [Table], and (ii) the uncontroversial empirical fact in question is that there are simples arranged tablewise.

4. Another view that’s incompatible with the claim that there are simples arranged tablewise is the view (developed in Cortens (2000) and Balaguer (2021)) that physical reality isn’t carved into objects at all and that there’s no fact of the matter whether there are composite objects, and no fact of the matter whether there are tiny simples, and no fact of the matter whether there’s an object that’s made up of everything so that there’s no fact of the matter whether the universe exists. Perhaps we could deal with this by switching from ‘There are simples arranged tablewise’ to a sentence like ‘Reality is arranged tablewise’ (or “‘Tablehood’ is instantiated”, or some such thing); but, again, we needn’t bother with this here. (Also, the non-factualist view under discussion here is an anti-realist view, in the sense at issue in this entry, and so it seems less important to accommodate it in the present context; it seems more important to accommodate realist views of the composite-object question.)

5. Views of this general kind have been endorsed by Kelly (2008) and Fine (2009). And for nearby views, see Markosian (1998) and Korman (2015).

6. There are various ways to define ‘abstract object’. E.g., in contrast with the definition given in the text, one might claim that abstract objects must be non-causal. None of the claims in this entry will depend in any important way on how exactly we define ‘abstract object’. For more on this, see the entries on abstract objects and Platonism in metaphysics.

7. For an argument for this sort of semantic externalism, see Burge 1979.

8. Locke characterizes verbal disputes in roughly this way in the Essay (see, e.g., Book III, chapter XI). So does Hirsch (2009). And see also Sidelle (2007) and Chalmers (2011) in this regard.

9. Some philosophers of time reject this assumption. In particular, growing block theorists (e.g., Broad 1923, Tooley 1997, and Correia and Rosenkranz (2018)) say that there exist past objects but not future objects. But we can safely ignore this view here.

10. In connection with presentism, see, e.g., Prior 1970; Hinchliff 1996; Zimmerman 1998; Markosian 2004; Merricks 2007; and Emery 2019, 2020. And in connection with eternalism, see, e.g., Quine 1950; Smart 1963; Lewis 1986; Sider 2001; and Hawley 2001.

11. For more on conceptual engineering and amelioration, see, e.g., Haslanger 2000; Vargas 2009; A. Burgess & Plunkett 2013a, 2013b; Plunkett & Sundell 2013; Thomasson 2017; Belleri 2017; and Cappelen 2018.

12. To see why we need this parenthetical qualifier, consider the debate over the truth value of [Dinosaur] and notice that even if we limit our attention to languages like Presentese and Eternalese, there are still non-verbal debates to be had about this sentence. Suppose, e.g., that Jane thinks that dinosaur fossils are a hoax and that there were never any such things as dinosaurs and, hence, that [Dinosaur] is false in Eternalese. Then the rest of us (who think that [Dinosaur] is true in Eternalese) could obviously have a non-verbal debate with Jane about this—in Eternalese. But this wouldn’t be a metaphysical debate in any interesting sense of the term; it would be a debate about zoological history. This is why we included ‘(metaphysical)’ in the definition of mere-verbalism.

13. Eklund (2016) and Balaguer (2021) both draw distinctions between kinds of mere-verbalism that are similar to the distinction between View V and the sort of mere-verbalism defined here. Hirsch and Warren (2020) draw a superficially similar (but importantly different) distinction between modest quantifier variance (roughly, the view that there are multiple existential quantifiers that mean different things) and strong quantifier variance (roughly, the view that these quantifiers are equally good for describing reality). Like View V, modest quantifier variance isn’t an anti-realist view in the sense at issue in this entry; indeed, lots of realists about metaphysics would endorse modest quantifier variance.

14. You might think it odd that a language we don’t actually speak, but should speak, would count as a language that “matters” vis-à-vis MQ. One point to make in response to this worry is that the definition in the text of ‘a language that matters’ is just a stipulative definition of a term of art that will be employed in this entry—and so nothing important depends on it. But even so, it’s worth saying a few words to explain this terminological choice. Suppose that the people who are actually debating MQ have been speaking L1 and that some philosopher (say, Smith) thinks that we should speak L2 when debating MQ. Given this, you might think that Smith should be interpreted as saying that we should stop asking MQ and start asking a slightly different question, say MQ*. But, in fact, Smith-style views are usually better thought of as implying that other philosophers have been mischaracterizing the original metaphysical question that we were supposed to be focusing on. In other words, they usually intend to say that L2 is the language that matters to the original question MQ.

15. Chalmers interprets Carnap (1950) as endorsing a view of this kind as well. But (a) this interpretation relies on the idea that, on Carnap’s view, external questions are defective in some way, and (b) it seems doubtful that Carnap would endorse that view. On a more popular interpretation of Carnap, external questions are just pragmatic questions about what language we should employ. If this is the right interpretation of Carnap, then he endorsed a mere-verbalist non-factualism of the kind described later in this subsection (and a trivialist view of the kind described in section 2.1), not a non-mere-verbalist non-factualism of the kind under discussion here.

16. You might wonder how this view of Warren’s fits together with his (2015, 2020, 2022) commitment to quantifier variance—for quantifier-variantist views entail that both parties in the given ontological dispute are uttering truths. The answer is that Warren thinks that, sometimes, the two parties in an ontological dispute are best interpreted in a quantifier-variantist way, and other times, they’re best interpreted in a non-mere-verbalist non-factualist way (because they’re best interpreted as using a heavyweight quantifier).

17. J. Burgess (2007) also endorses a view of this general kind in connection with ethical claims.

18. We saw in section 2.1.1 that Carnap endorses trivialism about the abstract-object question. And in section 2.2.3, we saw that this view is compatible with mere-verbalism about the abstract-object question. But is trivialism about a metaphysical question MQ compatible mere-verbalist non-factualism about MQ? Yes, it is. You can endorse both of these views by claiming that (i) the answer to MQ is trivially ‘Yes’ in the language that we’re actually speaking (say, English); and (ii) there’s another language (namely, English*) that’s such that (a) in English*, the answer to MQ is trivially ‘No’, and (b) English* is just as good as English (for our purposes), and there are no other languages that are better (for our purposes), and so there’s no fact of the matter which language we should speak, vis-à-vis MQ.

19. Quantifier variance is endorsed by Hirsch (2002, 2009) and Warren (2015, 2020, 2022). And Cortens (2000) develops a view of this kind but doesn’t endorse it.

20. Universalism is endorsed by, e.g., Heller (1990), Lewis (1991), Hudson (2001), and Van Cleve (2008).

21. For plenitudinous platonist views, see, e.g., Linsky & Zalta (1995) and Balaguer (1995, 1998).

22. For plenitudinous views of this kind, see, e.g., Yablo (1987), Fine (2003), Bennett (2004), and Fairchild (2019).

23. Another argument that’s similar in spirit to the argument from maximalism discussed in this subsection is the argument against quantifier variance in Finn and Bueno (2018).

24. Following Hirsch (2009), you might think we can take nihilists to be speaking a language whose quantifiers are restricted to simples; indeed, you might think that if we endorse universalism and the principle of charity, then we should interpret nihilists in this way. But nihilists explicitly claim to be speaking a language whose quantifiers are unrestricted, and so the claim that they’re speaking a language with restricted quantifiers doesn’t fit at all well with their linguistic intentions.

25. It would be pretty easy to run a parallel argument in connection with the abstract-object question; but it would be more complicated to extend this argument to the temporal-ontology question, for as we saw in section 2.2.2, it’s easy to formulate a language in which the sentences that are under dispute in the temporal-ontology debate—e.g., ‘There exist dinosaurs’—are trivially false.

26. Also, for more on the history of anti-metaphysics, see Agassi 2018.

27. This is the strategy that Balaguer (2021) employs. And Warren (2016b) develops a somewhat similar response to worries about self-refutation.

28. There are, of course, other worries that one might raise about general attacks on metaphysics. E.g., Bennett (2016) argues for the claim that there’s no general problem with metaphysics, as opposed to (a) local problems with specific metaphysical questions, and (b) problems that arise not just for metaphysics but for all of philosophy.