Shaaban Robert’s Virtue Ethics

First published Thu Sep 24, 2026

Shaaban’s exposition of African virtue ethics precedes the works of African theologians who mounted the “African traditional religions” movement as a school of thought in the wake of the Second Vatican Council, also called Vatican II (1962–65). In a crucial difference from those theologians who largely adopted the work of European anthropologists in pursuit of “proof” for the existence of indigenous African religious beliefs as close to those of Christianity, Shaaban developed his own philosophical explanations which he believed to be universal. Leading scholars of the African traditional religions movement included the Nigerian E. Bolaji Idowu (1962, 1973), the Kenyan John S. Mbiti (1969, 1970), and the Congolese F. M. Lufuluabo (1962, 1966). On the converse side, critics of the assumptions of the theologians as conceptual importations that only led to the idea of “African traditional religions” as a Eurocentric invention included the Ugandan poet Okot p’Bitek (1970), and the Congolese philosopher Valentin Y. Mudimbe (1988). A good summation of these opposing views is given by Rosalind Shaw (1990).

In this entry, works by Robert are cited by 2- and 3-letter abbreviations, and these abbreviations are explained, with full references, in the Primary Sources section of the Bibliography.

1. Shaaban Robert

African theologians’ renditions of the purported African traditional religions included explanations of derivations of moral norms from divine will and commands, however conceived or articulated in traditional lores. However, there are also original African thinkers who, despite their conversion to foreign religious faiths, endeavor to keep their individual reflections on moral values on secular and purely rational grounds. Their reflections and moral theories are therefore distinct from the moral codes or ethical theories derived from divine dictations associated with the religious faiths to which they may also have been converted. Shaaban Robert, the celebrated poet from Tanga, a coastal and port-town in the then-Tanganyika – today’s Tanzania – was such a thinker. He was born in 1909 in a village called Vibambani near Tanga in the predominantly Muslim region. His becoming a Muslim from childhood was a no-brainer even if the region and the whole territory was then still under German colonial rule before reverting to British control after WWI when Shaaban was barely ten years old. The villages and towns in the coastal region of East Africa including Tanganyika, and especially the island of Zanzibar, were not only predominantly Muslim by religion, they were also heavily settled by Arabs from the times of the Omani empire.  Under Seyyid Said bin Sultan, the empire had moved its headquarters to Zanzibar in 1840, ostensibly to have a more effective control of their Indian Ocean trade in cloves, African ivory, and African slaves. After modest schooling that ended with what was only primary education (up to Grade Four)[1] by today’s standards and systems, Shaaban was employed at age seventeen as a government clerk and was assigned to the Customs Department and posted to Zanzibar. This was the center and leading market for the trade in cloves. Although he was apparently accorded some personal respect and was amicably treated by his supervisors and workmates, Shaaban also witnessed social tensions and unacceptable treatment of his fellow Africans. He attributed these tensions to racism, especially by Arabs toward Black Africans. Arab racism toward Africans, and their trade in African slaves had long preceded European racism and slave trade. In addition, European importation of Indians to work in the construction of the railway lines but later staying as retail traders added another layer of racial tensions and discrimination toward Africans. Shaaban saw the friendly treatment of him in contrast to that of his fellow Africans as inconsistent with what he believed, and therefore unacceptable.

That was the reality of Arabs’and Indians’ social relations with Africans whom they regarded as inferior. In public spaces, especially in the formal institutional spaces under European control or supervision, these attitudes appeared to be toned down, but in others and in private set-ups, especially in Arab- or Indian-controlled businesses, racist practices were openly displayed. Shaaban was aware of this duplicitous Arab and Indian sub-cultures and was alarmed that the perpetrators of unacceptable practices of racism and the enslavement of Africans were the same people who also claimed to be believers in religious virtues which he had come to know through induction into Islam. From his own experience, he had come to know Islam to exhort its followers to apply its tenets indiscriminately to all segments of their daily lives as shown to align with God’s will. One of these tenets, as set in Chapter 49, Verse 13 of the Qur’an, teaches the equality of all human beings in the eyes of God, and that humans differed from one another only in regard to their righteousness. Not only did these experiences of the hypocrisy of some Arabs and Indians of Shaaban’s social world drive him to detect a disconnect between the word of God, on the one hand, and the actions of some of His believers, including those who wanted to be seen as the teachers and exemplifiers of those teachings, on the other. This hypocrisy also drove him to theorize about a better moral world by expounding the same virtues already identified through Islamic education, but now from a secular standpoint. In other words, he saw fault, not with religious teachings themselves, but in the contradictions found in the actions of those people who falsely portrayed themselves as pious. He thought the same of Christians as well. As a result, Shaaban became skeptical of the capacity of religious leaders and institutions to bring meaningful change to peoples’ lives. He says (SWW 9):

Kanisa na msikiti – ghala za asili – zimeharibika kwa matengano mabaya. Sheria hasa ya ushuria imepotoka na haiaminiki. [Ayubu] Alipoulizwa kama adili za jumuia ziliafikiana na Ukristo au Uislamu, alijibu kwamba ilikuwa hivyo katika baadhi ya mapokeo, lakini sio katika madhehebu. Majina peke yake ya dini hizi, ingawaje njema, yamekwisha leta shari badala ya heri kwa wanadamu kwa mtengano, chuki, uadui, na ubaguzi.

(Both the church and mosque – the symbols of Christian and Islamic traditions respectively – are riddled with serious divisions. The law of taxation itself, for example, is perverted and no longer trustable. But when Ayubu was asked whether Christianity and Islam concur on divine virtues, his response was that it was true only for some types of revenue, but not uniform for all denominations. The very names of these religions, although innocent, have resulted in much mischief rather than happiness among their adherents due to divisions, hatred, enmity, and discrimination.)

In Shaaban’s view, because of the manner in which they are propagated, both Christianity and Islam lack the moral capacity to bring any good into the lives of the public. In their place, it is imperative to establish a kingdom of virtues (Jumuia ya Adili[2]) constructed primarily from rational considerations.

Shaaban reasoned that the world’s injustices would never change unless someone, or some people with knowledge and concern, acted, and it did not matter how old or how rich they were. It is the determination to bring about happiness to those to whom it has been denied that counts. Furthermore, he believed, race is not a source of hatred for those who look different as all humans are created equal and free just like their creator intended and made the first ancestor of all humans free (KL 72–73). Shaaban had already been converted to Islam when he started to write, but his reflections on freedom were grounded on the awareness and rejection of the slavery of Africans as described in the narratives he grew up with. He also was aware of the racist practices of the apartheid system in South Africa which he had come to know about through information flowing through channels made available to him by virtue of his work as a government clerk in colonial times (Robert MY: 105–7). In addition to his awareness of this unacceptable plight of fellow Black people, Shaaban was also observing in his own time significant social and political changes taking place in East Africa and contrasted them to the experiences of fellow Black people in South Africa.[3] His idea of “first ancestors of all humans” is therefore a deductive reflective claim of the similarity of all humans as defined by what he believed to make them “all equally human.” Above all, as he observes in Utubora Mkulima, there are both rational and moral expectations for humans whom he refers to there as “wa miguu miwili (these two-legged beings)” (UM 21). He wondered there, then, about what it is that happens to some of them when they behave like they were four-legged beasts (wa miguu minne). Humans are therefore not just similar, but also equal in respect to what it is that makes them all to bear that similarity as members of a species. This is interesting because Shaaban, who was so conscious of his own individual or personal dispositions and temperaments, must have often contrasted his understanding and expression of what he considered to be cardinal moral dispositions of any right-thinking human with those exhibited by those who, despite wishing to be regarded as superior, practiced decadent moral principles which exposed them as fundamentally flawed or lacking in what was expected of humans in their conduct. In all these regards, Shaaban thought that skin (racial) differences between humans is a mere superficial look that does not define them differently as humans. Bad moral dispositions, including thinking of other humans as unequal, are a sign of intellectual (rational) incapacitation that ought to be corrected. And when that is done, there would only be a kingdom of virtuous people (Jumuia ya Adili) rather than societies bedeviled by all manner of injustices.

Shaaban separated his frustrations with the failures of society from the valuable moral education he had acquired in the Madrasas (a general name for Islamic schools for the teaching of the fundamental tenets of the Islamic faith and prayers, usually attached to Mosques). He believed in them as the ideals to inculcate in people regardless of whether they were Christians, Muslims, or anything else. He believed in the intrinsic capacity of people to be good, but they had to be taught the exact and correct content of what a good person is or ought to be. Because he was brought up a Muslim and inculcated the moral virtues taught therein, Shaaban believed strongly that prosperity is possible only in social conditions in which individuals, and communities, are allowed to freely perform those deeds that promote the common good. Hence the terms “good” and “bad” are considered to be not only powerful but also important descriptions of conduct in so far as they either promote or hinder the attainment of the common good. They are important because they lie at the heart of how people think about life and how it should be lived whenever any two or more people share an environment in any consistent manner. And they are powerful because they carry regulatory value about them. The first one commends, and the second admonishes, and this happens for a reason. Put positively, the first term carries with it the view that the actions of a person ought to be in line with a desirable objective or end, and that the action(s) so described serve the attainment of such a goal while those described as “bad” are a hindrance to it. To that end, people, as much as their conduct goes, are either good or bad, depending on the consequences of their actions, usually for their communities. It is the desirable objective or end of conduct that good consequences accrue from them. Thus, to the question, how ought I to behave?, the morally plausible answer should be: in such a way that good or desirable results will come from your actions. No-one will know or care about the actions of a person who lives and acts alone behind their closed doors. But when their actions affect the interests of others in any way, whether they act clandestinely or in any other outflowing way, the consequenses of their actions inevitably become subject to question.

The above approach to ethics is often referred to in English as “consequentialism,” that is, the consideration of the moral worth of actions in view of their possible effects or results. This way of thinking of morals is what guides moral teachings for many ordinary people every day. It is a fundamental principle of a view that prioritizes the good of community as the goal of the conduct of its members. Shaaban pushes for and defends it in Utubora Mkulima when he contrasts the moral views of Radhia with those of the individualist Makuu. But it is not divorced from the idea of morality based on identity or character. In Shaaban’s account as described briefly above, any right-thinking person, one who thinks the way all rational beings are expected to do, ought to act in a manner that produces desirable ends, and those ends would not be desirable unless they were concomitant with the good of community. He says in Utubora Mkulima, “Humans are not solitary animals; they are social, and their nature is for them to live in community with others” (UM 28). According to him, detaching morality from this communitarian end would be just wrong because that would be only half of the story about why or how humans become moral at all. In other words, humans become human only in community with other humans. In other words, in community with other humans one not only acquires, but also develops, sharpens, and practically demonstrates those capacities that show them to be human. This communitarian view of the making of personhood has recently been popularized by Desmond Tutu in his discussion of Ubuntu (Tutu 2013) which is a Southern-African (Nguni) variation of the KiSwahili Utu. 

Let us put together in summary Shaaban’s teachings about the importance of a virtuous life. First, Shaaban teaches that when we have physical life, it is not enough just that we are alive. Rather, it is good that we keep healthy, because it is only a good, healthy life that is worth living. He says (KL 22):

Maisha jambo la heri, uyapatapo kamili,
Isipungue kadiri, afya katika mwili,
Kisha upate urari, wa hekima kila hali,
Maisha ni jambo bora, uyapatapo kamili.

(Life is a blessed thing when you have it in full,
It should never lose bodily value,
And it should always be with a good balance of wisdom at all times,
Life is a good thing when you have it in full.)

Jambo la kwanza maisha, uhai katika mwili,
Lakini hayatatosha, afya ikiwa mbali,
Afya inaunganisha, roho na kiwiliwili,
Maisha ni jambo bora, uyapatapo kamili.

(First thing in life, is to be physically alive,
But not enough, without good health,
Good health connects soul and spirit,
Life is a good thing when you have it in full.)

Tena twataka hekima, ili itawale mwili,
Tuchague mambo mema, maovu tuweke mbali,
Tungalikuwa wanyama, kasoro umbo la mwili,
Maisha ni jambo bora, uyapatapo kamili.

(We also need wisdom, that it may control the body,
That we may choose what is good, and reject what is evil,
For without wisdom, we would be like beasts,
Except for bodily differences,
Life is a good thing when you have it in full.)

It is important to note that Shaaban distinguishes human life from other forms of life by virtue of humans’ capacity for knowledge or wisdom (hekima[4]). Knowledge, or wisdom, he says, is the foundation of the ability to distinguish between good and evil. We say in English that our conscience tells or alerts us about the moral value of our actions, so in this regard, the KiSwahili word “hekima” incorporates all the senses of the foundation of the human ability to become aware that actions have a value, and this, like we said above, is in regard to the moral worth or value of human conduct which is measured in terms of its possible moral effects or consequences. That is the difference between the (two-legged) human and (four-legged) beastly life which he addresses in Utubora Mkulima. We say of a wise person (Mtu mwenye hekima) that they are diligent by habit; that they weigh matters, especially their own, or other people’s actions when they are asked for counsel, for purposes of directing conduct to be based on right choices at all times and in all instances. He says in KiSwahili: upate urari, wa hekima kila hali – that is, “that you may have a good balance of wisdom at all times.” In other words, humans ought to act with due diligence at all times, otherwise they risk being like beasts in their actions. We also see in this section that Shaaban distinguished reason as a faculty or capacity from knowledge or wisdom as its product when reason is carefully and diligently applied to consideration of matters of life. Not once should humans ever let their guard down that they fail in this fundamental and defining expectation. Elsewhere in Koja la Lugha he says that without intelligence the human body is just like a tree, for even botanical trees, though they may not have mouths, yet they eat, drink, and dance to the music of the wind (KL 8–9). And if you saw humans so comparable, you would not know what to call them. He says (KL 8):

Kuuliza ni thawabu, wanenaji wamenena,
Jambo likikupa taabu, usilinyamaze sana,
Uliza wenye vitabu, na wajuao maana,
Nani aliyeona, mti kucheza taarabu?

([Ability for] asking questions is a human gift,
When you have trouble understanding anything,

Do not suppress it with silence,
Ask the scholars, and experts in the matter,
Who has ever seen a tree dance to music?)

Mti uchezao ngoma, nimepata kuuona,
Umefungwa mahazama, kama kwamba msichana,
Achezae lelemama, kasoro kichwa hapana,
Ndivyo nilivyoona, nilipokwenda tazama.

(But I have seen one, a tree that dances to music,
Adorned with pendants, as if a young woman,
That she dances through the night, except she has no head,
That’s what I observed, when I went to look.)

2. The guidance of reason in a life of righteousness

According to Shaaban, what defines a good and attractive life is not physical looks, nor is it social class or the lifestyle one leads.[5] Rather, that which makes a person attractive is the moral quality of their conduct. Everyone loves a good person, but goodness is attained through a sustained practice of diligence and thoughtfulness as a way of life. “Moyo wanambia penda, mtu mjinga sipende – My heart tells me to love, but not to love a stupid person,” he says (KL 26). Although moral goodness is essential for a good human life, it is cultivated through a combination of right upbringing and learning. We saw above that Shaaban characterizes learning as a practice that brings rewards. He urges that when one is troubled by a matter, they should go to scholars or experts who already have knowledge of the matter. When we are in doubt about the best way to act, or about any form of knowledge, we do not cringe in silence; we ought to ask. Seeking knowledge for use in paving the right path in life is a virtuous thing.

It is Shaaban’s view that the moral well-being of a society is cultivated and sustained through generations in cycles of responsibility: good people teach and prepare the youth to be good, and they too take over the same leadership in society, and thus a communal or social character is planted. It is the responsibility of elders to instill good intellectual and moral growth and development in young people, and they should do so by teaching and by practical examples, because children, besides the ability to learn from their teachers, are also good imitators. So Shaaban starts by asking God to gift those who are in charge of bringing up the youth with intelligence and ability for good judgement. He says (KL 27):

Mungu wape majazi, wenye kulea vijana,
Hao ndio waongozi wa kuwatenga na laana.
Ibariki yao kazi, yakue yao majina,
Wafundisheni imani, watoto mkiwalea.

(God, fill them with gifts, those who bring up the youth,
For it is they who will protect the youth from curses,
God, bless their work, and make their names to grow,
Teach faith to the youth as you bring them up.)

It is apparent from the above lines that Shaaban is giving affirmation to the moral teachings he received in the Madrasa as having given him a good foundation through faith. But he moves quickly to assert that moral goodness is all about diligent exercise of the intellect. Also, however, it is not clear what sense of “faith (imani)”[6] – religious, or secular – Shaaban had in mind here, for the KiSwahili verb “kuamini” from which the noun “imani” is derived, sometimes only means “to believe,” or “to trust.” But we can assume that even in this secular sense, Shaaban implied some form of religious affirmation of the supremacy of God since he (Shaaban) begins by appealing to the recognition of the origin of the abilities of the teachers of the youth as divine gifts. Yet, as used in the stanza above, the term “imani” could imply merely exhorting teachers of morality to be those whose own moral standing in speech and actions was exemplary in order to elicit trust from the youth whom they were entrusted with teaching. It is trust in them as both moral teachers and role models that would cause their names to grow in recognition and reputation.

3. Faith and reason

Shaaban appears to strongly recognize the importance of religious faith in regard to how it influences moral practice and lifestyles. In other words, it is the general view and spirit of Shaaban’s works that, as a cognitive state, faith is a combination of reason (belief) and emotional (character orientation) attitudes toward the external world that an individual adopts as their basis for conduct. This is the case with most believers as observed about the followers of Islam and Christianity. Shaaban was a Muslim and seems not to have had any problem with this choice. But he believed that the cognitive stance of faith should lead directly to some specific moral inferences. One of these was that God wanted humans to live good (morally right) lives. There are four cardinal virtues according to Islam. The first of these is Wiqāh, or piety, the consciousness of God. All humans ought to have a deep awareness of Allah’s presence, and consequently develop a deep desire to know and obey him. This is followed by Şidq, or honesty, truthfulness in both speech and action. For Shaaban, being honest and respectful of all other creatures was the cardinal virtue expected of any believer. Shaaban believed that this divinely derived stance or attitude required the recognition of the equality of all humans irrespective of the color of their skin, gender, aesthetic or physical looks, or station in life or society. In Kusadikika, Shaaban criticizes the racist assumption that one’s skin color confers on some groups, and individuals belonging to them, certain rights or privileges in respect of some claims while denying the same to others. In the same book too, he criticizes gender-based discrimination. In his view, both forms of discrimination are totally unwarranted, and therefore unacceptable. He revisits the issue of racial hierarchization and discrimination in Maisha Yangu na Baada ya Miaka Hamsini when he refers to the social-political discrimination against Black people in South Africa under the White minority regime of apartheid. Under this beastly political order, he writes, “human rights and equality (haki za wananchi na usawa) were mere imaginations and useless dreams, and their freedom did not have even a hair’s chance or possibility” (“Katika Afrika Kusini, haki za wananchi zilikuwa si kitu ambacho kilijulikana kikajaliwa. Usawa ulikuwa ndoto iliyokuwa haina maana, na uhuru wao haukuwa na nafasi hata ya unywele”; MY 105–107). In other words, race or gender cannot be factors for determining justice as they cannot be valid grounds for any legitimate entitlements. Another cardinal virtue is Iffah, which is self-restraint or modesty. The practice of Iffah enables us to control our desires and to avoid excesses, thus enabling us to maintain moral purity. And then there is Adi (Justice), which directs the practice of just, fair, or equitable treatment of others by giving them what they rightfully deserve.

In Kusadikika, Utobora Mkulima, Adili na Nduguze, and Maisha Yangu na Baada ya Miaka Hamsini Shaaban paints a picture of the world of his time as deeply unjust and in need of radical transformation. At the end of Maisha Yangu na Baada ya Miaka Hamsini (MY 102–104), Shaaban glorifies Allah as the Maxim of greatness and exhorts believers and all humans to pay tribute to Allah who, out of His unlimited goodness and gentleness, gifts humans, first with life, and then with anything else they may ask for. The world, he writes, is worthless, except for the stupid and self-conceited who do not recognize their finitude and indebtedness to Allah for their existence and everything they are or have. It is Allah who confers goodness, and for this humans ought to be cognizant and grateful. He writes:

Nusura kushika zani, roho nikaikalifu,
Nikarudi mawazoni, kufuta moyo uchafu;
Dunia ni kkity duni, ila kwa aliye dufu,
Alhamdudillahi, namshukuru Latifu.

(I almost fell into waywardness, and blemished my soul,
But reconsidered, and cleaned my heart;
The world is in an abject state, except for the morally blind and ignorant,
But I thank Him who is Absolute Goodness.)

Shaaban argues that the value of faith is practical and should be seen in the cultivation of character which, in turn, should be seen in one’s moral conduct. A society in which individuals live by the four virtues (Wiqāh, Şidq, Iffah, and Adi) shall be a peaceful, harmonious, and just society in which people take care of one another. He observes that the general communal or societal atmosphere – the common good – that results and prevails when everyone lives by these virtues is an atmosphere of happiness, and this is what is desirable as a specifically human experience. It is an experience guided by right reason rather than one in which the pursuit of worldly goods and social status is made the focus of life. This is the lesson that Shaaban, through Utubora the fictional character, aims to pass to a society clamoring for liberation, justice, and restoration of their human dignity when Utubora defies those with misplaced senses of values, like his employer Bwana Ahmed, and his caretaker Bihaya in Utubora Mkulima (UM 13–25).

For the most part, humans treat each other in special ways, and every person desires a certain kind of treatment on account of their Utu, the KiSwahili term for humanity, or personhood, which is what makes all humans deserving of all those things that are owed to anyone just by virtue of their Utu – what the specific nature – that is, their nature as members of the human species – confers upon them. Reciprocally, humans demand from their fellow humans the kind of treatment that is dutifully expected of their conduct toward others. By virtue of their common Utu, all humans are endowed with both duties and deserts.

Utu has both epistemic and moral senses to it. In Utubora Mkulima, Shaaban intimates – in the words of Mke wa Liwali (the wife of the local religious leader) while addressing Bihaya – that (UM 13–25):

…nimefurahi kabisa kusikia kuwa mtu huyo [yaani, Utubora] amefanana ajabu na jina lake. Nadhani hutaniona mjuba nikisema kuwa hapana jambo baya duniani kama kuona kiumbe mwenye umbo la mtu amebadilika kuwa kama knyama kwa uovu wa matendo yake. Wa miguu miwili huwaje wa minne?

(I have been delighted to hear that the gentleman’s name says exactly what his moral character shows. So, I hope you will not find me to claim to know it all (to be wise, or to be a philosopher) when I say that nothing in the world would be worse than seeing a human turn into a beast by virtue of their behavior. Humans are expected to conduct themselves as defined by their nature. Humans must not descend to the level of beasts in their behavior. So, what is it that would cause a [human] person to allow themselves to suffer this degradation?)

There is an implied sense of moral universality in Shaaban’s abstract idea of Utu (personhood). Utu bora (ideal personhood) is a regulative concept of an ideal (best possible) nature that everyone should always aspire to attain in their everyday conduct. Bimkubwa’s surprise that Utubora exhibits utu bora in his conduct speaks to the rarity of this moral equation: Utubora ni mtu bora kwa matendo yake (Utubora exemplifies by his conduct what it means to live a morally perfect life: he is perfect just as his name shouts out). In other words, his very life was an exemplary, practical lesson on what it means to be properly human, and his name said it all. Thus, being like him suddenly was to be the aspiration for many, especially those who had the privilege of encountering and learning from him. Utu (personhood) confers upon people both responsibilities and deserts in equal measure. Yet moral character is determined by what one does, not by what she or he receives.[7] In other words, Utu equally demands of everyone a certain way of conduct as much as it confers upon them deserts or certain expectations of right and just treatment by others. We ought not act toward others as if we were beasts, just like we ought not be treated by anyone as if we were beasts or lesser humans. These moral goods are irreducible and inextricably intertwined.

According to Shaaban, the pursuit of happiness or of what is good often faces obstacles, yet one must not surrender, for, as we learn from him, again in Utubora Mkulima, no good comes without tremendous effort, sacrifice and selflessness which in turn require great intellectual discipline. This, unsurprisingly, is why both the path toward the good and its attainment are often dared and achieved by only a few people in life. While all humans have Utu (humanity or personhood) in equal measure, differences in how they tend to matters in manners commensurate with its prescriptive guidelines depend on a variety of factors like one’s health, as well as one's upbringing and education or level of understanding. This is why good judgement requires more: it requires intellectual maturity and steadfastness which in turn leads to wisdom as the virtue of unfailing disciplined reasoning. According to Shaaban, this developmental progression is the general expectation for the growth and maturity of average persons, but it is neither universal nor essential. Critical thinking can set in earlier than conventionally expected for the average person. Utubora was such exception. He was a young man with admirable but rare intellectual fortitude. He was able to rise above the materialist attractions of life driven by the new economy and urban settings of his time. Instead, he set his eyes early on what he believed to bear true and lasting value for humanity (UM 1–7). He believed that ideal humanity is attained through understanding and committing to pursue what truly matters as is indicated in the definition of personhood – Utu. Ideal or perfect (bora) and universal personhood or humanity (Utu) is cultivated in a very specific way that requires discipline. This process, the making of utu bora, can, at least partly as an example, in his “representation” of the life choices of the character “Utubora”  whose moral persona exemplifies what separates individual persons with the right moral commitments from those without, or those with wrong ones. Such human value transcends any gains conferred by the jobs they perform, the amount of wealth they possess, the social status of the households they were born into, the faith they profess, their race or physical look of their bodies, their gender, the status of their health, or the level of education they have.

Shaaban unleashes a scathing critique of the attitude of aristocratic and racial superiority shown by Arab settlers toward Black Africans in the East African coast, including Tanganyika and Zanzibar at the beginning of Kusadikika. There, Shaaban indicates that neither physical attributes, nor race, nor class, nor social status, either makes one virtuous, or gives them the freedom or right to treat other humans anyhow they like. According to him, such attitudes create, and have become, obstacles to the attainment of a just society. They have become impediments to their victims' pursuit of happiness. In Maisha Yangu na Baada ya Miaka Hamsini (MY 1–2), Shaaban narrates that Ubora, that is, perfection, was an ideal he strove diligently to attain in all aspects of his daily life. He did this both privately and publicly in the course of discharging his duties at work. In life, he says, one must not depend on luck either to become good or to achieve what they deserve, fo luck is unreliable, and does not deliver as one would desire. Sometimes, it just doesn’t come altogether. Instead, people ought to rely solely on their own diligence. Hard work, discipline, honesty, and doing what is right at all times is what delivers. And these are the virtues that bring development, that is, the good and right change, to individuals and to a nation when practiced by citizens. Then, in the moving autobiographical poem in Koja la Lugha (KL 72–74) titled “Jina Langu Nimewapa (I gave Them My Name, but really meaning ‘I honestly and transparently laid down my dispositions toward perfect conduct’)” he spells out these strivings – different aspects or types of virtuous conduct that lead to perfection. He narrates there specifically that (KL 72–74):

Miaka kumi na nane nilifanya kazi hizo,
Mimi na watu wengine, bila ovu na mzozo,
Nia yangu waone, watu wenye mawazo,
Rangi siyo chukizo, kuwa sawa na wengine.

(For eighteen years I worked in the Customs Department in Dar es Salaam with other, different colleagues without any ill feelings or fracas toward them, so thoughtful people would realize that race is not a cause for hatred or inferiority, but of equality.)

Then, in [SWW], Shaaban visualizes a world of happy citizens, the utopian world according to Mulokozi (1975), Shaaban describes such an imaginary – possible but not yet real – world as one in which all citizens would – in this case following the gaining of freedom from any form of colonial domination or discriminatory and unjust treatment – be able to engage, freely and on the strength of good reason alone, in activities that augment the quality of their embodied ideal personhood (Utu bora). Such achievements, according to Shaaban, are possible only when laws are enacted that give and guarantee justice for all, including justice for women, and when there is collaboration between citizens who work toward a common good.

The depth of Shaaban’s idea of Utu becomes clearer through the role he assigns to love as it is evident that by it he does not mean one type of emotion, but a host of them under the rubric of the common term, love. First, he believes that humans are such beings that bear a special dignity and worth, and that on account of those attributes, every person deserves special regard and treatment, not because of their age, their social rank, their education, their wealth, their physical appearance, but because of their very personhood, Utu. “Utu wenyewe ni fadhili (personhood is an optimal good or valuable thing in and of itself)” whose integrity, dignity, and worth is everyone’s moral duty to guarantee and to protect.

He thought of love as the virtue that drives collaboration and makes the attainment of the common good possible. He describes “love [as] the link between individuals, and the preservative salt of personhood that can never be corrupted by hate” (mapenzi – kiungo kati ya nafsi na nafsi – na chumvi ya hifadhi ya utu usiozeshwe na chuki) (SWW ix). In contrast, hatred causes personhood to rot and the social fabric to break apart. On the contrary, he argued, hatred is the negation of the common good.

4. Virtue is in doing

In Siku ya Watenzi Wote, Shaaban proposes an era of liberty and democratic agency in which everyone, all citizens, would become doers, watenzi, because they would not only own their destiny, in contrast to the passivity of life under domination in which there are only lords and serfs or their workers, but, more importantly, as doers, citizens will practice what is good in accordance with the expectations of righteousness, that is, knowing and striving always to do that which is morally good. And that this good would primarily be for themselves as opposed to the life of serfdom serving the interests of others who sit over them as lords. Proper moral cultivation for self and community occurs only when people know and do only that which is right, and therefore work toward what is commonly good for society – their common interests – instead of working for the interests of external forces. For the stability and sustenance of this new society, Shaaban observes, there is need to create awareness about righteousness in all sectors of life at both individual and societal levels. Even religious organizations will have to reckon with the new times because they will usher in an era of gender equality among other new or transformed values that benefit humanity and progress. As strongly argued and illustrated in Utubora Mkulima, Shaaban believed that a virtuous life is not built on sporadic or spontaneous good deeds which are arrived at by intuition or chance. Rather, virtues are the function of clear and critical thinking about the good as one ought to act only in pursuit of those ends that they have carefully reflected upon. Sometimes the pursuit of the good may require radical action and sacrifice, because indeed no good comes to, nor does the world change for the better for, those who are permanently sitting on their laurels. “True blessings and fortune,” he says, “make visits from time to time to those who are brave, but rarely to those who are weak in thought and lacking in commitments and courage to doing that which is good (Heri huenda mara kwa mara kwa wajasiri, nadra kwenda kwa walegevu. Usipojaribu kutenda neno, utaishi, na uzikwe kabla ya kutenda kitu cho chote katika dunia. Jambo hili la hasara lilikimbiwa sikuzote na Utubora hata akawa mtu wa matendo mengi mema)” (UM 20).

The above statement is a general appeal that everyone ought to know, and then practice, all that is good in order to bring about the realization of the good, desirable society. Both as individuals in their private capacities and as servants in institutions, everyone has the obligation to only that which is good or right. In Siku ya Watenzi Wote, Shaaban crushes the perception of having the state to work for the interests of only a few. There, in pursuit of the idea of gender equality, he champions the rights of women and believes that they are no less deserving of anything no less than men, and he supports the enactment of laws that would protect the rights of women on equal measure with those of any and all other citizens. He observes that because he was dealing with new times – following radical social and political transformations – these matters, especially those calling for visions of new, equal rights for all without exception, will require equally new and fitting modes of deep and careful thinking as opposed to unhelpful ones that do not lift society out of losses, or give hope to those who, either forcefully or by the dynamics of new ways of life, have been victimized due to ignorance and the pains of poverty, all which often happen due to lack of righteousness (SWW ix).

Shaaban explains that the origin of the idea to write Siku ya Watenzi Wote was his belief that love is the foundation in grounding human good. “It is what holds together the relations between different selves, and also the salt that preserves and protects one’s personhood so it is not corrupted by hate” (kiungo kati ya nafsi na nafsi – na chumvi ya hifadhi ya utu usiozeshwe na chuki) (SWW ix). Love, he explains, brings and binds together “two siblings,” by which Shaaban means cognate concepts, into unequaled and unconditional togetherness, or “marriage” as he calls it. He says (SWW ix–x):

Mapenzi haya yalisababishwa yakafaulishwa katika arusi ya furaha isiyo kifani na shangazi mmoja, kati ya wapwa zake wawili vijani, ambao aliwasabilia mahaba yote ya moyo wake: wa kiume, imamu wa jamii ya umoja wa dini mbalimbali katika dunia; na wa kike, mwongofu katika karne hii, ya matukio na mageuzo mengi ya maumbile na ya binadamu , juu ya watu na maisha katika Afrika Mashariki, kama sio katika ulimwengu huu mzima wa ufanifu na uharibifu.

(That love is the kind that binds together two siblings, and the siblings are, on the one hand, the Imamu (religious leader) of the global union of religious systems as the male and, on the other, a female relative, the convert who represents all the social and natural changes of today’s modern world as experienced by many people in East Africa and beyond.)

In other words, for Shaaban, love is a natural human attribute which erases the significance of the (natural) pluralism built upon the separateness and differences between individuals and communities across the globe.

Apparently aware of the problems of contemporary times, Shaaban teaches in Utubora Mkulima (see UM 41–44) that leaders have the duty, by their teachings and exemplary deeds, to direct their societies toward the attainment of tangible positive change in the lives of those among their citizens who may be in need of acts of care. There, Shaaban criticizes the local religious and secular leaders of Busutamu for preaching values in merely abstract manners without living by the same values themselves. He observes that while Muslim preachers talk of Islamic faith and civic peace, one member of their community – BiMkubwa – is gradually dying of depression, a mental health condition, due to having recently lost her husband, son, and then grandson in the recent war. Instead of helping to bring Bimkubwa out of her depressive state by performing simple acts of showing attention and care, the leaders ignored and left her to wither and rot away. To the contrary, Shaaban redefines the idea of good communal leadership by suggesting that a good leader should be that person who is sensitive and humbly listens to, and directs their attention toward the interests and needs of the members of their community.

Shaaban directs his criticism at the practice of taking refuge in simple statements found in the Holy Books of faith like the Bible (Proverbs 19:17, and Matthew 5:7) or the Qur’an (2:110, or 2:177 in the Picktall translation, Zakat – giving of alms to the poor as part of the practice of the virtue of charity) because these passages teach about the heavenly rewards for helping the poor. In Shaaban’s eyes, these are acts of hypocrisy because their aim is self-glorification by those who perform them in the desire to please someone else – even when that is God or Allah, rather than be an act that is prompted by the desire to perform goodness as a virtue in itself. Rather, in his view, moral virtue ought to be seen as a sustained penchant or disposition for doing what is right and just for the simple, rational ground that it is the right thing to do. In the end, doing that which is right is a good that translates into a good foundation in respect of the dignity and worth of one’s Utu. In social and political terms, according to Shaaban, according someone or people their freedom is to give them the foundation for a morally good life for the person or people as it gives them the state of life befitting human beings. It makes them doers – watenzi – as agents of their own actions.

Shaaban may not have been against religion per se, or against any form of its expression, but he obviously was against riding on religion as a shield to hide intellectual shortcomings. In other words, reason, which he believed to be the true foundation of moral values, could not be replaced with faith. And faith was, in his view, not sufficient without the aid of the light of reason. According to him, sometimes actions performed only in compliance with the directives of the Holy Books or the teachings of the religious institutions are only self-serving to those who perform them. In his apparent criticism of the moral shortfalls of religious beliefs acquired solely from religious institutions, Shaaban says that leaders of religious institutions, Christians and Muslims alike, see it enough to bring the poor and the suffering to the doors of either the Church or Mosque, respectively, only for the leaders to abandon them there (KL 74–77, and also SWW 8–12). This is a strong criticism, and it appears to point to Shaaban’s relatedly strong belief that morality has its own intrinsic value – as related by definition to what it means to be and live like humans are rationally expected to – as opposed to being viewed to be good only because it is the divine command.

Shaaban argued that sometimes believers have the tendency of viewing the disadvantaged in society as experiencing their divine-given and therefore deserved fates. Hence such believers will abandon the disadvantaged and the suffering in society while embracing those who are successful as the ones who they consider to be blessed and therefore closer to the divine. He argued against this view by explaining that no-one is born with a curse. In other words, humans are not hopelessly and helplessly tied to predetermined fates. Successes and failures, as well as health conditions, whether they are physical or mental, are acquired in society. And some mental health conditions especially – like PTSD (Post Traumatic Syndrom Disorder) and depression – are socially generated. Hence, unless society itself intervenes to assist those of their members whose ailments are due to social causes, such afflicted individuals are likely to wither away and possibly perish as a result of abandonment. Nobody, he argued, is born into solitude because human nature has no room for solitary life, nor is anyone condemned to suffering in their solitude as if they were less than human. All humans share in Utu in exactly the same measure. Because it is not an attribute of human nature, solitude itself is an evil and unnatural to humans as it engenders true depreciation of human life and the onset of mental health conditions like depression. Solitude is a form of a degenerate human condition that is experienced by folks in society because of lack of proper understanding of human nature and inference and practice of the moral values dictated by this nature.[8] People can slide into solitude as a result of a variety of causes in their lives. Therefore victims of solitude need the intervention of other members of their communities who can help them to re-engage and experience again their social relations and networks with others. Connections with others in one’s community is a source of health, and helping those in need is a good act toward enabling and sustaining these connections. A community whose members are socially connected in a positive way is likely to be happy because, Shaaban argues, this is what human nature itself dictates. Guided by reason, he argued, human life is one that is meant to be lived in communion with others; it was not meant to be solitary like that of most beasts in the jungle or domesticated. By contrast, human life is meant to produce good – such as happiness – for oneself and for others through performance of those deeds which bring about the common good. Shaaban thought that such deeds include mutual respect, fairness, love, and support of one’s neighbor who is understood to be anyone in need, like Utubora’s help of BiMkubwa (UM 41–48). The practice of these acts of positive connectivity with others is how human life is morally meant to be lived, as they are the kind of conduct that distinguishes human life from that of beasts. As he distinguishes between the two in Utubora Mkulima (UM 21):

Nadhani hutaniona mjuba nikisema kuwa hapana jambo baya duniani kama kuona kiumbe mwenye umbo la mtu amebadilika kuwa kama mnyama kwa uovu wa matendo yake. Wa miguu miwili huwaje [mpaka akawa kama] wa miguu minne.

(I hope you don’t find me to be overbearing in saying that nothing could be worse than having someone whose conduct is so bad that he or she is closer to being a beast than being a person. What would cause a person to transform into behaving like [he/she was] a beast?)

5. Shaaban’s order of virtues

Of the virtues, Shaaban ranks righteousness (Adili) and justice (haki) highest. He considers them to be the most important of all virtues because they are also the regulators and keepers of social order, as practicing them also keeps the other virtues in check. Those other virtues include moderation (kipimo), courage (ushujaa), kindness (hisani), peace (amani), trust or faith (imani), learning (elimu), love (mapenzi), and intelligence (akili). What is interesting about Shaaban’s maxims is the highest position he gives to righteousness because it is not only a virtue in its own right, but it is also special because it is the foundation of all the other virtues because it provides justification for the right conduct in any situation. Having the discipline of reason, that is, epistemological discipline, or being wise (kuwa mtu mwenye hekima) is what enables a person to consider carefully – reason about or rationally examine – every time, not just what the right thing to do is, but also, and more fundamentally, what it is that makes an action to be right, or be the best one among alternatives. Thus, to be righteous or virtuous (kuwa mwadilifu) is to be that person who not only applies his or her best reason to understanding what is presented to them for counsel, but also one who, in their own conduct, acts only after careful consideration of the nature and objects of their action. A righteous person is one who is epistemologically committed to objectivity and truth, and to be morally committed to fairness, justice, and generally to doing only that which is judiciously right. She or he is deliberative, and avoids acting on impulse or intuition. This, according to Shaaban, is what guides a righteous person to act with moderation, to be courageous in doing the right thing, to be kind, and also to keep the peace and to observe their faith, all in the right measure. Thus, the inevitable theme of Shaaban’s other work, Adili na Nduguze,[9] is the call to the importance of a rational search for this balance of virtues both within oneself and in one’s application of them in guiding her or his conduct and relations toward other people, especially in business dealings. All moral qualities become and remain virtues – internalized and consistently practiced as a way of life – only under the guidance of righteousness (Adili) and justice (haki) as the epitome of wisdom.

There is no doubt that Shaaban had a sharp philosophical mind and was a deep thinker with a creative knowledge of KiSwahili (the language) beyond its everyday use as a medium of ordinary or simple conversation. At the same time, although he strove to establish his well-considered view that moral theorization is primarily a secular rational enterprise, Shaaban did not necessarily downplay the role of religious knowledhe in shaping  a person's character. Thus, while his works establish him as a secular thinker first and foremost, Shaaban also clang firmly to his Islamic faith. His early learning about “good living” and the virtues that shape it appears to stem from his experiences in the Madrasa and probably also from deep conversations with local Islamic leaders and teachers in both Tanga, his home-town, and Zanzibar. It is a pertinent part and parcel of Swahili culture for men to hold deep discussions about the proper or correct understanding and interpretations of the verses of the Quran and Hadith. Evening Barazas (gatherings) of elders, teachers, and individuals of local intellectual repute on the porches and verandahs of Swahili homes along the coastal region is a common, almost daily occurrence (Kresse 2007). Interpretations of Islam and matters of communal well-being provided content and contexts for disputations among these local intellectuals. True to his style of good storytelling with deep concepts compacted into personal names to teach important lessons in story form, Shaaban quickly became famous and notorious in his community as a witty storyteller and fiction writer. In transiting from orality to the written storytelling, he ushered in a brand new style in Swahili literature. But Shaaban was far more complex than just making this transition. As an African, he avoided the prevalent use of animal characters in his stories as is commonly found in indigenous African literary forms, especially about values. Instead, he adopted the fictional style of indigenous Arab literature in using humanized characters. But he did more: he reverted to using KiSwahili words and gave them new semantic roles as potent conceptual indicators. Where no such words existed in single form for his purposes, he coined new ones, invariably revealing the depth of his imagination and abstract thinking. And there was still more. Shaaban was writing at a time when there was a heightened level of political and social tension in Zanzibar and also in Tanganyika generally (Glassman 2011). In Zanzibar, the tension was between indigenous Africans many of whom were descended from freed slaves from the mainland working in alliance with descendants of African-Arab mixed race, known as the Shirazi, on the one hand, and the descendants of Arab settlers who controlled the economy, on the other. Literature, including news, was mostly in Arabic and English at the time, so the indigenous people, while oppressed, had neither voice nor avenue for expression. With this background, Shaaban's writings, in language, style, and content, especially immediately following WWII as we see in Utubora Mkulima (UM), was part of the subaltern movement and conscience-building. These tensions culminated in the bloody January 1964 revolution that ended the Arab-led hegemony on the island. Yet Shaaban remained a religious person and ardent Muslim at heart while at the same time intellectually transcending its limits as he said was obervable in the practices of many believers in the world of his experience. While believing that faith was a good cognitive stance, he believed that finding the rationally firm and undeniable grounds for the moral principles learned in religious teachings required more than just the faith. It required a carefully considered philosophical insight. See what he says in the quotation from the “Foreword” to Adili na Ndugize below (AN vii) about the location of morality proper. In short, Shaaban sets an exemplary alternative to the Euromonopolistic claim to the style of philosophizing and arguing ideas.

A prime example of Shaaban’s influential and pioneering style is his use of a fictional break-all discussion between Makuu – a name he coins from KiSwahili “Trouble” for a man he portrays as a Muslim who was well educated in the Madrasas in Zanzibar, but is narcissistic and egoistic – and Radhia (meaning “of good and desirable character”) to critique vain Islamic education in preference for the secular Radhia because her position is rationally and socially agreeable. Yet his list of virtues, and especially his idea of righteousness and justice as the foundation of all the other virtues, resonates with what are described in Islamic ethics as the thirty-six everyday virtues of the third tier of Islamic virtues. This strategy of rationalizing morality is not foreign to Islamic moral theory. The Mu‘tazilites, also known as the proponents of “objective morality” in Islamic thought and the founders of rational or philosophical theology in Islam, were concerned with establishing that the nature of right and wrong can be determined rationally and independently of divine prescriptions. Modern Sunni Muslims, who make up the Muslim populations of Eastern Africa, and through whose teachings in the Madrasas Shaaban was probably inducted into the Islamic faith, place emphasis on reason, dialogue with others, and the rational basis of ethics.[10]

“Verily the most honored of you in the sight of Allah is (he/she who is) the most righteous of you,” declares the Qur’an (49:13). But how does one become righteous? From a negative angle, Shaaban believed that a life devoid of the best use of reason is a form of poverty because it would be based on the deprivation of that which is the defining quality and ideal of human nature. He did not believe that righteousness was a gift that comes from an external source, nor is it inherited with biological descent from one’s lineage, and much less from one’s social class.[11] While these bestow upon an individual person the physical and material pass-downs associated with them in the form of biological heredity and social inheritance, princes and merchants are worth nothing if they do not have the discipline of intellect by which to discern and inculcate into their daily behavior the right moral qualities that would enable them to practice fairness in their dealings or endear them to society. This is the pivotal and driving message in Shaaban’s Adili Na Nduguze.

Righteousness (Adili) begins with one’s own love for knowledge – of what is objective and true, and of what is right – hence one trains their mind in the right steps toward its attainment. Measured temperament is a key ingredient of the discipline of the intellect. So long as a person is of the right mind, even a young person can develop the qualities of epistemological objectivity and truth, and the moral virtue of goodness as understood through a careful and considerate reason. Shaaban observes, for example, that although traditional convention tended to estimate intellectual maturity to start showing at the age of about thirty years, Utubora – the protagonist of Utubora Mkulima – had exhibited both emotional and intellectual maturity at a relatively much younger age than is assigned by convention. For example, at that age he already was able to give guidance and counsel to some of those older than himself, like the lady who was his nanny as a baby and continued to be his care giver later in life. Also, he was able, through critical thinking and self-control, to withstand the effects of mental health issues – what is medically known today as PTSD (Post Traumatic Syndrome Disorder) – associated with people returning from war.[12] By exhibiting and maintaining a balanced mental disposition as demonstrated in his ability to process and understand complex ideas and experiences in everyday life instead of falling into a state of depression as a result of his experiences in the war, or as a result of losing his fiancée to the son of a local rich man while he was away at war, Utubora thought critically about those things that should matter more in life and so decided to quietly follow other pursuits and move on with his life. Rather than surrender to the idea of fate, he reasoned that he could shape his own future as nothing good ever happens without critical thinking and making tough choices, so long as they are good, at least from a rational standpoint. These traits in Utubora’s character would contrast him sharply to that of the prince of the (Zanzibari) Sultanate as portrayed in Shaaban’s other, and even more famous work, Kusadikika (KN).

But why Adili[13], or righteousness? Who needs it, and why? According to Shaaban, righteousness is the fundamental virtue upon which all others are built. A righteous person (Mtu mwadilifu) practices patient, careful, and analytic considerations of all sides of matters before them. They adopt the right attitude (honesty) which alone will lead them to the proper understanding by objective observation and truthful reporting. And this, in turn, will enable them to relate to, or to deal with others with fairness and justice as is ideally expected of all rational beings. This implies the view that human life is one of difficult yet, ideally, constant striving to distinguish good from evil and, consequently, to ward off that which is destructive to humanity. Shaaban adopts a familiar mode of presenting this text about ethics. “Although I mention angels and evil spirits and other strange beings,” he explains, almost as if apologizing for this style that is so common in Arabic-language literature. “Instead,” he says, “it is about common, mundane things, because the struggle between good and evil permeates all segments of life – ordinary, or professional and business or trading careers”. Hasidi, or sometimes Husudu (Envy, Grudge) and Mwivu (Jealousy, from the KiSwahili noun, Uwivu, or Wivu)[14] are always in contention with Adili (Righteousness) for control of people’s conscience and welfare. These temptations are particularly evident where the goal is pursuit of material wealth and other forms of personal gain in life. Although Adili is always in the minority in these struggles, she/he needs to come out triumphant for justice to prevail in all human affairs (AN vi-vii). In Abrahamic traditions of both Islam and Judaism (from which Christianity claims descent), this struggle is often between angels and evil spirits, but Good – which is how angelic qualities are characterized in contrast to those of evil – ought to prevail. According to Shaaban, and as taught by Islam, righteousness ought to be applied to all domains of life irrespective of one’s calling or the domain of their occupation, because the competition or fight between Good (Adili) and Evil (Hasidi and Mwivu) relentlessly lurks everywhere. So it is important that humans are unfailingly alert and focused only on those actions of righteousness (Adili). So, the “Foreword” as cited above could be translated as follows: “Despite framing moral struggles in the human consciousness in apparent religious vocabulary and figuration, morality proper is the domain of rational consideration about what is right or good conduct in matters of everyday practical experience.” (AN vii).

Although it is set in colonial times and may probably have been conceived to address the evils associated with the political, racial, religious, and economic or commercial injustices of the time, Shaaban may well have been writing Adili na Nduguze for Africa’s present-day moral struggles and failed leadership. For Shaaban, the kleptocratic subculture in Africa signals the moral defeat of honesty and trust as the values of righteousness in the management of public institutions. For him, the trouble starts with failure to impart to the youth the right moral education and its role in shaping who they ought to desire to become: like Utubora, or like Hasidi and Mwivu. The right choice can be only one.

Bibliography

Primary Sources: Works by Shaaban Robert

  • [AN] Adili na Nduguze, New edition, Dar es Salaam: Mkuki na Nyota, 2010 (Also published by Tanzania Publishing House, 1977, 1st. edition, and 2010, as 14th edition).
  • [KL] Koja la Lugha, Nairobi: Oxford University Press, 1969.
  • [KN] Kusadikika: Nchi iliyo Angani, London: Nelson, 1951; later edition, Nairobi: Evans Brothers Ltd, 1966.
  • [MY] Maisha Yangu na Baada ya Miaka Hamsini, Dar es Salaam: Mkuki Na Nyota, 1991 (2003 as 3rd. edition).
  • [PL] Pambo la Lugha, Johannesburg: Witwatersrand University Press, 1960.
  • [SWW] Siku ya Watenzi Wote, Nairobi: Thomas Nelson and Sons, 1968.
  • [UM] Utubora Mkulima, Nairobi: Evans Brothers Limited, 1968.

Secondary Sources

  • Adeney-Riskotta, Bernard T., 1995, Strange Virtues: Ethics in a Multicultural World, Lisle, IL: IVP Academic.
  • Al-Attar, Mariam, 2010, Islamic Ethics: Divine Command Theory in Arabo-Islamic Thought, London: Routledge Publishers.
  • Glassman, Jonathon, 2011, War of Words, War of Stones: Racial Thought and Violence in Colonial Zanzibar, Blloomingto, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Idowu, Bolaji E., 1962, Olodumare: God in Yoruba Belief, London: Longmans.
  • –––, 1973, African Traditional Religion: A Definition, New York: Orbis Books.
  • Kresse, Kai, 2007, Philosophising in Mombasa: Knowledge, Islam and the Intellectual Practice on the Swahili Coast, Edinburgh, Scotland: Edinburgh University Press.
  • Lufuluabo, F. M., 1962, Vers une théodicée bantoue, Tournai: Casterman.
  • –––, 1966, Perspective théologique bantoue et théologie scholastique, Malines: St-François.
  • Masolo, D. A., 2019, “Crafting Ideal Conditions: Ubuntu and the Challenges of Modern Society,” in James Ogude (ed.), Ubuntu and the Reconstitution of Community, Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, pp. 40–72.
  • Mbiti, John S., 1969, African Religions and Philosophy, London: Heinemann Educational Books.
  • –––, 1970, Concepts of God in Africa, London: S. P. C. K. [The Society for Promoting Christian Knowledge].
  • Mudimbe, V. Y., 1988, The Invention of Africa: Gnosis, Philosophy, and the Order of Knowledge, Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Mulokozi, M. M., 1975, “Two Utopias: A Comparative Examination of William Morris’s News From Nowhere, and Shaaban Robert’s Siku ya Watenzi Wote,” Umma, 5(2):11–49.
  • p’Bitek, Okot, 1970, African Religions in Western Scholarship, Nairobi: East African Literature Bureau.
  • Shaw, Rosalind, 1990, “The Invention of African Traditional Religion,” in Religion, Vol. 20. 339–353.
  • Tutu, Desmond, 2013, God Is Not a Christian: Speaking Truth in Times of Crisis, London: Rider.
  •  

Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

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Dismas Masolo <da.masolo@louisville.edu>

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