1. Amazingly, this modesty would prove to be no hindrance to Shaaban’s intellectual power and influence as a writer who pioneered the pursuit of conceptual depth and a unique allegorical style in Swahili literature. As an idealist philosopher, his equal greatness is, using his own vintage beautiful style, obliquely indicated in this statement by Sara to Yusuff, the respected British-educated Attorney: “ Look, I would like you to be my friend because, look, you are one of the people who had the opportunity to reflect during your sojourn and studies in the United Kingdom, but just like I did sitting by the ocean and in the fields in the midst of birds and crops, or light and darkness as my playmates on the Island” (SWW 55).

2. This phrase shows the influence of Arab traditions on the traditions of the people of East African coast line, especially in Kenya and today’s Tanzania, including the Swahili people. Besides the adoption of Islam itself, the influence of Arab traditions, as seen here, is present also in KiSwahili, the language. Here, the phrase is adopted from Arabic in which it means “a community of just people.” The word “Adili” in Arabic means “justice.” As we shall see later in his list of virtues, Shaaban uses it for “righteousness,” and reserves “haki” for “justice,” but it is assumed that a righteous person (Mtu mwadilifu) will be a “just person (Mtu mwenye haki).”

3. It is an account of these changes and their significance for humanity that opens his other book, Siku ya Watenzi Wote (cited) as depicting fundamental values to the very idea of humanity, and uses them to articulate and defend the equal rights for women. See SWW 1–12.

4. This is another Arabic-derived word which means “wisdom,” as is also found in Quranic vocabulary.

5. The presentation and defense of this idea is spread over a number of Shaaban’s works: see KN, UM, and AN.

6. Yet another Arabic/Quranic -derived word meaning “faith.”

7. Shaaban lists many of these in Koja la Lugha. He recites (in poetic verses) both ideals not only as goals of everyday real life practices but, more importantly, as required habits and dispositions of all humans. It includes as well poems of encouragement for people to never tire, be afraid, or be ashamed to pursue that which is good. For, he says, “pursue that which brings a smile and happiness to your face and avoid that which brings regrets” (pp. 13–14).

8. This is the debate between Makuu and Radhia, in reality Shaaban’s style of naming and debating concepts by contrasting them to their opposites (in this case individualist versus communalist values) in SWW (26–30) regarding the moral worth of Utubora’s help rendered to BiMkubwa who was stricken by depression and withdrawal from her social life as a result of misfortunes. The deep and complex debate is not only about service to those in need, but also about the naturalness of solitary life to humans. While Makuu, a Muslim with a background in solid education in the Madrasas (Islamic schools where children learn the basic tenets of the Islamic faith), argues that no-one is obliged to help others like BiMkubwa who are living their fate in life as apportioned by the creator, Radhia argues strongly against this view. In her own counter-view which is in defense of Utubora, solitude is unhuman; that is, it is contrary to human nature as humans are communitarian by the nature of their specific type. Their nature is to depend on each other. Because of these fundamental rational differences, Radhia and Makuu, once betrothed, part ways. For conceptual deconstruction of this allegorical narrative, see (Masolo 2019: 54–57).

9. This title can roughly be translated into English as Righteousness and Its Cognates, meaning that a righteous person is will likely possess other, related virtues because righteousness is the foundation of them all. Shaaban’s discussion of the challenges of the virtue of Adili (righteousness) is exposed later here below.

10. For a detailed account of the characteristics of Mu‘tazilites, and how they differ from their rivals, the Ash‘arites who believe in the Divine Command theory, see Mariam al-Attar (2010).

11. Shaaban’s statement in this particular regard was on the occasion of criticizing what, from a social and political standpoint, he perceived as an unjust rule of Zanzibar by the Sultans descended from the rulers of Oman and the colonial rule of the mainland by the German and British forces. But because the target of the criticism of social injustice in Kusadikika is evidently an Arab ruler, or the system of the Sultanate as a whole, it can be inferred that this line about the non-social (classisist) and non-biological origin, heredity, or location of righteousness is aimed at the often-unconcealed Arab racist and classicist relations with African natives of the coastal Tanganyika and Zanzibar as part of the Arab Omani Empire – then under Sultan Seyyid Sir Khalifa II bin Harub who held the throne between December 9, 1911 and October 9, 1960, Shaaban was eager to show the hollowness of racial and class discrimination because, many times, in his view, those who perpetrate these vices do so because they lack rational discipline. Race and class do not endow one with proper knowledge, let alone the right moral knowledge.

12. It is not clear if Shaaban formed this idea from observing any particular person(s) returning from war, but it is obvious that he is referring to some of many people who were returning from fighting, possibly abroad, in WWII on behalf of the colonial armies into which Africans had been coercively drafted.

13. “Adili” is the KiSwahili term for “righteousness” in English. The title of the book, then, takes the same style as used in Utubora Mkulima, and Kusadikika: Nchi Iliyo Angani. The earlier translation of the latter as Kusadikika: The Country in the Sky misses crucial fundamentals as it makes a literal rendition of the sub-title instead of rendering the philosophical meaning of the phrase which would have shown the proper reading of Shaaban. There now exists a new translation in kindle version by Harriet Nyanchama Ocharo which now simply says, Kusadikika: An English translation.

14. Indeed, true to his style, Shaaban uses these names for (negative) moral character as personal names in the allegorical story to depict the struggle between virtues and vices.