1. The Tattvāvatāra and Tattvāvatāravṛtti are extant only in Tibetan translation (PD 3121; D 3892). The root text is not extant as an independent treatise, surviving only as embedded in the autocommentary. There is one additional text attributed to Śrīgupta in the Tengyur (Bstan ’gyur = canons of Indian Buddhist commentarial literature in Tibetan translation), which is a brief commentarial work in the Tantra (rgyud) section, titled Śrīratnamañjarīnāmaṭīkā (Dpal rin po che snye ma zhes bya ba’i rgya cher ’grel pa, PD 0112; D 1217).

2. Those endorsing this date based on the Tibetan relative chronology include Seyfort Ruegg (1981), Eckel (1986: 8), Rospatt (1995: 80), Blumenthal (2004: 61), Almogi (2009: 184), and Aitken (2021a). Matsumoto (1978), Kobayashi (1992: 37–42), and Akahane (2003: 127) have challenged Tibetan, suggesting that he postdates Śāntarakṣita. See Aitken (2025) for an analysis of this dispute and an argument that there is insufficient evidence to emend the received relative chronology.

3. The *Svātantrika label signifies (in part) a style of argumentation which, following Bhāviveka, deploys independent inferential arguments (svatantrānumāna) to establish theses rather than exclusively utilizing reductio ad absurdum arguments (prasaṅga) to undermine the theses of his opponents. For discussions on the disputed historical development of the *Svātantrika and *Prāsaṅgika doxographical labels, which are likely Tibetan innovations, see Dreyfus and McClintock (2003), Seyfort Ruegg (2006), and Vose (2009 & 2020).

4. Śrīgupta’s tradition of Madhyamaka was highly influential in early Tibetan scholasticism by way of the works of his successors—the so-called “[treatises of the] three Madhyamaka [scholars] of the East” (dbu ma shar gsum), referring to Jñānagarbha’s Satyadvayavibhaṅga (SDV), Śāntarakṣita’s MA, and Kamalaśīla’s Madhyamakāloka. Somewhat ironically, Candrakīrti’s (seventh century) Madhyamaka ultimately came to dominate Tibetan Madhyamaka alongside Dignāga and Dharmakīrti’s tradition of logic and epistemology, despite the fact that Candrakīrti was an outspoken critic of Dignāga’s epistemological project. See Vose (2009) on the historical development of Candrakīrti’s ascension in Tibetan Madhyamaka.

5. As will be discussed below, satya has a semantic range inclusive of both “truth” and “reality” and, accordingly, the concept connoted by saṃvṛtisatya in this context is inclusive of both these meanings.

6. Bhāviveka II refers to the eighth-century author of the Madhyamakārthasaṃgraha (MAS) and Madhyamakaratnapradīpa (MRP). See Heitmann (2004: xv–xviii), Saitō (2005: 832–838), Eckel (2008: 17–27), Krasser (2011: 49–76), and He and van der Kuijp (2014) on disputes concerning the authorship of the various works attributed to Bhāviveka.

7. On Śāntarakṣita’s neither-one-nor-many argument in the MA, see, for instance, Tillemans (1982), Ichigō (1989), Blumenthal (2004), and Aitken (2023 & 2025). For an edition, translation, and analysis of Śāntarakṣita’s neither-nor-nor-many argument as applied to matter from the Yogācāra perspective in his Tattvasaṃgraha (TS), see Saccone (2018); for a discussion of the difference between these two versions of Śāntarakṣita’s argument, see Aitken (2023).

8. naiko ’nekapradeśatvān nāpradeśaś ca kaś cana / vinaikam api nāneko … For a similar line of reasoning, see also Nāgārjuna’s ŚS 32ab; he runs a loosely related argument against real wholes and parts in VP 33–39. Nāgārjuna’s successor Āryadeva (third century) echoes this line of reasoning in his Catuḥśataka 14.19.

9. Śāntarakṣita uses this example to illustrate this point in MAV ad MA 61.

10. phyi rol nang na gnas ’di kun // yang dag tu ni rang bzhin med // gcig dang du ma’i rang bzhin nyid // bral ba’i phyir na gzugs brnyan bzhin //. As mentioned, Śāntarakṣita closely echoes TA 1 in MA 1: niḥsvabhāvā amī bhāvās tattvataḥ svaparoditāḥ / ekānekasvabhāvena viyogāt pratibimbavat // (Sanskrit preserved in BCAP ad 9.2); “In reality, [s] everything that our own and other [philosophical systems] propound [p] does not have intrinsic nature, [r] due to lacking an intrinsic nature that is either unitary or non-unitary, [e] like a reflection”.

11. This point is central to Śrīgupta’s response to the objection that the neither-one-nor-many argument is guilty of the fallacy that the subject, or the “basis” of the inference is unestablished (āśrayāsiddha-hetvābhāsa), meaning either that the subject of the inference is not accepted by both parties or else that the subject does not exist at all. See Aitken (2025) for an analysis of Śrīgupta’s defense of the soundness of the neither-one-nor-many argument and how his responses to objections that the argument is guilty of a range of logical fallacies are both influenced by and deviate from strategies employed by Dignāga, Dharmakīrti, and some of their commentators.

12. Accordingly, in RĀ 1.71d, Nāgārjuna compares the relation between unity and multiplicity/non-unity to that between existence (astitā) and non-existence (nāstitā). In both these cases, he takes the negative correlative to be parasitic on the positive correlative, such that the negative is incoherent without the positive.

13. On issues concerning topic-neutrality in mereology, see Johnston (2005), Varzi (2010), Donnelly (2011), and Johansson (2015).

14. See, for example, Nāgārjuna’s VP 33–39 for a mereological analysis of a formal inference.

15. AŚ abbreviates antaraśloka, “transitional stanza”.

16. See, e.g., AKBh ad 1.43d2: kiṃ punaḥ paramāṇavaḥ spṛśantyanyonyamāhosvin na / na spṛśantīti kāśmīrakāḥ / kiṃ kāraṇam yadi tāvat sarvānmanā spṛśeyurmiśrībhaveyurdravyāṇi / athaikadeśena sāvayavāḥ prasajyeran / niravayavāśca paramāṇavaḥ / [AKBh [Pradhan 1967: 32.12–15]). See also CŚ 9.15–17 and Vś 12.

17. bsags mi rung phyir rdul gcig min // rdul phra rab ni gcig pa nyid ma yin te / rang bzhin gcig pu de la mngon par phyogs par yul gcig na gnas pas na bsags pa mi rung pa’i phyir ro / rang bzhin gzhan gyis mngon du phyogs pa yang ma yin te / du ma nyid du thal bar ’gyur ba’i phyir ro /.

18. Although these sorts of arguments do not feature a term that precisely translates “extended,” and although the property of having spatially differentiable loci may not be intensionally equivalent to being spatially extended, these properties look to be extensionally equivalent insofar as to occupy spatially distinct loci just is to be spatially extended. Since extension involves occupying spatially distinct loci, which are equivalent to spatially distinct parts, by Śrīgupta’s lights, an “extended simple” would be a contradiction in terms. For contemporary arguments defending the coherence of extended simples, see Markosian (1998, 2004a, 2004b) and McDaniel (2007). See McDaniel (2003) for an argument against extended simples.

19. Nyāya and Vaiśeṣika philosophers maintain that when a whole inheres in some parts, those parts act as the “inhered-in causes” (samavāyi-kāraṇa) of that whole.

20. There are two dichotomies that can be derived here from satya and alīka as applied to representations, one epistemological and the other ontological: (i) The epistemological dichotomy concerns the veridicality of the representational content of a cognition. (ii) The ontological dichotomy concerns whether or not a representation itself is real. It is the ontological dichotomy that drives Śrīgupta’s argument.

21. *Satyākāravāda and *Alīkākāravāda are not attested labels in extant Indic doxographies, which instead feature the Sākāravāda-Nirākāravāda distinction, referring, respectively, to the theories on which consciousness is or is not endowed with a mental representation. Tibetan doxographers commonly classified Yogācāra Sākāravādins as realists about representations and Yogācāra Nirākāravādins as antirealists about representations. While these labels were imposed onto diverse sets of thinkers in contriving subschools of Yogācāra, they are nonetheless useful for understanding the structure of Śrīgupta’s argument and the range of positions he is targeting. See Almogi (2010) for a survey of these categorizations in late Indian Buddhist and early Tibetan doxographical writings. The Sākāravāda-Nirākāravāda distinction in the context of Yogācāra should be distinguished from the use of this same pair of terms to refer to external world realists who endorse, respectively, representationalist theories of perception (e.g., Sautrāntika) and direct realist theories of perception (e.g., Vaibhāṣika and Nyāya). Indeed, when transitioning from the external world realist to the Yogācāra context, the very meaning of “representation” (ākāra) changes insofar as Yogācārins admit of no corresponding extramental object that is “represented”. Instead, here a representation refers merely to the content of a cognition, i.e., what the cognition is about.

22. Prajñākaragupta’s treatment of nondual awareness in his commentary on Dharmakīrti’s version of this argument merits more careful consideration vis-à-vis Śrīgupta’s treatment of nondual awareness. Such analysis may even prove helpful for more decisively determining Śrīgupta’s relative chronology; see PVA ad 3.197–207; on this section of the PVA, see Inami (2011).

23. This is also one of the sections of Śrīgupta’s neither-one-nor-many argument that finds the most tenuous connection with Śāntarakṣita’s iteration in the MA.

24. For a detailed reconstruction and analysis of Śrīgupta’s case against mental simples, see Aitken (2024). For an analysis of this argument in discussion with Leibniz, see Aitken and McDonough (2020).

25. The name “numerical parity of awareness and representations view” is taken from Tibetan doxographies, and although it is not an attested doxographical label in Indic writings, the view it refers to is.

26. rnam pa tha dad ma yin rnams // sna tshogs phyir na sems gcig min // shes pa gcig pu ma yin te // rnam pa du ma dang tha mi dad pa’i phyir ro // gzhan du na chos ’gal bar gnas pa gnyis tha dad par ’gyur te /.

27. cig car du shes pa du ma khas len na / rnam pa rnams rdul phran bzhin du bsags par mi ’gyur te / ji ltar rtag tu bsgrubs pa bzhin no /.

28. rnam rnams mi bden nyid yin na / ha cang thal ’gyur /.

29. gzhan yang brdzun pa rnams dang shes par ma ’brel ba’i phyir snang ba nges pa dang ldan par mi ’gyur ro //.

30. nges par snang ba’i dbang gis ’brel par khas len na ni bden pa kho nar ’gyur te / gzhan du na de’i bdag nyid dang de las byung ba mi srid pa’i phyir ro //.

31. ’on te gnyis las nges par grol ba yin na / de ni ji ltar na shes pa yin /.

32. rig bya med phyir gzhan mi rig // gnyis su med phyir bdag nyid min // brtags na yang dag nyid mi ’gyur // rnam pa gzhan gang yin pa smros //.

33. According to the Vaiśeṣikasūtra, the defining characteristics of substances include being an inhered-in cause (VS 1.1.15). Eternal substances may also be instrumental, or efficient, causes (nimitta-kāraṇa). Although ether, space, and time are all inactive, or without motion (niṣkriya), they nonetheless serve as efficient causes in various ways. For instance, time contributes to the production of the qualities of anteriority, posteriority, and simultaneity (VS 7.2.22); for a discussion of this, see, for instance, Halbfass (1992: 207–209).

34. See, e.g., PVin 2.55 (PVin 2.55ab=PV 3.3ab). For an overview of Dharmakīrti’s argument for momentariness from existence, see, for instance, Yoshimizu (1999), Eltschinger (2010), and Tillemans (2011 [2021]).

35. On Gelukpa (Dge lugs pa) treatments of the neither-one-nor-many argument, see also Txillemans (1982, 1983, 1984, and 2021), Lopez (1987), and Tillemans and Lopez (1998).

36. ma brtags gcig pu nyams dga’ ste // de ’dra las byung de bzhin no // dngos po de dag de lta bu’i // don bya de dang de byed do //.

37. One also finds related terms such as avicāraramaṇīya, avicāramanohara, and avicāritaramaṇīya.

38. Mādhyamikas recognize two different notions of dependent being: one that belongs to the foundationalist framework and which they reject, and another that qualifies conventionally real things and which they affirm. The first is a kind of extrinsic being (parabhāva) that is founded on some thing(s) that has intrinsic being (svabhāva), or ontological independence (see, e.g., MMK 15.3), whereas the second is something that is merely dependently originated (pratītyasamutpanna) and which is not well founded.

39. For a detailed analysis of Śrīgupta’s three criteria for conventional reality and how they might be used to develop an account of the structure of reality, see Aitken (2021a).

40. See, for instance, Nāgārjuna’s argument in MMK 24 that being dependently originated is possible only for things that lack an intrinsic nature and are thus not ultimately real.

41. PV 1.27, PV 3.283ab/PVin 1.32ab, and possibly PV 3.210cd.

42. arthakriyāsamarthaṃ yat tad atra paramārthasat / anyat saṃvṛtisat prokte te svasāmānyalakṣaṇe //. See Franco and Notake (2014: 35–37) for an edition, translation, discussion, and overview of the relevant literature concerning this passage. See also NB 1.15: arthakriyāsāmarthyalakṣaṇatvād vastunaḥ /.

43. Arthakriyā might be translated as “causal efficacy” or “practical efficacy,” referring to something’s ability to fulfill its purpose (artha), or to the property possessed by objects on account of which one can accomplish one’s aim/objective (artha). Still, that aim, objective, or purpose is presumably achieved through causal processes. Aside from serving as the basis on which one may achieve practical human aims (puruṣārtha), another paradigmatic way in which Dharmakīrti speaks of this criterion is as x’s capacity to serve as a cause for a perception of x, since, in his system, the ultimate reals that possess this property are also distinguished by being the exclusive objects of perception. Dharmakīrti uses this same expression in defining a source of knowledge or knowledge-event (two meanings of pramāṇa), insofar as a knowledge-event is a cognition on the basis of which one may engage in successful action, or the accomplishment of some objective (PV 2.1abc). Arnold (2005: 99) suggests that arthakriyā is best translated as “causal efficacy” in the ontological context, and as “pragmatic efficacy” in the epistemological context.

44. In the succeeding stanza (PV 3.4), Dharmakīrti appears to concede that the capacity for causal efficacy itself is only admitted conventionally. The claim that causal efficacy itself is only conventionally real is in keeping with Dharmakīrti’s claim that all relations—including causal relations—are merely conceptual constructs superimposed onto a world of radically distinct particulars (see, e.g., SP 7–18). Still, according to Dharmakīrti’s epistemology, the sort of causal relation that underwrites a sound causal inference is a “natural relation” (svabhāvapratibandha), insofar as it is grounded in the intrinsic natures of the relata (see, e.g., Pramāṇavārttikasvavṛtti, PVSV 12.4). The intent of PV 3.4 is much disputed, both in historical commentaries as well as contemporary secondary scholarship. In particular, there is disagreement concerning what precisely Dharmakīrti is conceding with the final clause astu yathā tathā, translated here as, “Be that as it may”. According to some interpreters, PV 3.3 expresses the Sautrāntika perspective, while PV 3.4 articulates the Yogācāra perspective on the status of causal relations; see Tosaki (1979–85: 51–54) and Kyūma (1995: 47; 1996: 65–66). Commentators like Prajñākaragupta and Jñānaśrīmitra take PV 3.3 to articulate the criterion for what is ultimately real according to the world, rather than what is in actual fact ultimately real. Others—notably Prajñākaramati and Jitāri—even considered Dharmakīrti to be a Mādhyamika on the basis of PV 3.4; on Prajñākaramati, see Zwilling (1981: 313 n. 17); on Jitāri, see Shirasaki (1986) and Steinkellner (1990: 85 n. 22). Since Dharmakīrti argues for different ontologies in different contexts, discerning his considered position is no straightforward enterprise. See Franco and Notake (2014: 38–42) for an edition, translation, discussion, and overview of the relevant literature concerning PV 3.4.

45. snang du ’dra yang don byed dag // nus pa’i phyir dang mi nus phyir // yang dag yang dag ma yin pas // kun rdzob kyi ni dbye ba byas //; see also SDVV and SDVP ad SDV 12. Besides perceptual illusions, Jñānagarbha also mentions pseudo-objects maintained by other philosophical and religious systems (e.g., the Sāṃkhya account of prime matter, pradhāna) as another sort of example of unreal conventional things (SDVV ad SDV 8).

46. For analyses of Candrakīrti’s presentation of the two truths, see, for instance, Cowherds (2011). On the influence of Candrakīrti on Jñānagarbha’s presentation of conventional truth, see Eckel (1986) and Akahane (2008).

47. For analysis of the use of the causal efficacy criterion by subsequent Mādhyamikas, see Aitken (2025: 45–51).

48. slu ba mthong phyir ma brtags na // nyams dga’ ba yi tshad ma yis // de yi gzhal bya rnam gzhag na // ’jig rten spyod pa skyob par ’gyur //.

49. pramāṇam avisaṃvādi jñānam arthakriyāsthitiḥ / avisaṃvādanaṃ śabde ’pi abhiprāyanivedanād //; tshad ma bslu med can shes pa // don byed nus par gnas pa ni // mi slu sgra las byung ba yang // mngon par ’dod pa ston phyir ro //. For different perspectives on the status of PV2a and PV 2.5c as definitions of pramāṇa, see, for example, Katsura (1984), Dreyfus (1991, 1997), Franco (1997), Krasser (2001), and Taber (2003). For a helpful introduction to the secondary scholarship and commentarial literature on this topic, see Stoltz (2021: 23–36).

50. TAV AŚ 21: lung gis bskyed pa’i ’dus byas pa’i // rtog pas bskyed pa’i bdag nyid nyid // rnam par bsal nas snang rnams la // ngo bo spyod par byed pa yin //;
“Having negated only the nature that is fabricated by textual sources or fabricated by conceptual constructs, it is with reference to appearances that things are engaged as the subject of the inference”.

51. Jñānagarbha also describes the ultimate truth as rigs pa’i rjes su ’gro ba, *nyāyānusāra (SDVV ad SDV 4ab).

52. See SDV 3–4: kun rdzob dang ni dam pa’i don // bden gnyis thub pas gsungs pa la // ji ltar snang ba ’di kho na // kun rdzob gzhan ni cig shos yin // slu ba med pas rigs pa ni // don dam yin te kun rdzob min // de ltar mi slu min phyir te // ji ltar snang ba de nyid bden //;
“The Sage taught the two truths: the conventional and the ultimate. The conventional simply corresponds with appearances, while the other is different. [SDV 3] Since it is non-deceptive, reasoning [accords with] the ultimate—not the conventional. Thus, since it is not non-deceptive, [the conventional] is true just insofar as it accords with appearance. [SDV 4]” (trans. Eckel 2009: 122). See also SDV 13.

53. arvāṅ na tattvātmakarūpato ’mī sthitiṃ labhante pravicāryamāṇāḥ / yataḥ padārthā na tato vicāraḥ kāryo hi lokavyavahārasatye //.

54. ji ltar snang* bzhin ngo bo’i phyir // ’di la dpyad pa mi ’jug go // rnam par dpyod pa byed na don // gzhan du song bas gnod par ’gyur //. *The first line of this verse as rendered in the SDV reads instead ji ltar rang bzhin ngo bo’i phyir, while both the SDVV and Śāntarakṣita’s SDVP give the preferable reading: ji ltar snang.

55. The phrase appears frequently in the pramāṇa commentarial tradition beginning in the eighth century, often in expressing the opinion of an opponent, as in Dharmottara’s (c. 740–800) Prāmāṇyaparīkṣā (*Bṛhatprāmāṇyaparīkṣā, PD 3479, 573). Ravigupta (c. 780–840) also uses the expression to characterize the conventional in his Pramāṇavārttikavṛtti (PD 3456, 27).

56. Almogi (2009: 299ff) lays out three positions on the existence of gnosis at the stage of a buddha based on Rong zom Chos kyi bzang po’s (c. eleventh century) discourses, and identifies Indian authors who maintain the following three positions: (i) the dharmadhātu is the sole constituent of buddhahood, which excludes gnosis or cognition of any kind; (ii) a buddha additionally has nonconceptual gnosis; and (iii) a buddha additionally possesses pure mundane gnosis, or conceptual gnosis. Śrīgupta is the only Indian author that Almogi identifies who defends the third view.

57. See, e.g., NB 1.5: abhilāpasaṃsargayogyapratibhāsā pratītiḥ kalpanā.

58. sems can gyi ni don mdzad thabs // rnam rtog ye shes mnga’ ba na // de yi kun mkhyen rtsom pa ni // de don yin phyir nyes pa med //.

59. dngos po yod na kun mkhyen la // don ni gsal bar snang bar ’gyur // nor pa tsam la gzhi med phyir // gsal dang mi gsal su zhig sems //.

60. PVin 1.4ab pratyakṣaṃ kalpanāpoḍham abhrāntam.

61. As discussed in §2.2 and n. 44, see PV 2.1abc, which articulates Dharmakīrti’s so-called first definition of a pramāṇa.

62. Elsewhere, Śrīgupta claims that all that exists is mere error, without drawing a distinction between the conceptual and nonconceptual:

’khrul pa tsam zhig yod zhes pa // ma ’khrul yin par nges par bzung //;
“Hold fast to the ascertainment that the understanding that error alone (*bhrāntimātra) exists is non-erroneous” (TA 22cd).

63. This translation follows the Sanskrit of PV 3.283ab/PVin 1.32ab: na vikalpānubaddhasya spaṣṭārthapratibhāsitā /.

64. bya ba phyi rol lta bas gsungs // gang yin de ‘dir skabs med do //.

65. Lindtner (1997: 195ff) defends the traditional ascription of the Tattvasiddhi to Śāntarakṣita, though this has been contested by Steinkellner (1999: 356ff; 2008: 292). Steinkellner has published a critical edition (2001) and English translation (2008) of the final section of the Tattvasiddhi which includes the relevant discussion of whether or not omniscience is conceptual.

66. Steinkellner (2008: 292) remarks that he remains puzzled by this highly unusual position, stating:

I still cannot answer my initial main question however: How is it possible to promote the idea, as the Tattvasiddhi seems to do, that the cognitive event occurring at the end of yogic efforts is of an essentially conceptual nature, when the Buddhist tradition in general emphasizes its non-conceptuality?

67. He further characterizes omniscient cognition as qualified by the three aspects of subject, object, and reflexive awareness, since otherwise it could not determine all knowable objects: nanu tasyāpy aśeṣākāraśūnyasya saṃvinmātrasya katham aśeṣajñeyaparicchedakatvam / na hi nirābhāsasya jñānasya katham api paricchedakatvaṃ vidyate / (Steinkellner 2001: 846); see Steinkellner’s (2008: 302) translation of this passage.

68. See also Steinkellner’s (1991) discussion of this passage where he disputes Lindtner’s (1984) interpretation.

69. PVin 1 ad k. 58: so’pi kathaṃ sarvajñānānāṃ viṣayaṃ vyatirecyann upaplavetarayoḥ pramāṇetaratāṃ brūyāt viśeṣābhāvāt / (PVin [Steinkellner 2007: 43.12–14]). For accounts of Dharmakīrti’s method of shifting philosophical positions characterized as “sliding scales of analysis,” see Dreyfus (1997) and Dunne (2004: 53–79).

70. PVin 1 ad k. 58: sāṃvyavahārikasya caitat pramāṇasya rūpam uktam atrāpi pare mūḍhā visaṃvādayanti lokam iti / cintāmayīm eva tu prajñām anuśīlayanto vibhramavivekanirmalam anapāyi pāramārthikapramāṇam abhimukhīkurvanti / (PVin [Steinkellner 2007: 44.2–5]). See also Eltschinger’s (2016: 40–44) discussion and translation of this section.

71. See Almogi (2009) and Aitken (2021b) for discussions of the reception of Śrīgupta’s account of conceptual gnosis.