Śrīgupta

Śrīgupta was a circa seventh–early eighth century Indian Buddhist philosopher who made notable contributions to the Madhyamaka Buddhist philosophical tradition in relation to metaphysics, epistemology, philosophy of mind, and the theory of two truths (satyadvaya). In his best-known work, the Introduction to Reality (Tattvāvatāra, abbreviated TA) and autocommentary (Tattvāvatāravṛtti, abbreviated TAV),^[1] Śrīgupta presents the first fully-developed Madhyamaka iteration of the influential “neither-one-nor-many argument” (ekānekaviyogahetu), which, in succeeding centuries, was to become one of the most important arguments for the Madhyamaka central commitment to “emptiness” (śūnyatā), i.e., the universal absence of an intrinsic nature (niḥsvabhāvatā) (§1). In late Buddhist India, the neither-one-nor-many argument occupied a central place in intra-Buddhist debates between Madhyamaka and Yogācāra philosophers concerning the ontological status of the mind and mental content. And in Tibetan Madhyamaka philosophical traditions, this line of reasoning would come to be championed as one of the so-called “four/five great arguments for emptiness” (gtan tshigs chen po bzhi/lnga). The Introduction of Reality also appears to be the earliest example of the influential synthesis of Nāgārjuna’s Madhyamaka metaphysics with Dignāga (c. fifth–sixth century) and Dharmakīrti’s (c. sixth–seventh century) tradition of logic and epistemology.

Few of Śrīgupta’s biographical details survive, and his dates are uncertain, but a considerable number of Tibetan authors agree that Śrīgupta lived in Bengal and was the student of Bhāviveka (c. sixth century) and the teacher of Jñānagarbha (c. eighth century), which would situate him roughly in the seventh century.^[2] His Introduction to Reality reflects the influence of Bhāviveka’s interpretation of Madhyamaka, making him part of a tradition that would later come to be known as *Svātantrika-Madhyamaka.^[3] It is Bhāviveka’s interpretive tradition of Madhyamaka metaphysics that Śrīgupta integrates with the Dignāga-Dharmakīrti tradition of logic and epistemology, an approach that was adopted by subsequent prominent Mādhyamikas including Jñānagarbha, Śāntarakṣita, Kamalaśīla (late eighth century), and Haribhadra (late eighth century), and which was later institutionalized in Tibetan Buddhist scholasticism.^[4] This synthesis is exemplified by Śrīgupta’s influential presentation of conventional truth/reality (saṃvṛtisatya),^[5] which, together with the ultimate truth (paramārthasatya), constitute the two truths framework (§2). Śrīgupta’s account combines earlier Madhyamaka characterizations of conventional reality as that which is dependently originated (pratītyasamutpanna) with a repurposing of Dharmakīrti’s causal efficacy (arthakriyāsamartha) criterion for ultimate reality (PVin 2.55ab=PV 3.3ab). Śrīgupta adds a third criterion, which says that whatever is conventionally real is satisfactory only when not subjected to critical analysis (*avicāraikaramaṇīya). This presentation of conventional reality was taken up by later Mādhyamikas including Jñānagarbha, Śāntarakṣita, Kamalaśīla, Haribhadra, Bhāviveka II (eighth century),^[6] and Atiśa (982–1054).

Among these later Mādhyamikas, Śrīgupta’s influence is most evident in the work of Śāntarakṣita, whose Ornament of the Middle Way (Madhyamakālaṃkāra, MA) shares a remarkable number of parallels with the Introduction to Reality, including their nearly identical opening stanzas advancing the central inference of the neither-one-nor-many argument for emptiness.^[7] Both texts are devoted primarily to this argument, and it is Śāntarakṣita who popularizes it. His expanded version of the argument devotes the most real estate to demonstrating that that the mind is neither-one-nor-many, and where Śrīgupta’s section on the mind addresses only competing Buddhist views from the Yogācāra tradition, Śāntarakṣita’s targets an array of Buddhist and non-Buddhist positions on the nature of consciousness. Śāntarakṣita’s Ornament of the Middle Way also echoes Śrīgupta’s threefold criterion for conventional reality, though Śāntarakṣita’s presentation of conventional reality there marks the beginnings of a trend among certain of Śrīgupta’s Madhyamaka successors of synthesizing this definition of conventional reality with conceptual frameworks from Yogācāra idealism (Aitken 2023 and 2025).

Śrīgupta is also noteworthy for his stance on the nature of enlightened cognition, which deviates from standard Buddhist accounts, arguing that invariably veridical enlightened cognition can be conceptual, despite the fact that cognition mediated by concepts is commonly supposed to be erroneous (§3).

• 1. Neither-one-nor-many Argument for Emptiness
  • 1.1 Material objects are neither one nor many
  • 1.2 Mental entities are neither one nor many
    • 1.2.1 Rejecting realist views about mental representations
    • 1.2.2 Rejecting antirealist views about mental representations
    • 1.2.3 Rejecting nondual awareness
  • 1.3 Momentary and enduring things are neither one nor many
  • 1.4 Omnipresent and localized things are neither one nor many
  • 1.5 Impact of Śrīgupta’s Neither-one-nor-many Argument
• 2. Conventional Reality
  • 2.1 Causal efficacy criterion for conventional reality
  • 2.2 “Satisfies when not analyzed” criterion for conventional reality
• 3. Nature of Enlightened Cognition
• Bibliography
  • A. Primary Literature with Abbreviations
  • B. Secondary Literature
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Neither-one-nor-many Argument for Emptiness

The Madhyamaka central commitment to universal emptiness denies that anything possesses an intrinsic nature. According to Nāgārjuna’s Madhyamaka, whatever has an intrinsic nature both (i) exists and (ii) is the kind of thing that it is independently of anything else. Possessing an intrinsic nature, then, involves a sort of essential independence, that is, a kind of ontological self-sufficiency that belongs to something by its very nature—a status commonly attributed to the ontological category of substance. If everything is empty and nothing lays claim to an intrinsic nature, then whatever there is necessarily depends on other things both (i) for its existence and (ii) for being the kind of thing that it is. And Nāgārjuna takes it that these two sorts of dependence are mutually implicative: something can’t very well claim full responsibility for its existence as an F if it depends on other things for being an F; nor can something claim full responsibility for being the kind of thing that it is if it doesn’t claim full responsibility for its very existence.

On this view, there is a tight connection between possessing an intrinsic nature and fundamentality, such that the universal negation of an intrinsic nature amounts to the universal negation of metaphysical foundations, which is to say, the endorsement of anti-foundationalism. There are commonly two necessary and only jointly sufficient criteria that the metaphysical foundationalist demands of foundations: that they be (i) ontologically independent and (ii) constitute a complete basis on which all other things ontologically depend (see the entries on fundamentality, ontological dependence, and metaphysical grounding). But if there is nothing that has an intrinsic nature—and thus nothing that is ontologically independent—then a foundationalist dependence structure is ruled out. With no metaphysical foundations, there is no bedrock of reality, no terminus for any dependence chain. Universal emptiness, therefore, entails that the world is shot through with dependence relations.

Importantly, Nāgārjuna’s Madhyamaka recognizes mereological dependence as a species of ontological dependence, meaning that any composite which mereologically depends on its proper parts to be a composite also ontologically depends on those proper parts (where a proper part of x is a part of x that is non-identical to x, and an improper part of x is x itself) (see the entry on mereology). For instance, not only is it the case that a composite like a book mereologically depends on its parts (some sheets of paper, etc.) for having the nature of a composite, but it also depends on those parts for its very existence: without the sheets of paper, there is no book. Thus, whatever possesses proper parts is not a candidate for being ontologically independent, being fundamental, or possessing an intrinsic nature. Whatever has an intrinsic nature, then, necessarily lacks proper parts, i.e., is mereologically simple.

Śrīgupta’s neither-one-nor-many argument for emptiness turns on the entailment relation between having an intrinsic nature and being mereologically simple. This argument, in effect, poses a destructive dilemma, which says: If anything has an intrinsic nature, then it is either one or many. As will be discussed below, “one” and “many” in this argument pick out a dichotomy from the metaphysical foundationalist’s framework, which might be glossed as a true unity and a true multiplicity, where a true unity is a mereological simple and a true multiplicity is a plurality of simples. In other words, a true unity is something fundamental and a true multiplicity is something that is constituted by and founded in true unities. Śrīgupta effectively argues that nothing can satisfy either disjunct of the consequent in this dilemma, and thus, by modus tollens, that nothing can satisfy the antecedent: nothing is truly one or truly many, and therefore nothing has an intrinsic nature. And since a true multiplicity both mereologically and ontologically depends on true unities, (i.e., since a plurality presupposes singular things as its building blocks), if true unities are shown not to exist, then a true multiplicity is ipso facto precluded. The argument, therefore, reduces to a rejection of true unities.

Śrīgupta’s formulation of the neither-one-nor-many argument thus builds on a long and complex history in Indian philosophical thought and is anticipated in the work of Nāgārjuna, who, for example, states in his Precious Garland (Ratnāvalī, RĀ):

Something is not a unity if it has multiple [spatial or temporal] loci.
There is nothing that lacks [multiple spatial or temporal] loci.
Without any unity, there is no multiplicity.^[8] [RĀ 1.71abc]

Three premises might be extracted from Nāgārjuna’s RĀ 1.71 that form the backbone of Śrīgupta’s argument and clarify what he takes to be the nature of and relation between unity and multiplicity:

P1

To be a true unity is to lack proper parts.

P2

There is nothing that lacks proper parts.

P3

There is a true multiplicity only if there are some true unities.

In these arguments, one (eka) and many (aneka) are understood as a unity and a multiplicity in a strong sense, denoted in the premises above by “true unity” and “true multiplicity”. As Nāgārjuna implies in RĀ 1.71, a true unity is anything that does not have multiple distinct spatial or temporal loci (pradeśa), which amount to proper parts. Nāgārjuna is thus equating being a true unity with being mereologically simple. And a true multiplicity is just a plurality of true unities. True unities are thus metaphysically prior to a true multiplicity such that the existence of a true multiplicity presupposes the existence of some true unities, in the same way that the existence of a forest presupposes the existence of some trees.^[9] So, from the first two premises—P1: to be a true unity is to lack proper parts and P2: there is nothing that lacks proper parts—Nāgārjuna infers that there are no true unities. And from this conclusion taken together with the third premise—P3: there is a true multiplicity only if there are some true unities—he concludes that there is no true multiplicity either. Nāgārjuna’s argument might thus be reconstructed as follows:

P1

To be a true unity is to lack proper parts.

P2

There is nothing that lacks proper parts.

∴C1

Therefore, there are no true unities.

P3

There is a true multiplicity only if there are some true unities.

∴C2

Therefore, there are no true multiplicities.

Nāgārjuna applies this argument to entities from both a spatial and temporal perspective, rejecting spatially partless particles as well as temporally partless moments. These lines of reasoning are based on the thought that spatially partless particles and temporally partless moments would necessarily be unextended, point-like entities, and ordinary spatially and/or temporally extended objects could not be constituted by unextended, point-like building blocks. He reasons that, just as each fundamental material building block of an ordinary object—regardless of how small—necessarily has a right side that occupies a spatially distinct locus from its left side in order to constitute a spatially extended object, so too each fundamental temporal building block—no matter how brief—necessarily has a beginning that occupies a temporally distinct locus from its end in order to collectively yield temporal extension (RĀ 1.69–70).

Śrīgupta develops this line of reasoning by formalizing it in the standard inference structure of the Dignāga-Dharmakīrti tradition of logic and epistemology and defending the argument’s soundness. He advances a sustained argument in support of the second premise above: that there is nothing that lacks proper parts, i.e., there are no true unities of any kind, whether material, mental, or otherwise. Śrīgupta also spells out how Nāgārjuna’s line of reasoning can be used to establish universal emptiness, relying on the inference-warranting relation (vyāpti) that: whatever is neither truly unitary nor truly multiple lacks an intrinsic nature.

The central inference of Śrīgupta’s neither-one-nor-many argument is laid out in the opening stanza of the Introduction to Reality:

In reality, [s] everything that exists externally and internally
[p] does not have intrinsic nature,
[r] due to lacking an intrinsic nature that is either unitary or non-unitary,
[e] like a reflection.^[10] [TA 1]

Here, [s] denotes the subject (pakṣa, dharmin) of the inference, [p] denotes the predicate, or property to be proved (sādhyadharma) of the subject, [r] denotes the reason (hetu), or proving property (sādhanadharma), and [e] denotes the example (dṛṣṭānta) in which the co-presence of the property to be proved and the proving property is instantiated. Formulated in the standard three-part inference, the argument in TA 1 runs as follows:

Although the inferential subject of Śrīgupta’s neither-one-nor-many argument may be translated as “all that exists externally and internally,” the term “exists” (gnas) here is ontologically innocent, merely signifying existence simpliciter, such that the subject might be paraphrased as “whatever there is internally and externally”. After all, the property to be proved of the subject—the absence of an intrinsic nature—is an ontological status. To exist with an intrinsic nature is to exist “ultimately” (paramārthena). So, if “exists” in the statement of the inferential subject were ontologically loaded, then the inference would either be contradictory (if it meant “exists ultimately”) or question-begging (if it meant “exists conventionally”). Instead, as Śrīgupta clarifies, the inferential subject is determined based on “conventional assessment” (tha snyad ’jal ba), i.e., whatever appearing objects are determined to exist by conventionally trustworthy sources of knowledge (TAV ad TA 17).^[11]

This argument turns on three features of the one-or-many disjunctive predicate pair, all of which were alluded to in Nāgārjuna’s Precious Garland. These features clarify the meaning of the major premise (whatever is neither one nor many lacks an intrinsic nature) while also helping to explain Śrīgupta’s strategy for establishing the minor premise (all things are neither one nor many).

First, the terms translated as “one” and “many”—eka and aneka—are perhaps more precisely translated as “unity” and “non-unity” insofar as they are taken to be mutually exclusive and exhaustive, conforming to the logical, conceptual, and grammatical structure F and not-F.^[12] If something existed with an intrinsic nature, it must be a unity or a non-unity, with no third alternative.

Moreover, use of the qualifier “in reality” (*tattvatas, yang dag tu) in the central inference signals that this line of reasoning is inquiring into the final nature of things, assessing whether anything lays claim to the status of being a true unity or a true multiplicity. As discussed above, the defining criterion for being a true unity is to lack proper parts, i.e., to be a mereological simple. And, as Nāgārjuna made clear in his Precious Garland, anything that can be physically or even conceptually divided is regarded as partite. In this intellectual tradition, mereology is topic-neutral,^[13] meaning that it applies to all sorts of things. The parthood relation is not restricted to material things. Anything that can be conceptually or analytically divided into more basic units possesses proper parts. For instance, just as a material object might be conceptually divided into subregions, like a right side, a left side, a top, and a bottom, so too might a mental representation of that object. And just as a moment of consciousness might be conceptually divided into its beginning, middle, and end, similarly, an abstract syllogism might be divided into its premises and conclusion.^[14] So: x is conceptually divisible in the mereological sense just in case there are conceptually isolatable proper parts (ys) that compose x, such that x is the sum of ys. While a true unity is anything that lacks proper parts, a true multiplicity is anything that has proper parts, the most basic of which are themselves true unities.

Finally, unity and multiplicity stand in an asymmetrical metaphysical priority relation since the existence of a multiplicity presupposes the existence of some unities. As it turns out, then, a multiplicity isn’t a proper candidate for being ontologically independent, and thus for possessing an intrinsic nature: one can’t say of a multiplicity that it both exists and is the kind of thing that it is independently of the unities that constitute it. Since the existence of a true multiplicity is impossible in the absence of any true unities, the argument reduces to a rejection of true unity.

The structure of Śrīgupta’s argument in support of the minor premise, all things are neither one nor many, is opponent-relative, meaning that it is driven by targeting the entities that his opponents take to be ultimately real, with his principal targets being Yogācāra idealist theories of the mind and the non-Buddhist Vaiśeṣika ontology. The argument begins by rejecting material simples, thereby precluding composites of fundamental particles as well as any entities purportedly founded in fundamental particles or composites of them (TA 2–3) (see §1.1). He next turns to mental entities (TA 4–7ab), rejecting mental simples and any account of truly unified consciousness, which in turn precludes any account of a well-founded composite mental entity (see §1.2). After that, he takes aim at the dichotomy of momentary and enduring things (TA 7cd–9ab, TAV AŚ 5–7)^[15] (see §1.3), and he concludes his neither-one-nor-many argument by critically analyzing omnipresent and localized entities (TA 9cd–10; see §1.4).

1.1 Material objects are neither one nor many

Śrīgupta’s argument against material simples is a concise line of reasoning that gestures to a long history of anti-atomist arguments, bearing notable resemblances to those found in Āryadeva’s Four Hundred Stanzas (Catuḥśataka, CŚ 9.15–17) and Vasubandhu’s (fourth–fifth century) Autocommentary on the Treasury of Abhidharma (Abhidharmakośabhāṣya, AKBh ad AK 1.43d) as well as his Twenty Verses (Viṃśikā, Vś 11–15) (see the entries on ancient atomism and naturalism in Classical Indian Philosophy. All the external world realists in Śrīgupta’s intellectual context were atomists of one kind or another, who supposed that the material world is founded in and constituted by simple fundamental particles. There were broadly three live views on how fundamental particles constitute a composite:

1. Conjoined View: Each fundamental particle is in contact with adjacent fundamental particles (e.g., Nyāya and Vaiśeṣika).
2. Intervening Space View: Fundamental particles are not in contact with adjacent particles, but have intervening space between them (e.g., the Kāśmīri Sarvāstivāda-Vaibhāṣika, Saṅghabhadra, c. fourth–fifth century).
3. Spatially Continuous View: Fundamental particles are spatially continuous, without being in contact with one another and without intervening space (e.g., Vasumitra, c. second century CE, and Vasubandhu in the AKBh).

The common case against the Conjoined View runs as follows: each fundamental particle in a composite is in contact with neighboring particles either wholly or partially. If, in the first case, the entirety of a particle were in contact with each adjacent particle, then all the particles would merge with one another and the composite would collapse into the size of a single particle.^[16] In other words, no quantity of point-like, unextended particles could ever conjoin to yield an extended composite. On the other hand, if a particle were only partially in contact with adjacent particles—e.g., if particle x were in contact with particle y on its left side at a locus \(l_1\) and in contact with particle z on its right side at \(l_2\)—then it follows that particle x would have spatially distinct parts, and would fail the simplicity criterion for being a fundamental particle.

Śrīgupta’s argument echoes this line of reasoning, but it might be read as targeting all three views surveyed above since it does not explicitly center on the point of contact between particles, but rather on the point at which a given particle is facing (*adhimukha, mngon par phyogs pa) neighboring particles:

A particle could not be unitary because a composite of [true unities] is impossible. [TA 2a]

A fundamental particle could not be a [true] unity because an [extended] composite [of such particles] is impossible, since if it had a [truly] unitary nature [and thus lacked spatially distinct parts], then it would [absurdly] face [all adjacent particles] at the same location. Nor is it the case that [a fundamental particle] could possess some other nature by means of which it could face [adjacent particles at distinct locations], since in that case it would absurdly follow that [each fundamental particle] would be a multiplicity.^[17]

To paraphrase the argument as a destructive dilemma:

Like other anti-atomist arguments in this tradition, Śrīgupta’s line of reasoning turns on the question of whether or not fundamental particles are differentiable into spatially distinct loci, or sides (digbhāgabheda). In other words, fundamental particles are either spatially extended or unextended.^[18] If fundamental particle x did not have spatially distinct sides—and were thus spatially unextended—then the point at which x faces particle y on its left side would absurdly be identical to the point at which it faces particle z on its right side, and likewise those above and below it. On the other hand, if fundamental particles did have spatially distinct sides—and were thus spatially extended—then, being at least analytically or conceptually divisible into proper parts (e.g., a right side and a left side, a top and a bottom, and a front and a back), they could not meet the simplicity criterion for being a fundamental particle, and each of the purportedly truly unitary, basic building blocks of the material world would absurdly be a multiplicity. Śrīgupta concludes that if there are no material true unities, then neither can there be a material true multiplicity, which, by definition, is a plurality of true unities. Being neither truly one nor truly many, material objects thus lack an intrinsic nature.

Śrīgupta takes this argument to rule out both simple and composite material substances, including the Vaiśeṣika category of material wholes (avayavin), which exist over and above their basic parts—fundamental particles—on which they both ontologically and causally depend.^[19] Moreover, he argues, all other sorts of entities that are thought to be founded in material substances are also precluded, such as the Vaiśeṣika ontological categories of properties (guṇa), motion/action (karma), universals (sāmānya), individuating factors (viśeṣa), and the inherence relation (samavāya).

1.2 Mental entities are neither one nor many

Having rejected Buddhist and non-Buddhist external world realist views, Śrīgupta next devotes the lengthiest section of his neither-one-nor-many argument to ruling out mental simples, critically analyzing a range of Yogācāra idealist views concerning the nature of and relation between consciousness and its object. These views can be divided into two broad camps: realism about mental representations (*Satyākāravāda, rnam pa bden par smra ba) and antirealism about mental representations (*Alīkākāravāda, rnam pa brdzun par smra ba). The terms satyākāra (real/true representation) and alīkākāra (unreal/false representation)^[20] refer to the ontological status of representations relative to that of consciousness. Loosely speaking, realists maintain that representations are real in the same way that consciousness is, while antirealists hold that representations are unreal figments that are by-products of an erroneous cognitive process (abhūtaparikalpa) (see e.g., Seitetsu Moriyama 1984: 10–11; Shinya Moriyama 2014: 340). These two accounts are historically associated with another pair of views on the status of representations: realism is frequently connected with the view that consciousness necessarily has a representation (sākāra), while antirealism is commonly connected with the view that consciousness does not necessarily have a representation (nirākāra).^[21] For instance, realists about representations, such as Jñānaśrīmitra (c. 980–1050) and Ratnakīrti (c. 990–1050), maintain that the mental states of both ordinary and enlightened epistemic agents necessarily possess (some kind of) representation. By contrast, anti-realists about representations, such as Ratnākaraśānti (c. 970—1030), claim that, although ordinary mental states have representations as their intentional objects, the necessarily veridical cognition of an enlightened individual cannot (see, e.g., Tomlinson 2019).

Śrīgupta’s subargument targeting realists about representations is influenced by Dharmakīrti’s iteration of the argument in his Explanation of the Sources of Knowledge (Pramāṇavārttika, PV 3.194–224). In fact, although Dharmakīrti’s considered view is commonly identified as a form of Yogācāra idealism, some later interpreters, including Jitāri (c. 940–1000), have read Dharmakīrti as a Mādhyamika based on this argument; see Shirasaki (1986) and Steinkellner (1990). However, the sort of emptiness that Dharmakīrti aims to establish with this line of reasoning is not the lack of an intrinsic nature, but the emptiness of duality (dvayaśūnyatā), that is, the absence of a real subject-object distinction in cognition (PV 3.212–13).^[22] Śrīgupta takes the neither-one-nor-many analysis further than Dharmakīrti, ultimately rejecting the true unity of even nondual awareness (advayajñāna), which is perhaps his most noteworthy contribution to the development of the neither-one-nor-many argument as applied to the mind.^[23]

Śrīgupta’s case against mental simples turns on an analysis of the relation between the mind and mental content, or consciousness/awareness (jñāna) and a mental representation (ākāra).^[24] The argument is structured by two implicit dilemmas:

1. Real-or-Unreal Dilemma: a mental representation is either real (satya) in the same way that consciousness is supposed to be or it is an unreal (alīka) figment.
2. Distinct-or-Identical Dilemma: consciousness and a mental representation taken together are either distinct (bheda) things or one identical (abheda) thing.

The Distinct-or-Identical Dilemma is often regarded as a variation of the One-nor-Many Dilemma insofar as it asks: are x and y one thing or more than one thing? However, as Tom Tillemans (1983: 305) has pointed out, the Distinct-or-Identical Dilemma is run on a dyadic subject, (either \(Fxy\) or \(-Fxy\), where F signifies the property of being distinct), while the One-nor-Many Dilemma is run on a monadic subject (either \(Fx\) or \(-Fx\), where F signifies the property of being truly unitary).

The Real-or-Unreal Dilemma and the Distinct-or-Identical Dilemma jointly yield the following range of views:

Realist Views about Representations:

1. Consciousness is non-distinct from real representations.
2. Consciousness is distinct from real representations.

Antirealist Views about Representations:

3. Consciousness is non-distinct from unreal representations.
4. Consciousness is distinct from unreal representations.

Śrīgupta argues that none of these four views offer a viable account on which consciousness could either be a true unity or a true multiplicity. He runs a multitiered argument from dilemma relying heavily on a version of the Law of Non-Contradiction, according to which contradictory properties cannot be predicated of the same subject (viruddhadharmādhyāsa).

1.2.1 Rejecting realist views about mental representations

In tackling the first view—that (i) consciousness is non-distinct from real representations—Śrīgupta runs a version of the One-nor-Many Dilemma on consciousness, which says: the mereological structure of consciousness is either truly unitary or truly manifold. In other words, consciousness that is non-distinct from a real representation is either simple or a composite of simples. The first alternative, the Simple Consciousness Lemma, is exemplified by the so-called “variegated nonduality” view (citrādvaita, sna tshogs gnyis med pa), while the second alternative, the Complex Consciousness Lemma, is commonly referred to as the “numerical parity of consciousness and representations” view (rnam shes grangs mnyam pa or gzung ’dzin grangs mnyam pa).^[25]

Śrīgupta’s argument against the Simple Consciousness Lemma turns on the datum that mental content, like the representation you might have of this page, is phenomenally variegated (citra, sna tshogs). And whatever is phenomenally variegated, being always conceptually divisible into proper parts (like the various subregions of your representation of this page—the top, the bottom, etc.), is not truly unitary. But if a non-unitary representation is non-distinct from consciousness, then given the Law of Non-Contradiction, consciousness too must be non-unitary:

Since representations that are non-distinct [from the mind]
are multifaceted (citra), the mind cannot be unitary. [TA 4ab]

Consciousness could not be unitary because [on your view] it is non-distinct from its non-unitary representations. Otherwise, on account of having contradictory properties, [consciousness and representations] would [absurdly] arise in two distinct loci.^[26]

Yet Śrīgupta argues that the Complex Consciousness Lemma is not viable either. He takes it that the same argument leveled against material atomism applies to this picture on which consciousness is a composite of simple mental elements:

Were one to accept a simultaneous plurality of consciousnesses, then represented aspects—just like fundamental particles—could not constitute a composite, as has been repeatedly established.^[27] [TAV ad TA 4cd]

While Śrīgupta doesn’t spell out the details of this argument against mental atomism, it might go something like this:

So, taking as the test case a visual representation, such as the representation of this page: if your representation of this page were constituted by simple mental parts—let’s call them representational parts—then those representational parts are either phenomenally extended or unextended. One might plausibly think that representational parts must be phenomenally extended if they are to be perceptible at all. But whatever is extended—whether that be phenomenally or physically—is at least conceptually divisible into proper parts and therefore not simple after all. Even a minimally visible black speck has a right side that is distinct from its left side. On the other hand, if representational parts were indeed simple and thus phenomenally unextended, then they could not have phenomenally distinct sides at which to conjoin with neighboring representational parts, and phenomenal extension could never get up and going. Yet clearly our visual representations are phenomenally extended. On this first view, then, consciousness and the representations from which they are non-distinct are neither truly one nor truly many.

The second alternative in the Distinct-or-Identical Dilemma available to realists about representations—that (ii) consciousness is distinct from real representations—is a non-starter, finding no known defenders in Śrīgupta’s intellectual milieu. After all, as noted above, realism about representations is generally associated with the view that a representation is a necessary feature of consciousness, with which it is ultimately identical, or nondual.

1.2.2 Rejecting antirealist views about mental representations

Śrīgupta also argues that no coherent antirealist account of representations is on offer, whether consciousness is taken to be distinct or non-distinct from unreal representations. First, in rejecting the Non-Distinct Lemma, he argues that if (iii) consciousness is non-distinct from unreal representations, then given the Law of Non-Contradiction, the mind too would be unreal, which is an unacceptable consequence for his idealist opponents:

If representations were simply unreal,
then absurd consequences would follow.^[28] [TA 5ab1]

When there is an experience, then not only would these [representations] be simply unreal, but it follows that cognition too would have [this same unreal] nature.

Turning to the Distinct Lemma on which (iv) consciousness is distinct from unreal representations, Śrīgupta runs yet another implicit dilemma, arguing that consciousness and an unreal representation as two distinct entities are either related or unrelated. First, in addressing the Unrelated Lemma, he argues that if consciousness stood in no relation to a given representation, then there is no explanation for why the objects of ordinary experience appear to us at all, much less why they do so with spatiotemporal determinacy and consistency:

Due to being unrelated [to consciousness],
how could [representations] determinately appear?^[29] [TA 5b2c]

Thus, consciousness and the unreal representation that is its intentional object must surely stand in some sort of relation with one another, perhaps a causal relation, in order to account for appearing objects in our experience. But, as Śrīgupta suggests, a real thing can only stand in a bona fide relation with another real thing. An actual forest fire clearly cannot stand in a bona fide causal relation with a fire-breathing chimera. Likewise, an unreal representation cannot cause a real cognition of it. Thus, he argues, the Related Lemma is no more viable than the Unrelated Lemma for the antirealist:

Were one to accept [representations] as related [to consciousness] in virtue of their appearing determinately, then [representations] would in fact be real, since otherwise it would be impossible [for them] to stand in either an identity relation (tādātmya) or a causal relation (tadutpatti) [with consciousness].^[30] [TAV ad TA 5d]

1.2.3 Rejecting nondual awareness

Having rejected both realists and antirealists about representations, Śrīgupta supposes that a Yogācārin opponent may object that this whole exercise of analyzing the relation between consciousness and its content as subjective and objective aspects (grāhakākāra and grāhyākāra) of a mental state is entirely misguided, since the apparent subject-object dualism of conscious experience is merely an error; in actual fact, the mind is just one simple entity: nondual awareness.

Śrīgupta argues that the very concept of nondual awareness is internally contradictory. This line of reasoning presupposes that awareness, or consciousness, is intentional by its very nature. To be aware is necessarily, and by definition, to be aware of something. Moreover, he takes nonduality to necessitate simplicity. In brief, he argues that if nondual awareness were truly nondual, then it could not meet the definition of awareness, since its simplicity would preclude an intentional structure. On the other hand, if nondual awareness were truly aware, then, having an intentional structure, it could not meet the simplicity criterion for nonduality.

He begins this argument by asking rhetorically,

But if [awareness] were free from duality,
then how could it be aware?^[31] [TA 6ab1]

That is, if awareness were truly nondual, or simple, and thus not conceptually divisible into subjective and objective parts, or aspects, then how could it meet the definition of awareness as necessarily intentional? He supposes that an opponent may respond that, despite lacking a distinct object, nondual awareness nonetheless meets the definition of awareness insofar as it is reflexively aware; it takes itself as its intentional object. Yet Śrīgupta insists that reflexive awareness (svasaṃvedana, svasaṃvitti), too, instantiates a complex structure, smuggling in objective and subjective features, and thus fails to meet the simplicity criterion for nonduality. He sums up his argument as follows:

Due to lacking a cognitive object, [nondual awareness] could not cognize anything else.
Due to being nondual, [awareness] could not cognize itself.
Upon analysis, it cannot be correct [that awareness is nondual].
Tell me, what other option is there?^[32] [TAV AŚ 3]

Having ruled out nondual awareness as the last best candidate for a mental simple, given the metaphysical priority of true unities to a true multiplicity, Śrīgupta concludes that the mind, like matter, is neither one nor many, and thus lacks an intrinsic nature.

1.3 Momentary and enduring things are neither one nor many

Śrīgupta next deploys a temporal analysis, taking up the dichotomous subject of momentary and non-momentary things. He first attacks the thesis of universal momentariness (kṣaṇikatva) as maintained by competing Buddhist schools of thought, such as the Sautrāntika and Yogācāra, according to whom the only ultimately real things are momentary physical and/or mental simple particulars, each of which exerts its specific sort of causal efficacy (arthakriyāsamartha) whereupon it immediately perishes, persisting for no longer than a moment. Yet, with mental and material simples rejected, Śrīgupta points out that momentariness has no foundation (TA 7cd–8).

On the other hand, he argues, neither can there exist a temporally extended entity that has a truly unitary intrinsic nature (TA 9ab, TAV AŚ 5–7). His argument here turns on the suppressed premise that if something’s intrinsic nature were truly unitary, or simple, then it could never change to exhibit different essential properties without becoming a distinct entity. The essential property on which his analysis centers is causal efficacy, which is commonly taken to be the mark of existence and is among the defining characteristics of the Vaiśeṣika eternal substances (dravya), which are Śrīgupta’s explicit subject in this section.^[33] According to the Vaiśeṣikasūtra, there are nine eternal substances: the four elemental atomic substances (bhūta) of earth, water, fire, and air, as well as ether (ākāśa), space (diś), time (kāla), soul (ātman), and the mind, or mental organ (manas). Having already rejected truly unitary material atoms, and thus the four elemental substances, as well as a truly unitary mind, here Śrīgupta takes aim at the remaining four eternal substances: ether, time, space, and the self (TAV ad TA 9ab).

In critically analyzing these permanent substances, Śrīgupta recruits arguments advanced by the Buddhist proponents of momentariness whose thesis he had just undermined, specifically relying on Dharmakīrti’s influential argument for momentariness from existence (sattvānumāna), according to which a non-momentary thing could not satisfy the defining criterion for existence—causal efficacy—since it could not produce an effect either gradually or instantaneously.^[34] Of course, Dharmakīrti takes this argument to establish universal momentariness. But Śrīgupta instead uses this argument in support of his larger thesis that neither momentary things nor temporally extended things could possess a truly unitary intrinsic nature.

1.4 Omnipresent and localized things are neither one nor many

Of the nine Vaiśeṣika eternal substances, ether, space, time, and souls are held to be omnipresent, or all-pervasive (vyāpin), while the four elements and the mental organ are localized, or non-pervasive (avyāpin), each being atomic in dimension. But as with atomic substances, Vaiśeṣika omnipresent substances are unitary. Having already rejected the simplicity of both atoms and the mind as well as the diachronic unity of all eternal substances, Śrīgupta next targets the synchronic unity of any omnipresent entity.

As noted above, Śrīgupta takes his case against fundamental particles to have ruled out members of the Vaiśeṣika ontological categories that are purportedly founded in atoms and composites of atoms. Yet according to the Vaiśeṣika, while plenty of qualities, actions, universals, individuating factors, and inherence relations are ultimately founded in the four elemental atomic substances (as well as the atomic mental organ), these sorts of entities may also be founded in the other kinds of substances (VS 1.1.4). Motion may inhere in atoms, composites of atoms, as well as the mental organ, but properties, universals, and individuating factors can inhere in any kind of substance. Since, according to Vaiśeṣika, only the eternal substances are ontologically independent, with all other ontological categories being ontologically dependent on eternal substances, a successful refutation of all nine eternal substances would undermine the foundation of the entire Vaiśeṣika ontology.

Śrīgupta reasons that whatever is all-pervasive, or omnipresent, is necessarily conceptually divisible into proper parts corresponding to the spatially or temporally distinct loci with which it is connected:

Due to being connected with distinct loci,
how could there be a unitary omnipresent entity? [TA 9cd]

Nor is it admissible, by definition, that the Vaiśeṣika omnipresent substances could be manifold. And since localized material and mental entities have already been rejected together with whatever is purportedly founded in them, Śrīgupta concludes that nothing with an intrinsic nature could be either omnipresent or localized since their unity and multiplicity have both been rejected.

Having examined his universal subject using the material-mental, the momentary-non-momentary, and the omnipresent-localized dichotomies, Śrīgupta concludes that nothing is truly unitary or truly manifold, and thus all things lack an intrinsic nature.

1.5 Impact of Śrīgupta’s Neither-one-nor-many Argument

Among the so-called four/five great arguments for emptiness, the neither-one-nor-many argument had arguably the most significant impact in late Buddhist India within both the Madhyamaka and Yogācāra traditions. The argument was taken up and elaborated at length by Mādhyamikas including Śāntarakṣita in his Ornament of the Middle Way and autocommentary, Kamalaśīla in his sub-commentary on the Ornament of the Middle Way and his Illumination of the Middle Way (see Keira 2004), Haribhadra in his Illumination of the Ornament for Clear Realization (Abhisamayālaṃkārālokā), Jitāri in his Stanzas Clarifying the Sugata’s (Sugatamatavibhaṅgakārikā) and autocommentary, and many others. The neither-one-nor-many argument also came to occupy a central place in debates among Yogācāra scholars at Vikramaśīla such as Ratnākaraśānti (see Shinya Moriyama 2014; Tomlinson 2019 and 2023), Jñānaśrīmitra, and Ratnakīrti, concerning the status of the mind and mental content. And throughout the subsequent centuries in Tibet, some of the most influential philosophers cutting across traditions authored commentarial works on Śāntarakṣita’s version of this argument, including Phya pa Chos kyi seng ge (1109–1169) (see Hugon 2015), Tsong kha pa Blo bzang grags pa (1357–1419) (see Blumenthal (2004),^[35] and ’Jam mgon ’Ju Mi pham mgya mtsho (1846–1912) (see, e.g., Doctor 2004).

2. Conventional Reality

Taking the definitions of true unity and true multiplicity to be, respectively, a mereological simple and a plurality of simples, Śrīgupta’s neither-one-nor-many argument effectively stipulates a foundationalist structure of reality that bottoms out in simple, ontologically independent fundamentalia. By demonstrating that there are no simples, he thus aims to rule out such a foundationalist structure. But if there is nothing ontologically independent at bedrock, then how do things exist and what is the structure of reality? Immediately upon concluding his neither-one-nor-many argument in the Introduction to Reality, Śrīgupta clarifies that his deconstructive project leaves intact the world of appearances, which he characterizes as conventionally real, dependently originated, and devoid of an intrinsic nature.

Still, one might worry that, having rejected the possibility of a true unity—and thus also a true multiplicity—Śrīgupta is committed to a thoroughgoing nihilism. After all, he takes unity and multiplicity/non-unity to be mutually exclusive and exhaustive. So, if nothing could instantiate these categories, then all candidate entities appear to have been ruled out. On the other hand, if he does accept the existence of anything after having argued that nothing could be one (F) or many (not-F), then he looks to be guilty of violating the Law of Excluded Middle. For surely, one might think, the following holds:

Conventional One-or-Many Dilemma: If anything is conventionally real, then it is either truly one or truly many.

Śrīgupta would deny that he violates the Law of Excluded Middle in upholding conventionally real things that are neither one nor many. That’s because, so long as unity and multiplicity are understood according to the foundationalist definitions outlined above, the Conventional One-or-Many Dilemma involves a kind of category error, akin to saying, “if x is a unit of time, then it is either blue or non-blue”. In other words, he would understand this dilemma to be equivalent to the ill-formed proposition: “if x does not belong to a foundationalist structure of reality, then it is either a foundation or it terminates in some foundation(s)”. So, rather than denying that unity and multiplicity (as defined by the foundationalist) are jointly exhaustive, he instead takes issue with the framework to which these definitions belong. No conventionally real, dependently originated thing is a true unity, but it may very well be a conventional unity, much like an army, a heap of sand, or a university.

But what precisely does it mean to be a conventional unity or to be conventionally real? In his Introduction to Reality, Śrīgupta formulates an influential threefold criterion for conventional reality:

1. Satisfying only when not analyzed,
2. [things] arise from that which is similar to themselves.
3. Those things enact their respective forms of causal efficacy.^[36] [TA 11]

In other words, whatever exists conventionally

1. is satisfactory when not critically analyzed (*avicāraikaramaṇīya),^[37]
2. arises from conditions similar to itself, i.e., is dependently originated (pratītyasamutpanna),^[38] and
3. has the capacity for causal, or pragmatic, efficacy (*arthakriyāsamartha/arthakriyāśakti).^[39]

Thus, whatever is conventionally real (i) does not withstand the kind of analysis into its ultimate nature that seeks to uncover some ontologically independent entity, and yet it (ii) comes into being in dependence on other conventionally real things, and (iii) fulfills our practical expectations in accordance with how it appears.

The term satya has a semantic range inclusive of both “truth” and “reality” and, accordingly, the concept connoted by saṃvṛtisatya in this context is inclusive of both these meanings. While these three criteria most obviously qualify things, they also qualify truths concerning those sorts of things. So, conventional truths concern conventionally real things and are claims that satisfy only when not critically analyzed, refer to things that are dependently originated, and may be relied upon to lead to pragmatic success in our everyday actions.

By the eighth century, this threefold criterion for conventional reality had become a standard Madhyamaka definition, repeated in some form by Jñānagarbha (SDV 8, 12, 21), Śāntarakṣita (MA 6), Kamalaśīla (MAP ad MA 64), Haribhadra (AAA [Wogihara 1932–35: 594.18–25]), Bhāviveka II (MAS 9–11; MRP 1.4), Atiśa (SDA 4), and others. Śrīgupta’s Introduction to Reality appears to be the earliest extant text presenting this threefold definition of conventional reality, with the first criterion—satisfies when not analyzed—possibly adapted from Candrakīrti (seventh century) (MAv 6.35), the second— being dependently originated—inherited from Nāgārjuna,^[40] and the third—causal efficacy—a repurposing of Dharmakīrti’s criterion for ultimately real particulars (svalakṣaṇa) (PV 3.3ab) (Eckel 1986: 137–38 n. 104; 2008, 25). Śāntarakṣita’s presentation of conventional reality in his Ornament of the Middle Way echoes Śrīgupta’s insofar as he takes up this threefold definition, yet it also deviates from Śrīgupta’s in provisionally endorsing Yogācāra idealism on the conventional level. This move marks the beginnings of a trend among certain of Śrīgupta’s Madhyamaka successors of synthesizing this threefold definition of conventional reality with certain conceptual frameworks from Yogācāra idealism (Aitken 2023). For instance, both Kamalaśīla and Haribhadra incorporate the Yogācāra three-natures (trisvabhāva) framework into their presentations of conventional reality (Aitken 2025: 59–67).

2.1 Causal efficacy criterion for conventional reality

As discussed above, Śrīgupta’s Introduction to Reality is noteworthy for being one of the earliest works—if not the earliest work—to synthesize Dharmakīrti’s tradition of logic and epistemology with Madhyamaka metaphysics. While Nāgārjuna is the only figure Śrīgupta mentions by name in this text, the only citations that appear come from Dharmakīrti.^[41] Śrīgupta’s repurposing of Dharmakīrti’s causal efficacy criterion for ultimately real particulars as the criterion for conventionally real things marks both an example of Dharmakīrti’s influence on Śrīgupta’s Madhyamaka as well as one respect in which Śrīgupta apparently subverts Dharmakīrti’s ontology. Dharmakīrti’s well-known use of the causal efficacy criterion to qualify ultimate reals reads:

Whatever has the capacity for causal efficacy is ultimately real.
[Whatever is] otherwise is conventionally real. These two are [respectively] called the “particular” and the “universal”.^[42] [PV 3.3]

Here, Dharmakīrti characterizes the objects of the two sources of knowledge (pramāṇa) that he accepts: perception (pratyakṣa) and inference (anumāna). Ultimately real particulars, which are distinguished by their capacity for causal efficacy, ^[43] are known by perception, which is necessarily nonconceptual. By contrast, conventionally real universals (sāmānya) are known by means of inference, which is invariably conceptual.^[44] But since nothing is ultimately real according to Madhyamaka, Śrīgupta would take Dharmakīrti’s first ontological category (ultimately real particulars possessing causal efficacy) to be an empty one. Instead, as Śrīgupta and many subsequent Mādhyamikas claim, the capacity for causal efficacy is the mark of whatever is merely conventionally real, and it is only conventionally real things that are the objects of both perceptual and inferential cognitions.

Although Nāgārjuna does not employ the same expression for causal efficacy used by Śrīgupta as adopted from Dharmakīrti, the causal efficacy criterion for conventional reality is clearly continuous with Nāgārjuna’s thought. For instance, in MMK 1 and 24, Nāgārjuna argues that participating in causation, and thus being dependently originated in a causal way, is possible only for things that lack an intrinsic nature and are thus not ultimately real. By implication, then, it is only conventionally real things that are causally efficacious.

Beginning with Śrīgupta’s student, Jñānagarbha, in his Differentiating the Two Truths (Satyadvayavibhaṅga, SDV), the causal efficacy criterion came to be standardly cited as the touchstone for distinguishing between conventional objects of veridical cognitions and those of non-veridical cognitions—i.e., correct vs. mistaken conventions (tathyasaṃvṛti vs. mithyāsaṃvṛti), or real vs. unreal conventional things (Eckel 1986: 53–54, 122–23, n. 36; Seitetsu Moriyama 1991). Jñānagarbha states that a conventionally real thing is a “thing simpliciter” (*vastumātra) that is dependently originated, and which is not confused with the superimposition of a mistaken or merely imagined concept (SDV 8). He then goes on to clarify that the way in which one determines whether an appearing object involves a mistaken conceptual superimposition is by verifying whether or not it is causally efficacious:

Despite being similar in appearance, real and unreal conventional [things]
are differentiated based on whether or not they have the capacity for causal efficacy.^[45] [SDV 12]

As Jñānagarbha explains in his commentary on this stanza, although things like actual water and the pseudo-water of a mirage are similar in their appearance, they can be differentiated and identified respectively as real and unreal conventional entities based on whether or not they have the capacity to slake one’s thirst (SDVV ad SDV 12).

Before Jñānagarbha, Candrakīrti, too, differentiates between real and unreal conventional things, yet he bases this distinction not on the capacity for causal efficacy, but instead on general consensus (MAv 6.25).^[46] Jñānagarbha incorporates the common consensus measure into his causal efficacy criterion, claiming that whether or not an entity has causal efficacy in accordance with what one would expect given its appearance is in fact determined by the “world,” i.e., what is commonly accepted (SDVV ad SDV 12).

Although Śrīgupta himself neither draws an explicit distinction between real and unreal conventional things (or correct and mistaken conventions), his threefold criterion in general, and the causal efficacy criterion in particular, came to be commonly cited as qualifying correct conventional truths and real conventional by subsequent Mādhyamikas, including Śāntarakṣita, Kamalaśīla, Haribhadra, Bhāviveka II, Atiśa, and Prajñāmokṣa.^[47]

2.2 “Satisfies when not analyzed” criterion for conventional reality

After having set out his threefold criterion for conventional reality in TA 11, he clarifies in his commentary that although conventionally real things are necessarily causally efficacious, causal efficacy itself does not withstand ultimate analysis, just like the apparent unity and ontological independence of things:

Thus, regarding these things that appear externally and internally, which cannot withstand the pressure of analysis and are produced from causes similar to themselves, if one has not analyzed the causal efficacy on account of which these conventional things arise, one will approach satisfaction here and there. [TAV ad TA 11]

Ultimately, things are devoid of unity,
multiplicity, and so forth.
If one has not engaged in examination,
then [things] appear to have a satisfactory nature. [TAV AŚ 8]

As mentioned above, the neither-one-nor-many argument became part of a canon of Madhyamaka arguments for emptiness, and while this argument critically analyzes the unity and ontological independence of things, the other arguments principally engage in critical analysis of anything that has an intrinsic nature possessing the capacity to participate in causation. In TAV ad TA 11, Śrīgupta gestures to these causal arguments, suggesting that, upon examination, causal efficacy itself is not a process that involves relata, a causal relation, or causal activity that bear these identities intrinsically.

A precursor to this “satisfies when not analyzed” criterion for conventionally real entities involved in causal processes is found in the work of Bhāviveka. For instance, in his Flame of Reasoning (Tarkajvālā, TJ) autocommentary on the Stanzas on the Heart of the Middle Way (Madhyamakahṛdayakārikā, MHK), Bhāviveka states that the causal chain of dependent origination is “generally accepted when not analyzed” (*avicāraprasiddha, ma brtags na grags pa) (TJ ad MHK 2.10d). He clarifies that critical analysis is reserved for inquiring into the ultimate nature of things (MHK 3.22ab).

Śrīgupta characterizes both the standard sources of knowledge that he takes up from the Dignāga-Dharmakīrti epistemological tradition—perception and inference—as satisfying only when not analyzed, since our ordinary way of seeing is deceptive (*visaṃvādi, slu ba):

An object of knowledge (prameya) is established
by a source of knowledge (pramāṇa)
that satisfies when not analyzed, due to seeing deceptively;
that being so, the practices of the world are safeguarded.^[48] [TA 17]

This account of the ordinary sources of knowledge, which take conventional entities and truths as their objects, as “seeing deceptively” (slu ba mthong) accords with the etymology of saṃvṛti (translated as “conventional” here), which literally means “concealing” or “obscuring,” suggesting that conventional truths, and even our conventional ways of knowing, obscure the actual nature of things and are thus misleading. Yet this description of the standard sources of knowledge as deceptive also appears to allude to Dharmakīrti’s (first) definition of a source of knowledge as non-deceiving (avisaṃvādi, bslu ba med pa) in PV 2.1,^[49] serving as another instance in which Śrīgupta seems to subvert a Dharmakīrtian definition (see also §2.1). Śrīgupta goes on to describe the standard sources of knowledge as a kind of “conventional assessment” (tha snyad ’jal ba). He explains that conventional assessment can be used to reject characteristics of things that are fabricated by unreliable textual sources or by erroneous conceptual superimpositions, and in this way, he, like Bhāviveka, suggests that conventional assessment in the form of inferential reasoning can establish claims compatible with the ultimate truth of universal emptiness insofar as they may exclude whatever is contrary to insight into reality. Śrīgupta emphasizes, the fact that this conventional assessment—whether perceptual or inferential—is deceptive in one important respect does not undermine the conventional reality of mere appearances, which are the subject of the neither-one-nor-many inference.^[50] So, while conventional things and sources of knowledge that engage in conventional assessment do not withstand ultimate analysis that seeks to uncover an intrinsic nature, such analysis does not vitiate their status as conventionally real appearances or conventionally trustworthy sources of knowledge, and thus “the practices of the world are safeguarded”.

Subsequently, Jñānagarbha characterizes (i) conventional truths as corresponding with appearance (ji ltar snang ba) and (ii) the ultimate truth as consistent with reasoning (rigs pa ji lta ba bzhin) (SDVV ad SDV 3cd),^[51] which is non-deceiving (*avisaṃvādi, slu ba med pa) (SDV 3–4).^[52] With this, Jñānagarbha, too, appears to allude to—and once again subvert—Dharmakīrti’s definition of a source of knowledge as non-deceiving in PV 2.1 (Eckel 2009: 117), yet he does so in a manner different from Śrīgupta. For Dharmakīrti, non-deceptiveness qualifies both perceptual and inferential types of knowledge-events, while Śrīgupta describes both as deceptive. Yet Jñānagarbha seems to suggest that perceptual cognitions—whose objects are conventional appearances—are deceptive insofar as they can be undermined by analysis, while at least certain instances of inferential reasoning are non-deceptive insofar as they are compatible with the ultimate truth.

When Jñānagarbha articulates his version of the “satisfies when not analyzed” criterion for the conventional, he does so in normative terms to the effect that one ought not analyze conventionally real things or the conventional truths concerning them. In this respect, his presentation again bears at least superficial similarities to that of Candrakīrti, who states in his Introduction to the Middle Way,

If one critically analyzes these things,
one does not find any real nature behind them,
Thus, one should not analyze
the conventional truths of the world.^[53] [MAv 6.35]

Similarly, in his Differentiating the Two Truths, Jñānagarbha states,

Since the nature [of a conventionally real thing] corresponds with how it appears,
one should not analyze it.
If one does analyze it, the object is undermined,
having become something else.^[54] [SDV 21]

Here, Jñānagarbha explains that the conventional nature of a conventionally real object accords with its appearance, meaning, for instance, the device on which you are reading this article appears to be an independent and unitary object, and as such, these properties of independence and unity are part of its conventional nature. Yet the ontological independence and true unity of the device are undermined by critical examination such that it “becomes something else” qua cognitive object when analyzed insofar as it may be continually deconstructed into a plurality of more basic parts upon which it depends for its existence. Likewise, the participation of conventionally real things in causal processes does not stand up to ultimate analysis either. In Differentiating the Two Truths, Jñānagarbha demonstrates this point using the argument rejecting the four possible manners of causation (catuṣkoṭyutpādapratiṣedhahetu) (SDV 14 and SDVV ad 14). This argument aims to demonstrate that whatever participates in causation could not possess an intrinsic nature by showing that if cause and result did possess intrinsic natures, then (i) multiple results could not arise from a single cause, (ii) nor a single result from multiple causes, (iii) nor multiple results from multiple causes, (iv) nor a single result from a single cause.

Unlike Candrakīrti and Jñānagarbha, Śrīgupta does not articulate this “satisfies when not analyzed” criterion in normative terms, and in this way his presentation looks closer to Bhāviveka’s claim that conventional dependent origination and causal processes are generally accepted when not critically analyzed (*avicāraprasiddha). Significantly, however, the Introduction to Reality appears to be one of the earliest works featuring the phrase that conventional truths/conventionally real things “satisfy only when not analyzed” (*avicāraikaramaṇīya, ma brtags gcig pu nyams dga’ ba/ma brtags na nyams dga’ ba), terminology that was standardly adopted by many subsequent Mādhyamikas beginning in the eighth century, including Śāntarakṣita, Kamalaśīla, and Haribhadra, as well as Dharmamitra’s (fl. c. 800) Abhisamayālaṃkāraprasphuṭapadā, Prajñākaramati’s (tenth century) Bodhicaryāvatārapañjikā, Jñānavajra’s Āryalaṅkāvatāranāmamahāyāna-sūtravṛttitathāgatahṛdayālaṃkāra, Jayānanda’s (twelfth century) Madhyamakāvatāraṭīkā, and Abhayākaragupta’s (twelfth century) Munimatālaṃkāra and Marmakaumudī̄. With the addition of this phrase, the criterion might be glossed as meaning that conventionally real objects satisfy our ordinary notions of independence and unity only so long as they are not subjected to critical analysis. Akahane (2003: 127) attributes the earliest use of the phrase “satisfies only when not analyzed” (avicāraikaramaṇīya) to Avalokitavrata’s (c. 700) voluminous commentary on Bhāviveka’s Lamp of Wisdom (Prajñāpradīpaṭīkā, PPṬ), though further research is required to determine the relative chronology of Śrīgupta and Avalokitavrata. Prajñākaragupta also uses the expression repeatedly to characterize the conventional in his Ornament of the Explanation of the Sources of Knowledge, though he argues for a Yogācāra view on which the ultimate—nondual awareness—does withstand critical analysis, as evidenced by its being impervious to the neither-one-nor-many argument (Inami 2011).^[55]

While Mādhyamikas like Śrīgupta claim that one may arrive at (at least a provisional, indirect, and conceptually mediated) understanding of the ultimate truth by way of analysis like the neither-one-nor-many argument, they do not claim that the ultimate itself withstands analysis. Emptiness, too, is empty of an intrinsic nature.

3. Nature of Enlightened Cognition

A final noteworthy contribution of Śrīgupta’s Introduction to Reality—significant not for its subsequent uptake but rather for representing an outlier position—is its excursus on the nature of enlightened cognition. Here, he makes a case for the non-standard position that the cognition of an enlightened individual may, without contradiction, be both invariably veridical and have conceptual content (*vikalpajñāna, rnam par rtog pa’i ye shes). In fact, he argues that at least certain instances of enlightened cognition are necessarily conceptual since it is this that enables an enlightened individual to use linguistic-conceptual conventions in order to interact with, instruct, and benefit sentient beings. This also serves as an example of where the content of this text deviates from that of Śāntarakṣita’s Ornament of the Middle Way.

Dignāga influentially characterizes an enlightened being as an individual who has become a source of knowledge (pramāṇabhūta), i.e., an authoritative epistemic agent whose cognition is invariably veridical. In Buddhist writings in general, and in Madhyamaka in particular, it is standardly supposed that this veridical enlightened cognition is directly and perceptually acquainted with reality unmediated by concepts (nirvikalpajñāna),^[56] since, as Nāgārjuna emphasizes, reality (tattva) itself is nonconceptual (nirvikalpam) and free from fabrications (niṣprapañca) (MMK 18.9). Enlightened conceptual cognition, then, would seem to be a contradiction in terms. Yet a second common commitment says that only conceptual cognition is fit for linguistic expression (abhilāpasaṃsargayogya).^[57] This pair of claims leads to a puzzle: if enlightened cognition is exclusively non-conceptual, how can this be reconciled with the general Buddhist account on which an enlightened being guides sentient beings to liberation by teaching them the nature of reality and the means of realizing it? That is, how can an agent whose awareness has no conceptual content engage in discourse utilizing language that expresses concepts?

One common answer is that an enlightened being’s activities of teaching and benefiting sentient beings are spontaneous, with no mental act of intention immediately preceding each speech act. On this view, an enlightened individual’s physical and verbal actions are the result of the past aspirations of the prior unenlightened agent whose mental continuum is causally connected in the right way with the present enlightened agent. To the contrary, Śrīgupta argues not only that enlightened conceptual gnosis (*vikalpajñāna, rnam par rtog pa’i ye shes/rnam rtog ye shes) is possible, but also that it is necessary for an enlightened individual to linguistically communicate conventional truths, which are instrumentally useful for guiding beings to realize the ultimate truth of universal emptiness. He states:

Given that possessing conceptual gnosis (*vikalpajñāna)
is a means of benefiting sentient beings,
since it is for their sake that omniscience commences,
there is no fault [with enlightened conceptual gnosis].^[58] [TA 15]

It is inappropriate to maintain that possessing conceptual gnosis—which is the cause of imparting instructions pertaining to liberation, and so forth—is based on an [epistemic] fault, since it has this [conceptual] character for the sake of benefiting sentient beings.

If a thing exists, that object will
clearly appear to omniscient [cognition].
Because there is no basis for the slightest error [in such a case],
who would consider whether or not [enlightened cognition] is clear (*spaṣṭa)?^[59] [TAV AŚ 15]

Here, Śrīgupta addresses the implicit objection that conceptual gnosis is based on an epistemic fault. According to the epistemological tradition of Dignāga and Dharmakīrti, cognitions that are mediated by concepts are not endowed with a clear appearance of their object. It is only the non/pre-conceptual, non/pre-linguistic perceptual cognition that is non-erroneous in the strict sense, since it is only perception that is directly acquainted with ultimately real particulars. Inferential cognition, on the other hand, involves conceptual construction, that is, the superimposition of conventionally real concepts onto the world of ultimately real particulars. Thus, Dharmakīrti characterizes perception as non-erroneous precisely because it is nonconceptual,^[60] while inferential cognition is erroneous (bhrānti), despite the fact that inference is classified as one of the two sources of knowledge, and is thus non-deceptive (avisaṃvādi) insofar as actions taken on the basis of sound inferences can lead to practical success. ^[61] Accordingly, in the Madhyamaka tradition following Dharmakīrti, Kamalaśīla, for example, identifies conceptual cognitive objects as the unreal/false conventional (MAP ad MA 64).

While Śrīgupta does not explicitly mention the real/unreal conventional distinction, he seems to agree with Bhāviveka that at least certain conceptual cognitive objects may be understood as correct conventional truths, which are the objects of a kind of conventional insight, and which are instrumentally useful in guiding one to realize reality directly, unmediated by concepts. Likewise, Śrīgupta’s account looks compatible with Jñānagarbha’s claim that everyday conceptual cognitions might correspond with correct conventional truths so long as they do not involve the superimposition of mistaken philosophical commitments and are not based on perceptual errors. After all, Śrīgupta rejects the view that conceptual cognition is necessarily erroneous—at least when it belongs to the continuum of an omniscient individual.^[62] Moreover, he reasons that whatever there is ought to fall within the purview of omniscient cognition, and whatever there is includes conceptual cognitions. And given that omniscient cognition is necessarily veridical, whatever appears to it ought to do so clearly. In sum, Śrīgupta argues that enlightened cognition does not strictly conform to the dichotomy on which conceptual cognition lacks a clear appearance of its object and is thus erroneous while, nonconceptual, perceptual cognition has a clear appearance of its object and is therefore non-erroneous. Instead, he insists that enlightened cognition (i) has a clear appearance of its object, (ii) is necessarily veridical, and (iii) can nonetheless have conceptual content.

In the next verse of his autocommentary, Śrīgupta cites Dharmakīrti’s claim that a conceptual cognition cannot have a vivid, or clear (spaṣṭa) appearance of its object:

[A cognition] involving concepts
does not have a clear appearance of its object. [PV 3.283ab / PVin 1.32ab]^[63] [TAV AŚ 16ab]

Despite Śrīgupta’s citation of Dharmakīrti as an authority elsewhere in the Introduction to Reality, here Śrīgupta dismisses Dharmakīrti’s claim as the irrelevant perspective of those who reify external objects:

This claim by those with realist views about external objects
is irrelevant in this context.^[64] [TAV AŚ 16cd]

Śrīgupta’s terse response and apparent rejection of Dharmakīrti, whose claim he associates with external world realists, may be elucidated with the help of a more elaborate discussion of this topic in a seemingly unrelated text. While there is no obviously parallel treatment of omniscience in Śāntarakṣita’s Ornament of the Middle Way, Śrīgupta’s unusual position on conceptual gnosis finds support in another text contentiously attributed to Śāntarakṣita,^[65] the Proof of Reality (Tattvasiddhi). In this text—which aims to prove the efficacy of the tantric path in reliance on Dharmakīrti’s account of the causal inference—the author appears to argue for this same unusual position in support of the possibility of conceptual gnosis (savikalpajñāna).^[66] Here, the author claims that omniscient cognition (i) has a clear appearance of its object, (ii) determines its object just as it is, in accord with how it in fact exists (i.e., is necessarily veridical), and (iii) is nonetheless conceptual. The Proof of Reality even claims that Dharmakīrti is in agreement with this position that objects can appear clearly (spaṣṭābha) to conceptual cognition,^[67] pointing to Dharmakīrti’s differentiation between ordinary knowledge-events (laukika-pramāṇaparīkṣā) and transcendent ones, alluding to the distinction that Dharmakīrti draws between conventional (sāṃvyavahārika) and ultimate (pāramārthika) knowledge-events in PVin 1 ad k. 58 (Steinkellner 2001: 846; 2008: 301–02).^[68] Indeed, Śrīgupta may be gesturing to this distinction in his response to his imagined interlocutor’s citation of PV 3.283ab/PVin 1.32ab in TAV AŚ 16ab. In this concluding section of PVin 1, Dharmakīrti assumes the Yogācāra idealist perspective and addresses an objection that, for an idealist, there can be no basis for distinguishing between erroneous and non-erroneous cognition, and thus nothing to uniquely characterize a knowledge-event.^[69] Dharmakīrti responds that even the idealist has recourse to pragmatic efficacy in order to differentiate deceptive from non-deceptive cognitions. Nevertheless, he clarifies that his foregoing presentation of the sources of knowledge concerns conventional knowledge-events (sāṃvyavahārika-pramāṇa), which should be contrasted with ultimate knowledge-events (pāramārthika-pramāṇa).^[70] Still, Dharmakīrti does not explicitly endorse an account of ultimate knowledge-events as conceptual, thus failing to provide a genuine precedent for Śrīgupta’s account of conceptual gnosis.

Despite the fact that Śrīgupta’s unusual position on conceptual enlightened cognition did not claim many adherents, it was to become a touchstone in discussions concerning the nature of enlightened cognition in late Indian Buddhism and early Tibetan Buddhist scholasticism.^[71]

Bibliography

A. Primary Literature with Abbreviations

[AAA]

Haribhadra, Abhisamayālaṃkārālokā Prajñāpāramitāvyākhyā, in Abhisamayālaṃkārālokā Prajñāpāramitāvyākhyā (Commentary on Aṣṭasāhasrikā-Prajñāpāramitā) by Haribhadra Together with the Text Commented on, 2 volumes, Unrai Wogihara (ed.), Tokyo: The Toyo Bunko, 1932–35.

[AAP]

Dharmamitra, Abhisamayālaṃkāraprasphuṭapadā, PD 3021, vol. 52, 709–987.

[AK]

Vasubandhu, Abhidharmakośakārikā, in Abhidharmakośabhāṣya of Vasubandhu (rev. 2nd ed.), Prahlad Pradhan (ed.), Patna: K. P. Jayaswal Research Center, 1967 [1975].

[AKBh]

Vasubandhu, Abhidharmakośabhāṣya, see AK.

[BCAP]

Prajñākaramati, Bodhicaryāvatārapañjikā, in Prajñākaramati’s Commentary to the Bodhicaryāvatāra of Śāntidev, Louis de La Vallée Poussin (ed.), Calcutta: Asiatic Society, 1901–14.

[CŚ]

Āryadeva, Catuḥśatakaśāstra, in Āryadeva’s Catuḥśataka: On the Bodhisattva’s Cultivation of Merit and Knowledge, Indiske Studier VII, Karen Lang (ed.), Copenhagen: Akademisk Forlag, 1986.

[D]

sDe dge Tibetan Tripiṭaka – bsTan ’gyur Preserved at the Faculty of Letters, University of Tokyo, Z. Yamaguchi et al. (eds). Tokyo: Tokyo University Press, 1977–88.

[MA]

Śāntarakṣita, Madhyamakālaṃkārakārikā, in “Śāntarakṣita’s Madhyamakālaṃkāra”, Masamichi Ichigō (ed.), in Studies in the Literature of the Great Vehicle: Three Mahāyāna Buddhist Texts, Luis O. Goméz and Jonathan A. Silk (eds), Ann Arbor: Center for South and Southeast Asian Studies, University of Michigan, 1989, 141–240.

[MAP]

Kamalaśīla, Madhyamakālaṃkārapañjikā, in Madhyamakālaṃkāra of Śāntarakṣita with His Own Commentary or Vṛtti and with the Subcommentary or Pañjikā of Kamalaśīla, Masamichi Ichigō (ed.), Kyoto: Buneido, 1985.

[MAS]

Bhāviveka II, Madhyamakārthasaṃgraha, PD 3084, vol. 58, 851–53.

[MAV]

Śāntarakṣita, Madhyamakālaṃkāravṛtti, see MAP.

[MAv]

Candrakīrti, Madhyamakāvatāra, in “Madhyamakāvatāra-kārikā Chapter 6”, Li Xuezhu (ed.), Journal of Indian Philosophy, 43(1): 1–30, 2015. doi:10.1007/s10781-014-9227-6

[MHK]

Bhāviveka, Madhyamakahṛdayakārikā, in Madhyamakahṛdayam of Bhavya, Christian Lindtner (ed.), The Adyar Library Series, vol. 123, Chennai: The Adyar Library and Research Centre, 2001; chapter 5 in Bhāviveka and his Buddhist Opponents: Chapters 4 and 5 of the Verses on the Heart of the Middle Way (Madhyamakahṛdayakārikāḥ) with the Commentary Entitled The Flame of Reason (Tarkajvālā), Malcolm David Eckel (ed.), Harvard Oriental Series 70. Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Department of South Asian Studies, 2008.

[MMK]

Nāgārjuna, Mūlamadhyamakakārikā, in Zhong lun song: Fan Zang Han he jiao, dao du, yi zhu, Ye Shaoyong (ed.), Shanghai: Zhongxi shuju, 2011.

[MRP]

Bhāviveka II, Madhyamakaratnapradīpa, PD 3081, vol. 57, 1487–1567.

[NB]

Dharmakīrti, Nyāyabindu, in Nyāyabindu of Dharmakīrti with Nyāyabinduṭīkā of Dharmottara and Paṇḍita Durvekamiśra’s Dharmottarapradīpa, Dalsukh Malvania (ed.), Tibetan Sanskrit Works Series 2. Patna: Kashi Prasad Jayaswal Research Institute, 1955.

[PD]

Bka’ ’gyur and Bstan ’gyur Dpe bsdur ma. Beijing: Krung go’i bod rig pa’i dpe skrun khang, 1994–2008. (Reference is to text number and page number)

[PPṬ]

Avalokitavrata, Prajñāpradīpaṭīkā, PD 3086, vol. 58, 859–1622.

[PV]

Dharmakīrti, Pramāṇavārttika, in “Pramāṇavārttika-Kārikā (Sanskrit and Tibetan)”, Yūsho Miyasaka (ed.), Acta Indologica 2 (1971–72): 1–206.

[PVA]

Prajñākaragupta, Pramāṇavārttikālaṃkāra, in “Second search for Sanskrit palm-leaf manuscripts in Tibet”, Rāhula Sāṅkṛtyāyana (ed.), Journal of the Bihar and Orissa Research Society 23 (1953): 1–57.

[PVin]

Dharmakīrti, Pramāṇaviniścaya, chapters 1 and 2 in Dharmakīrti’s Pramāṇaviniścaya, Chapters 1 and 2, Ernst Steinkellner (ed.), Beijing-Vienna: China Tibetology Publishing House, Austrian Academy of Sciences Press, 2007; chapter 3 in Dharmakīrti’s Pramāṇaviniścaya: Chapter 3, Pascale Hugon and Toru Tomabechi (eds), Sanskrit Texts from the Tibetan Autonomous Region 8. Beijing: China Tibetology Publishing House and Vienna: Austrian Academy of Sciences Press, 2011.

[PVSV]

Dharmakīrti, Pramāṇavārttikasvavṛtti, in The Pramāṇavārttikam of Dharmakīrti: The First Chapter with the Autocommentary, Raniero Gnoli (ed.), Serie Orientale Roma 23. Rome: Istituto Italiano per il Medio ed Estremo Oriente, 1960.

[RĀ]

Nāgārjuna, Ratnāvalī, Nāgārjuna’s Ratnāvalī, Michael Hahn (ed.), vol. 1. Bonn: Indica et Tibetica, 1982.

[SDA]

Atiśa, Satyadvayāvatāra, in “Atīsha no Ni-shinri-setsu” (Atīśa’s Theory of the Two Truths), Yasunori Ejima, (ed.), Ryūjukyōgaku no kenkyū (Studies of Teaching of Nāgārjuna), Taishun Mibu, (ed.), 359–391. Tokyo: Daizô̂ Shuppan Co., 1983.

[SDV]

Jñānagarbha, Satyadvayavibhaṅgakārikā, in A New Critical Edition of Jñānagarbha’s Satyadvayavibhaṅga with Śāntarakṣita’s Commentary, Ritsu Akahane (primary editor), Ryo Nishiyama, Yukio Yamanaka, and Yasutaka Muroya (eds), Wiener Studen zur Tibetologie und Buddhismuskunde, Heft 98, Vienna: Arbeitskreis für Tibetische und Buddhistische Studien Universität Wien, 2020.

[SDVP]

Śāntarakṣita, Satyadvayavibhaṅgapañjikā, see SDV.

[SDVV]

Jñānagarbha, Satyadvayavibhaṅgavṛtti, see SDV.

[SP]

Dharmakīrti, Sambandhaparīkṣā, in Dharmakīrti’s Sambandhaparīkṣākārikā and Devendrabuddhi’s Sambandhaparīkṣāvṛtti (Sanskrit Texts from the Tibetan Autonomous Region 23), Ernst Steinkellner (ed.), Beijing/Vienna: China Tibetology Publishing House, Austrian Academy of Sciences Press, 2022.

[ŚS]

Nāgārjuna, Śūnyatāsaptati, in Nagarjuniana: Studies in the Writings and Philosophy of Nāgārjuna, Christian Lindtner (ed.), Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1982.

[TA]

Śrīgupta, Tattvāvatāra, see TAV

[TAV]

Śrīgupta Tattvāvatāravṛtti, in Introduction to Reality: Śrīgupta’s Tattvāvatāravṛtti, Allison Aitken (ed.), Harvard Oriental Series, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Department of South Asian Studies, 2025; PD 3121, vol. 63, 101–12; D 3892 dbu ma, ha 39b4–43b5.

[TJ]

Bhāviveka, Tarkajvālā, chapters 1–3.26 in Nektar der Erkenntnis: Buddhistische Philosophie des 6. Jh.: Bhavyas Tarkajvālā I–III.26, Annette L. Heitmann (ed.), Aachen: Shaker Verlag, 2004.

[TS]

Śāntarakṣita Tattvasaṃgraha, in Tattvasaṃgrahapañjikā. Tattvasaṃgraha of Śāntarakṣita, with the Commentary “Pañjikā” of Śrī Kamalaśīla in two volumes, Swami Dwarikadas Shastri (ed.), Varanasi: Bauddha Bhāratī Series I. 2 vols, 1968; Bahirarthaparīkṣā chapter in On the Nature of Things: A Buddhist Debate on Cognitions and their Objects, with a Manuscript Description by Paolo Giunta, Margherita Serena Saccone (ed.), Wiener Studien zur Tibetologie und Buddhismuskunde, Heft 94. Vienna: Arbeitskreis für Tibetische und Buddhistische Studien Universität Wien, 2018.

[VS]

Kaṇāda Vaiśeṣikasūtra, in Vaiśeṣikasūtra of Kaṇāda: with the Commentary of Candrānanda, Muni Jambuvijayi (ed.), Gaekwad’s Oriental Series 136. Baroda: Oriental Institute, 1961.

[Vś]

Vasubandhu, Viṃśikā, Materials toward the study of Vasubandhuʼs Viṁśikā (I): Sanskrit and Tibetan critical editions of the verses and autocommentary, an English translation and annotations, Jonathan Silk (ed.), Harvard Oriental Series 81. Cambridge, MA: Department of South Asian Studies, Harvard University, 2016.

[VP]

Nāgārjuna, Vaidalyaprakaraṇa, in Nāgārjuna’s Refutation of Logic (Nyāya): Vaidalyaprakaraṇa / Źib mo rnam par ḥthag pa źes bya baḥi rab tu byed pa, Fernando Tola and Carmen Dragonetti (eds), Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 1995.

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Acknowledgments

Portions of the present entry were taken from the author’s Introduction to Reality: A Study of Śrīgupta’s Tattvāvatāravṛtti with a Critical Edition and Annotated Translation (Harvard Oriental Series 102), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 2025.