1. See, e.g. Kaplan 2011: 509, which explicitly invokes Peirce’s conception of the distinction in order to raise some worries about applying it to words, as well as Szabó 1999:150 (fn. 11) which cites Peirce as anticipating a component of Szabó’s preferred view of the relationship between types and tokens.

2. See Lane 2024: §3 on the Peirce’s distinction between reality and existence. Peirce in addition holds that God does not exist, though God is real. See Gilmore 2006 for a detailed discussion.

3. See the entries on dualism and the mind/brain identity theory for discussion and references.

4. See Lewis and Lewis 1970 for a discussion of holes and views on which they may be ordinary concrete things.

5. See Goodman and Quine 1947 for an influential view on which there are no abstracta, and Cowling 2017 for an overview of arguments against abstract objects.

6. In addition to the Peirce passage discussed in §1, Quine 1987 (216–19), the standard more recent synopsis of the distinction, introduces it using counting data.

7. See Barwise and Cooper 1981 for the seminal statement of this view and Rothstein 2017 for a recent overview of the semantics of number words.

8. Thanks to Ofra Magidor for helping me appreciate this point.

9. See Leech, Rayson, and Wilson (2001).

10. That said, they become controversial on Liebesman and Magidor’s (2025) Property Versatility view where many properties are true of a wider variety of entities than theorists have thought. Liebesman and Magidor 2025 (ch. 10), however, argues that at least some common claims about properties not applying to individuals withstand scrutiny.

11. We’ll temporarily set aside the worry that not all tokens of ‘the’ are inscriptions or utterances.

12. Moltmann 2013 argues that many instances of what theorists have taken to be reference to abstract objects can actually be understood in other ways, in particular some as reference to pluralities. One precursor of this view is Sellars 1963 (633), which argues that certain terms statements that seem to contain reference to kinds/sorts are understood as tacitly quantificational.

13. Of course this is not wholly controversial. See Hawthorne and Lepore 2011 for a similar example and Kaplan 2011 for some reservations about whether a word is genuinely introduced.

14. See Florio and Linnebo 2021 (ch. 10) for a discussion of these issues.

15. This is a key theme of Wetzel 2009 (ch. 6), which argues that some familiar nominalistic paraphrases fail to avoid commitment to word types.

16. Wetzel 2002 (247) emphasizes this problem.

17. See the entry on generic generalizations for an overview.

18. See, e.g. Krifka et. al. 1995.

19. This view could be motivated with analogies well-known sentences like ‘The average American has 2.3 children’, where few argue we should really be committed to an ontology of a unique average American with the surprising property of having 2.3 children. Especially given that there are there are well-motivated analyses on which there is no ontological commitment to an average American (Kennedy and Stanley 2009).

20. None of this conflicts with the fact that we are happy to speak of words/songs as having types in ordinary discourse. Surely we are, e.g. ‘Nouns are a type of word’. But this is beside the point: the point is that in ordinary discourse we do not speak as if particular words/songs like ‘the’ or Hey Jude are types.

21. None of this is to say that we don’t talk about types of words or artworks in ordinary discourse! We certainly do: expletives are a type of word. Rather, the point is solely that we don’t ordinarily speak as if words (artworks) are themselves types.

22. Why the qualifier ‘mostly’? Later in the same paragraph Kaplan notes that Peirce refers to tokens as ‘replicas’ which suggests that tokens resemble their types, but Kaplan does not think that there need be any resemblance in order for an inscription/utterance to token a type—this follows from the fact that he takes mere intention to suffice for tokening a word.

23. Liebesman and Magidor (2025, ch. 13) argue that this motivation is not convincing.

24. See Krifka, et. al. 1995 on kind reference and kind predications.

25. Thomasson 1999 is the seminal defense of the abstract artifact view for fictional entities. Irmak 2019 defends the view that words are analogous.

26. It is worth noting that, again, mental state types seem disanalogous to words and repeatable artworks. At the very least, it is more plausible to hold that mental state types are eternal and lack contingent intrinsic properties.

27. This distinction is developed in Zalta 1983 and applied to word types and tokens in Zalta 2021 and mathematical types and tokens in Zalta 2024.

28. A parallel question arises about universals: whether there can be uninstantiated universals. See Armstrong 1989 for discussion.

29. See Cowling 2017 for an overview and discussion of the epistemic challenges posed by abstracta.

30. Szabó (1999: 152) himself notes the difficulty in generalizing the representation view beyond word types.

31. This section is particularly indebted to Wetzel’s work, especially in her 2009 book and her work on the 2018 version of the entry on types and tokens.

32. Russell (1940, 36) also holds that words are universals, and in a footnote, he analogizes words to dog-kind, suggesting that he holds the more general view that types are universals.

33. Two examples: Carlson 1977 (240), Kaplan 2011 (509).

34. There’s an enormous amount of work in semantics on kind reference, much of it stemming from Carlson 1977 and Chierchia 1998.