Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

18th Century German Aesthetics

First published Tue 16 Jan, 2007

The philosophical discipline of aesthetics did not receive its name until 1735, when the twenty-one year old Alexander Gottlieb Baumgarten introduced it in his Halle master's thesis to mean epistêmê aisthetikê, or the science of what is sensed and imagined (Baumgarten, Meditationes §CXVI, pp. 86-7). But Baumgarten's denomination of the field was an adult baptism: without the benefit of a name, aesthetics had been part of philosophy since Plato attacked the educational value of many forms of art in the Republic and Aristotle briefly defended them in his fragmentary Poetics. In particular, Aristotle defended the arts from Plato's charge that they are cognitively useless, trading in mere images of particulars rather than universal truths, by arguing that it is precisely the arts, or at least poetry, that deliver universal truths in a readily graspable form, unlike, for example, history, which deals merely with particular facts (Aristotle, Poetics, chapter 9, 1451a37-1451b10). And if experience of the arts can reveal important moral truths, then it can also be important to the development of morality, the other pole of Plato's doubts. Some variant of Aristotle's response to Plato was the core of aesthetics through much of subsequent philosophical history, and indeed continued to be central to aesthetics through much of the twentieth century. In the eighteenth century, however, an alternative response to Plato was introduced, namely, the idea that our response to beauty, whether in nature or in art, is a free play of our mental powers that is intrinsically pleasurable, and thus needs no epistemological or moral justification, although it may in fact have epistemological and moral benefits. This line of thought was introduced in Britain in Joseph Addison's 1712 Spectator essays on “The Pleasures of the Imagination,” and developed by subsequent Scottish writers such as Francis Hutcheson, Henry Home (Lord Kames), and Alexander Gerard. It was only slowly received in Germany, hinted at by Moses Mendelssohn in the late 1750s, making its first sustained appearance in the emphasis on the pleasure of the unhindered activity of our powers of representation in some of the entries in Johann Georg Sulzer's Allgemeine Theorie der schönen Künste (1771-74), e.g., the entries on “beauty” and “taste” (Sulzer, Allgemeine Theorie, vol. II, pp. 371-85, at p. 371, and “Schön (Schöne Künste),” vol. IV, pp. 305-19, at p. 307), but then quickly becoming central to the aesthetic theories of Kant and Schiller in the Critique of the Power of Judgment (1790) and the Letters on the Aesthetic Education of Mankind (1795). This article will chronicle the interaction between the traditional theory of aesthetic experience as a special form of the cognition of truth and the newer theory of aesthetic experience as a free play of cognitive (and sometimes other) mental powers in eighteenth-century Germany.

1. Leibniz and Wolff: Perfection and Truth

The traditional idea that art is a special vehicle for the expression of important truths is the basis for the work of the philosopher who established the framework for German thought for much of the 18th century, namely, Christian Wolff (1679-1754). Wolff never devoted a whole work to aesthetics, but many of the ideas that would influence subsequent aesthetic theory are contained in his Rational Thoughts on God, the World, and the Soul of Man, his “German Metaphysics,” first published in 1719.

Originally appointed to teach mathematics at the Pietist university of Halle, Wolff was inspired by both the mathematical and philosophical genius of Gottfried Wilhelm Leibniz (1646-1716), but published a vast systematic statement of a philosophy that was constructed partly although by no means wholly on Leibnizian lines in a way that Leibniz himself never did. Wolff's collected works (over thirty volumes in German and forty in Latin) include German versions of his logic, metaphysics, ethics, political philosophy, and teleology as well as a four-volume encyclopedia of mathematical subjects. In addition, there are expanded Latin versions of the logic, the components of metaphysics including ontology, rational cosmology, empirical psychology, rational psychology, and natural psychology, as well as another four-volume mathematical compendium, seven volumes on ethics, and no fewer than twelve volumes on political philosophy and economics. In all of this vast output, the only thing that might look like a work specifically in aesthetics is a treatise on architecture included in his encyclopedia of mathematics. That very placement indicates that Wolff regarded the discussion of architecture as part of the theory of science; and in the Preliminary Discourse on Philosophy in General that prefaces his Latin restatement of his system, Wolff states more generally that a “philosophy of the arts” is possible, but as part of “technics or technology,” “the science of the arts and of the works of art” (Wolff, Preliminary Discourse, §71, p. 38). Here Wolff uses the term “art” (ars) in the ancient sense of techne, which means any form of craft requiring both aptitude and training, rather than in the specifically modern sense of “fine art.” In his German works, Wolff uses the word Kunst in the same broad way. Even with regard to something closer to the fine arts, however, he says that “There could also be a philosophy of the liberal arts, if they were reduced to the form of a science….one might talk about rhetorical philosophy, poetical philosophy, etc.” (ibid., §72, p. 39). Wolff certainly does not have the idea of the fine arts as a domain of human production and response that differs in some essential way from all other forms of human production and response, thus he does not have the idea of aesthetics as a discipline that will focus on what distinguishes the fine arts and our response to them from everything else. Nevertheless, in the course of his works he introduces some ideas about both the fine arts and our response to them that will be seminal for the next half-century of German thought.

1.1. Leibniz

The two key ideas that Wolff takes from Leibniz are, first, the characterization of sensory perception as a clear but confused rather than distinct perception of things that could, at least in principle, be known both clearly and distinctly by the intellect; and, second, the characterization of pleasure as the sensory, and thus clear but confused, perception of the perfection of things. Leibniz's conception of sensory perception was presented in a 1684 paper entitled “Meditations on Knowledge, Truth, and Ideas.” Here Leibniz stated that “Knowledge is clear…when it makes it possible for me to recognize the thing represented,” but that it is “confused when I cannot enumerate one by one the marks which are sufficient to distinguish the thing from others, even though the thing may in truth have such marks and constituents into which its concept can be resolved.” Conversely, knowledge is both clear and distinct when one can not only clearly distinguish its object from other objects but can also enumerate the “marks” or properties of the object on which that distinction is based. Leibniz then says that sensory perception is clear but indistinct or confused knowledge, and illustrates his general thesis about sense perception with a remark about the perception and judgment of art: “Likewise we sometimes see painters and other artists correctly judge what has been done well or badly; yet they are often unable to give a reason for their judgment but tell the inquirer that the work which displeases them lacks ‘something, I know not what’” (Leibniz, “Meditations on Knowledge, Truth, and Ideas,” p. 291). This illustration would be decisive for Wolff and all of those whom he in turn influenced.

The second idea that Wolff took over from Leibniz is the idea that pleasure is itself the sensory perception of the perfection existing in an object. For Leibniz and all his followers, there is one sense in which all of the properties of actually existing objects can be regarded as perfections, since they held that the actual world is the one selected to exist by God from among all possible worlds precisely because it is the most perfect; thus each object and all of its properties must in some way contribute to the maximal perfection of the actual world. But they also used the concept of perfection in a more ordinary way, in which some actual objects have specific perfections that others do not, and it is this sense of perfection that Leibniz employed when he stated that

Pleasure is the feeling of a perfection or an excellence, whether in ourselves or in something else. For the perfection of other beings is also agreeable, such as understanding, courage, and especially beauty in another human being, or in an animal or even in a lifeless creation, a painting or a work of craftsmanship, as well.

Leibniz also holds that the perfection that we perceive in other objects is in some sense communicated to ourselves, although he does not say that our pleasure in the perception of perfection is actually directed at the self-perfection that is thereby caused: “For the image of such perfection in others, impressed upon us, causes some of this perfection to be implanted and aroused within ourselves. There is thus no doubt that he who consorts much with excellent people or things becomes himself more excellent” (Leibniz, “On Wisdom,” p. 425). But there is certainly a nascent view here that the perception of beauty in art, although not only in art, is both intrinsically pleasurable and also instrumentally valuable because it leads to self-improvement.

1.2. Wolff

This is the background from which Wolff's own hints toward aesthetics emerged. Wolff introduces the central concepts and principles of his ontology in the second chapter of his German metaphysics, which deals with “The first grounds of our cognition and all things in general” (German Metaphysics, p. 66). After expounding the formal principles that are the basis of all truth, the principles of non-contradiction and sufficient reason, Wolff introduces the concept that is the substantive basis of his ontology, namely the concept of perfection. He defines perfection as the “harmony” or “concordance” (Zusammenstimmung) of a manifold or multiplicity of objects or parts of objects — or as he says in Latin, perfectio est consensus in varietate (Wolff, Ontologia, §503, p. 390) — and illustrates this abstract definition with the example of a work of technology: “E.g., one judges the perfection of a clock from its correctly displaying the hours and their parts. It is however composed of many parts, and these and their composition are aimed at the hands displaying correctly the hours and their parts. Thus in a clock one finds manifold things, that are all in concordance with one another” (Wolff, German Metaphysics, §152, p. 152). Here Wolff defines perfection in both formal and substantive terms: formally, simply as the order or harmony of the parts in a whole; but substantively, as the suitability of that order or harmony of parts for achieving the aim that is intended for the whole, such as accurately telling time in the case of a clock.

When we turn to Wolff's conceptions of the perfections of the particular forms of art that he mentions, we will see that he always has in mind both formal and substantive perfections for any particular art. We should also note here that Wolff identifies order in things with truth. He says that “Since everything has its sufficient ground why it is, there must also always be a sufficient ground for why in simple things the alterations succeed one another just so and not otherwise, and why in composite things their parts are juxtaposed just thus and not otherwise, and also their alterations succeed one another just so and not otherwise.” He contrasts this order with the disorder that reigns in dreams, and then says that “Accordingly truth is nothing other than order in the alternations of things while the dream is disorder in the alteration of things” (German Metaphysics, §142, pp. 146-8). In a 1729 lecture on “The enjoyment that one can derive from the cognition of truth,” Wolff does not in the first instance treat truth as a semantic correspondence between a linguistic representation and the object represented, or an epistemic relation between a mental representation and an external reality, but as an objective property consisting in coherence within things themselves, which is precisely what perfection consists in as well. But there is nevertheless a strongly cognitivist cast to Wolff's aesthetics.

Wolff next defines clarity and distinctness and indistinctness in cognition. Thoughts are clear “when we know well what we think, and can distinguish that from other things”; they are obscure if we cannot even distinguish the objects of our thoughts from other objects (German Metaphysics, §§198-9, p. 188). Clear thoughts are also distinct if we not only know what objects we are thinking of but if “our thoughts are also clear with respect to their parts or the manifold that is to be found in them” (German Metaphysics, §207, p. 194), and are otherwise indistinct or confused. Wolff then defines sensations (Empfindungen) as those thoughts “which have their ground in the alterations of the members of our body and which are occasioned by corporeal things outside us,” and the “capacity for having sensations as the senses” (German Metaphysics, §220, p. 202). He then adopts Leibniz's view that sensations or sensory perceptions are typically clear but indistinct or confused (German Metaphyics, §214, p. 198). Unlike Leibniz, the systematic Wolff observes that sensations come in differing degrees of clarity (German Metaphysics, §224, p. 206), but they are nevertheless all indistinct to some degree. This means that at least in principle a purely intellectual or conceptual representation is always a better source of knowledge of its object than is a sensory representation of it.

This in turn means that an aesthetic perception of a perfection is always a less than optimal cognition of that perfection, for having described sense perception or sensory cognition as clear but indistinct or confused, Wolff next defines pleasure as the sensory or “intuitive” cognition of perfection. In his German metaphysics, he writes that “Insofar as we intuit perfection, pleasure arises in us, thus pleasure is nothing other than an intuition of perfection, as Descartes already remarked” (German Metaphysics, §404, p. 344). Wolff's successors will struggle to avoid the limitations on the cognitive significance of aesthetic response that follow from his definition of pleasure as a kind of sense perception and the limits he places on the cognitive significance of sense perception.

While Wolff's basic account of pleasure is problematic, he does provide a straightforward account of beauty. Wolff defines beauty as the perfection of an object insofar it can be perceived by us with and through the feeling of pleasure: “Beauty consists in the perfection of a thing, insofar as it is suitable for producing pleasure in us”(Psychologia Empirica, §544, p. 420). This definition enunciates a clear position on the ontological status of beauty, which will often be vexed in the eighteenth century. Beauty is an objective property, founded in the perfection of things, but it is also a relational rather than intrinsic property, for it is attributed to perfection only insofar as there are subjects like us who can perceive it sensorily. Given perceivers like us, beauty is coextensive with or emergent from perfection, but in a universe without such perceivers perfection would not be equivalent to beauty.

Thus far we have considered only Wolff's most abstract definition of perfection and therefore of beauty, namely that it is unity in variety or the coherence of a manifold insofar as we can perceive that through the sensation of pleasure. When he mentions or discusses specific arts, Wolff invokes more specific conceptions of perfection and thus of the beauties of those arts. In the case of the visual arts of painting and sculpture, Wolff locates their perfection in imitation or veridical representation, while other arts find their perfections in the fulfillment of intended uses. He uses the examples of painting and architecture in the German metaphysics to illustrate his claim that pleasure arises from the intuition of perfection. Thus, “the perfection of a painting consists in its similarity. For since a painting is nothing other than a representation of a given object on a tablet or flat surface, everything in it is harmonious if nothing can be discerned in it that one does not also perceive in the thing itself,” and “if a connoisseur of architecture contemplates a building that has been constructed in accordance with the rules of architecture, he thereby cognizes its perfection”(German Metaphysics, §404, p. 344). Wolff frequently reiterates that the perfection of painting or sculpture consists in accurate representation without further amplification (“On the enjoyment that can be derived from the cognition of truth,” §7, p. 257, and Psychologia Empirica, §512, pp. 389-90, and §544, pp. 420-1); he is simply using what he takes to be a non-controversial fact about painting to confirm his connection of pleasure with the intuition of perfection. In his extended discussion of architecture, however, he reveals a more subtle conception of the perfections and thus the “rules” of architecture. Wolff's discussion of architecture makes it clear that in order for us to perceive it as beautiful, a building must display both the formal perfection of unity amidst variety as well as the substantive perfection of being suitable, indeed comfortable for its intended use.

Wolff begins his treatise on the Foundations of Architecture with the claim that “architecture is a science for constructing a building so that it is in complete correspondence with the intentions of the architect”(Wolff, Principles of Architecture, §1, p. 305). This locates the harmony or agreement in which perfection always consists in the relation between the intentions of the architect and the building that results from his plans and supervision. However, as he proceeds Wolff makes it clear that the intention of an architect is always to produce a structure that is both formally beautiful as well as useful and comfortable, so the perfection that subsists in the relation between intention and outcome in fact consists in the perfection of both form and utility in the building itself. Thus, Wolff argues on the one hand that “A building is space that is enclosed by art in order that certain functions can proceed there securely and unhindered” (Architecture, §4, p. 306), and that “A building is comfortable if all necessary functions can proceed within it without hindrance and vexation” (Architecture, §7, p. 307). These definitions form the basis for a requirement of perfection in the utility of a building. On the other hand, however, Wolff also introduces his standard definition of beauty, namely “Beauty is perfection or the necessary appearance thereof, insofar as the former or the latter is perceived, and causes a pleasure in us” (Architecture, §8, p. 307), and then asserts that “A building must be constructed beautifully and decoratively” (Architecture, §18, p. 309). This is the basis for the requirement of formal rather than utilitarian perfection in a building. Throughout the remainder of the treatise, both conceptions of perfection are at work. Wolff does not explicitly extend this complex analysis of perfection to other arts, although it is not difficult to imagine how that extension might go: in painting we might respond to formal features of composition as well as to the accuracy of depiction, in sculpture we might respond to the intrinsic beauty of the marble or bronze as well as to the accuracy of depiction, and so on.

Finally, we must ask about the moral and religious implications of Wolff's contributions to aesthetics. As we have seen, Wolff equates perfection, which is the object of pleasure in all contexts including those subsequently labeled aesthetic, with an objective sense of truth. However, and in this regard most unlike the German aestheticians of the next several generations who are so strongly influenced by him in other regards, he has nothing to say about the arts that are typically paradigmatic for those who ground their aesthetics on the notion of truth rather than that of play, namely literature, especially poetry and drama. Thus he does not consider the paradox of tragedy, which arises for every eighteenth-century writer who thinks about literature, nor does he emphasize the moral benefits of uplifting literature, as so many others do. Indeed, he has nothing explicit to say about the moral benefits of aesthetic experience, nor does he directly consider the religious significance of such experience in any of his discussions of it. Nevertheless, it is clear that aesthetic experience does have religious significance for Wolff , because his philosophy culminates in a religious teleology. For Wolff, the most perfect and therefore most orderly of all possible worlds exists for a reason, namely to mirror the perfection of God, and sentient and cognizant beings such as ourselves exist for a reason, namely to recognize and admire the perfection of God that is mirrored in the perfection of things in the world and of the world as a whole. The perfection that is added to the natural world through human artistry is also part of the perfection of the world that emanates from and mirrors the perfection of God . Thus, in admiring the perfection of art we are performing part of our larger function in the world, namely admiring the perfection of God. Wolff states the premise of his teleology quite clearly in a work devoted entirely to that subject, the Rational Thoughts on the Aims of Natural Things, or “German teleology.” There he declares that “The chief aim of the world is this, that we should cognize the perfection of God from it. Now if God would attain this aim, he also had to arrange the world in such a way that a rational being could extract from the contemplation of it grounds that would allow him to infer with certainty the properties of God and what can be known about him”(Rational Thoughts on the Aims of Natural Things, §8, p. 6). Several sections later, he uses the metaphor of the mirror to describe the relation between God, the world, and we who look at the mirror: “Now if the world is to be a mirror of the wisdom of God, then we must encounter divine aims in it and perceive the means by which he attains these aims….And accordingly the connection of things in the world with one another makes it into a mirror of [God's] wisdom…” (ibid., §14, pp. 18-19; see also German Metaphysics, §1045, p. 802).

Wolff writes as a spokesman for the Enlightenment, and he is emphatic that God reveals his wisdom and power not by intervening in the course of the world by means of miracles, but rather by designing everything in the world as if it were all smoothly-running machines that can achieve his goals without further intervention (see German Metaphysics, §1037, p. 796). This might seem to leave no room at all for the human creation of art, which all eighteenth-century writers will conceive of as a production of genius that is the complete opposite of anything mechanical. But for Wolff our ability to produce works of art is another manifestation of the perfection of the world — of which we are a part — and in turn of God. Wolff draws no distinction between the works of human art that are the subject of the “science of art” and the works of nature, nor for that matter any distinction between the works of human art that are the subject of the “science of art” and those human creations that are the subjects of the “doctrine of morals and statecraft”: they are all forms of perfection which, in a teleological natural theology, all ultimately mirror the perfection of God. And no doubt Wolff hardly thought it necessary to spell out the moral benefits of such a recognition.

2. Gottsched and His Critics: Truth and Imagination

As we saw in section 1, Christian Wolff defined the experience of beauty as the “sensitive cognition of perfection.” Cognition is naturally understood as knowledge of truth, so in the first instance Wolff's formula meant that the experience of beauty is knowledge of truth by means of the senses, although as we also saw Wolff's notion of perfection was broad enough to include successful adaptation to an intended purpose, and thus in his analysis of our experience of architecture he emphasized our sense of the utility of structures as well as a sensory response to the kind of abstract form that could be considered an object of cognition. But it was the idea that aesthetic experience is a sensory apprehension of truth that dominated in Wolff's most general statements. After 1720, Wolff's philosophy enjoyed an influence in most parts of Germany similar to that which the philosophy of Locke exercised in most parts of Britain by then and in France beginning a decade or two later. So the history of German aesthetics after Wolff is a history of the attempt to find room for a fuller account of aesthetic experience within a framework that privileges the idea of cognition, and only gradually was room found for the idea that the free play of our mental powers (including emotion and imagination) could be equally important. The first round of this struggle was a debate extending from the late 1720s until the 1740s between the Leipzig literary figure Johann Christoph Gottsched and the Zürich critics Johann Jacob Bodmer and Johann Jacob Breitinger, in which the issue was really just how much room there could be for the freedom of imagination within a theory of poetry based on the idea that poetry is a truthful imitation of nature.

From a distance of almost three hundred years, the differences between the “critical poetics” (critische Dichtkunst) of Johann Christoph Gottsched and his critics seem small, even trivial, because to us they are all so clearly working within the paradigm established by Wolff. Yet in the 1730s and 1740s their debate was intense, not just because Gottsched was a self-important controversialist who clearly enjoyed being on center stage, but also because their debate about the proper scope and power of the imagination was both theoretically interesting and reflected a tectonic shift in German taste. This shift is away from the French classicism represented by Racine and Corneille to the freer forms of Milton and Shakespeare, which in turn lead to the pan-European romanticism of the later eighteenth and early nineteenth centuries.

2.1 Gottsched

Johann Christoph Gottsched (1700-66) was born in Königsberg and studied philosophy there. He began teaching philosophy there in 1723, but fled the Prussian draft the next year and settled in the Saxon city of Leipzig, a trading and publishing city that was home to one of the great universities of Germany (Leibniz's father had been a professor of law there and Leibniz himself studied there). Leipzig is only thirty kilometers away from Halle, the Prussian city where Wolff had been teaching for two decades; but Wolff himself had been driven from Halle in 1722 by the reaction to his argument that the “atheistic” Chinese could arrive at the same moral truths as Christian Europeans by the use of human reason alone. There is no reason to believe that Gottsched ever met Wolff. Nevertheless, he had already been exposed to Wolffian philosophy in Königsberg, and his two-volume Erste Gründe der gesamten Weltweisheit (“First Principles of all Philosophy,” 1733-34), which includes an extensive review of natural science as well as logic, metaphysics, and ethics, became the most widely adopted textbook of Wolffian philosophy. However, although he eventually held the professorship in logic and metaphysics in Leipzig, Gottsched was also the professor of poetry, and by far the greatest part of his boundless energy was devoted to literature and philology. In the history of aesthetics, his reputation rests on his Versuch einer critischen Dichtkunst vor die Deutschen (“Essay toward a Critical Poetics for the Germans,” 1730, with further editions in 1737, 1742, and 1751).

The practical aim of the Critical Poetics was to elevate the tone of German popular theater and moderate the Baroque excesses of the upper-class theater by recommending the model of the classical French theater of Racine and Corneille. The theoretical basis of the work was the Wolffian principle that the theater and other forms of poetry (Gottsched had little to say about the emerging medium of the novel) should be used to convey important moral truths through images that would make them accessible and engaging for a wide audience. Gottsched stated his position a year before the Critical Poetics in a speech with the anti-Platonic title “Plays and especially tragedies are not to be banished from a well-ordered republic” where he defined a tragedy as “an instructive moral poem, in which an important action of preeminent persons is imitated and presented on the stage” (Gottsched, Schriften, p. 5). He revealed the underlying premise of his argument when he observed that “The improvement of the human heart is not a work which can happen in an hour. It requires a thousand preparations, a thousand circumstances, much knowledge, conviction, experiences, examples and encouragement…” (Schriften, p. 9). A central theme of German Enlightenment aesthetics is that even if people know the general truths of morality in some abstract way, the arts can make those truths concrete, alive, and effective for them in a way that nothing else can. The Critical Poetics opens with a brief history of poetry rather than with a statement of theoretical principles, but its first chapter concludes with a similar suggestion that the point of poetry is to make moral truths alive through their presentation in a form accessible to our senses: “The arousal of affects is…much livelier” in tragedy and comedy than anywhere else, “because the visible representation of persons is far more sensibly touching than the best description. The manner of writing is, especially in tragedy, noble and sublime, and it has rather a superfluity than a lack of instructive sayings. Even comedy teaches and instructs the observer, although it arouses laughter” (Schriften, p. 33). The details of Gottsched's view emerge in the succeeding chapters on “The character of a poet” and “On the good taste of a poet.”

In the first of these chapters, Gottsched defines a poet as one who produces imitations of nature:

A poet is a skilled imitator of all natural things; and this he has in common with painters, connoisseurs of music, etc. He is however distinguished from these by the manner of his imitation and the means through which he achieves it. The painter imitates nature with brush and colors; the musician through beat and harmony; the poet, however, through a discourse that is rhythmic or otherwise well arranged; or, which is much the same, through a harmonious and good-sounding text, which we call a poem. (Schriften, p. 39)

Gottsched goes on to argue that a poet must have a sharp wit or acumen, a “power of mind which readily perceives the similarity of things and thus can make a comparison among them,” but also that such a “natural gift” is “in itself still raw and imperfect if it is not awaked and cleansed of the incorrectness that clings to it” (Schriften, p. 44).

For the wit of a poet to lead to good results, it must therefore be accompanied with “art and learning”: just as a painter must be learned in “geometry, perspective, mythology, history, architecture, even logic and morals if he is to bring [his work] to any perfection,” so the poet, “who also has to imitate the invisible thoughts and inclinations of human minds,” cannot accomplish this without “extensive scholarship,” indeed “no science is entirely excluded from his domain” (Schriften, p. 46). “Above all, for a true poet a thorough knowledge of humankind is necessary, indeed entirely indispensable”(Schriften, p. 48). Further, the poet must have a strong “power of judgment” in order to keep his imagination from overheating, because not all of his flashes of inspiration will be “equally beautiful, equally well-founded, equally natural and probable”(Schriften, p. 49). Moreover, a poet must have sound moral judgment, because his task is to make moral truths accessible to his audience through his imitations: “The duty to which he is obligated as an honest citizen is to praise what is virtuous in a rational way, to commemorate its memory and through the description of its worthy example to encourage those who live in his time and also posterity to praiseworthy deeds” (Schriften, p. 54). In other words, the artist has a double task of imitation: through the imitation of worthy deeds in the medium of his art, he is to encourage his audience to the performance of similarly worthy deeds themselves.

Thus far, Gottsched has not made special use of Wolffian terms. His ensuing discussion of the “good taste of a poet” is more explicitly Wolffian. Gottsched begins by characterizing taste in its literal sense — the taste of food or drink — as a form of representation “that for all of its clarity has nothing distinct in it.” He then states that in its “metaphorical” sense taste is always associated with the “liberal arts and other sensible things,” such as “poetry, oratory, music, painting, and architecture, likewise in dress, gardens, household furnishings, etc.,” not with subjects “where it is a matter of reason alone” and “where it is possible to make the strictest demonstrations from distinctly cognized fundamental truths,” such as “arithmetic and geometry or other sciences” (Schriften, pp. 60-1). Thus “metaphorical as well as ordinary taste has to do only with clear but not entirely distinct concepts of things, and distinguishes from one another the sort of things that one judged in accordance with mere sensation.” However, although it follows from the fact that judgments of taste are made on the basis of “clear but not entirely distinct concepts” that “people who judge merely on the basis of taste” can arrive at opposite conclusions, Gottsched holds that such opposed judgments cannot both be true, and that there must be a true fact of the matter to which one of them corresponds but the other not. In other words, although judgments of taste are made on the basis of clear but indistinct concepts, which is to say sensory perceptions and feelings rather than clear and distinct concepts, they nevertheless “have their ground in the unalterable nature of things themselves; in the concordance of the manifold; in order and harmony. These laws, which are investigated, discovered, and confirmed through lengthy experience and much reflection, are unbreakable and firm, even if someone who judges in accordance with his taste sometimes gives preference to those works which more or less violate them” (Schriften, pp. 62-3). In Gottsched's views, judgments of taste, even if they are not made on the basis of explicit knowledge of objective rules about the perfection of things, track those objective rules when they are in fact correct, and indeed experts in the relevant art can make those rules explicit. The “touchstone” for judgments of taste “is thus found in the rules for perfection that are suitable for every particular kind of beautiful things, whether buildings, paintings, music, etc., and which can be distinctly conceived and demonstrated by genuine masters thereof” (Schriften, pp. 64-5). Thus judgments of taste are not to be attributed to “wit, nor to imagination, nor to memory,” nor to any “sixth sense,” but to “understanding,” although not to “reason” (Schriften, pp. 63-4)), since these judgments track the rules that the experts know but are not explicitly derived from those rules.

And what are the rules in accordance with which judgments of taste are tacitly made? The most general rule is simply that art should imitate nature, so that in order to be beautiful art must imitate what is beautiful in nature. Poets in particular must give truthful but lively descriptions of “natural things,” and in the case of poetry destined for the theater they must give their characters “such words, gestures, and actions” as are “appropriate to their circumstances” (Schriften, p. 81). Gottsched does not interpret this rule to mean that poets can describe only the actual actions and feelings of actual people; of course poetry can present fables as well as history. But for Gottsched a fable is “an occurrence that is possible in certain circumstances although it has not actually taken place, in which a useful moral truth lies hidden. Philosophically one could say that it is a piece of another possible world” (Schriften, p. 86). Insofar as it does not recount an actual event a fable is “probable” rather than “true.” But for Gottsched probability depends upon the consistency of the fictional event with the actual laws of nature, in particular the laws of human nature, even though the circumstances of the fictional world differ in some regard from those of the actual world. In this regard even the fable must still be an imitation of nature with all its perfections. Of course Gottsched's rider that the fable must contain a hidden moral truth means that it must also be consistent with the real rules of moral perfection, and indeed that the point of poetic indulgence in fable or fiction is precisely to make a moral truth alive and forceful to us by showing that it holds even in a possible world that differs from the actual world in certain of its facts but not in its principles.

2.2 Bodmer and Breitinger

Gottsched's work became the subject of a “war of the poets,” with the Swiss writers Johann Jacob Bodmer and Johann Jacob Breitinger. Bodmer (1698-1783), originally a merchant, taught Swiss history in Zürich for forty years, advocated the works of Dante and Shakespeare, and translated Milton's Paradise Lost into German prose. Breitinger (1701-76) taught Greek, Hebrew, logic, and rhetoric, and edited the works of the German Baroque poet Martin Opitz. Together, they edited Die Discourse der Mahlern (“The Discourse of the Painters”), Switzerland's first “moral weekly” based on the model of The Spectator, from 1721-23. These essays did not concern painting at all or even general issues about the arts very much — the name merely reflects their use of the names of famous painters as pseudonymous signatures for their articles — although one of Bodmer's articles on Opitz celebrated the imagination as the key to poetic success: “A writer such as our Opitz who has enriched and filled the imagination with images of things can write poetry that is lively and natural” and by “the strength of his imagination bring back all the ideas that he had when he was really in love, empathetic, depressed, or enraged” (Die Discourse der Mahlern, Erster Theil, XIX Discourse, cited from Dichtungstheorien der Aufklärung, p. 13).

The emphasis on the imagination seems to have been the central issue in Bodmer and Breitinger's dispute with Gottsched, which came to a head in Breitinger's own Critische Dichtkunst, published in 1740 with a forward by Bodmer. Because they shared with Gottsched the general assumption that art is based on the imitation of nature and has the goal of making important moral truths come alive for us, it is hard to see exactly what divided the two sides in this dispute, but the key seems to lie in their conception of poetic fables. As we saw, Gottsched believed that a poetic fable describes events in a possible rather than in the actual world, but he insists that the laws of nature and human nature must remain constant: thus a poetic fable can depict a hero who never existed, and make some moral truth alive to us through its depiction of this possible rather than actual hero, but everything about this hero and his world should still be natural. Bodmer and Breitinger, however, as advocates of Shakespeare and Milton, believed that important moral truths could be made alive to us through works of the poetic imagination that depart more drastically from actual nature and history. They held that novelty is an especially powerful source of aesthetic pleasure and thus an especially powerful means of making moral truths come alive, and for this reason they concluded that “since the most ancient times” the fable has been the means “for bringing the most useful but at the same time best known moral truths home to us in a pleasing way”(Breitinger, Critische Dichtkunst, cited from Dichtungstheorien der Aufklärung, p. 42). Their idea is that the more imaginative inventions of the poets — the Satan of Milton or the Caliban of Shakespeare rather than the more ordinary heroes of Racine and Corneille admired by Gottsched — make moral truths appear more alive precisely by their attention-grabbing departure from the familiar creatures of the real world. Thus Bodmer and Breitinger thought that the moralistic aim of poetry that they accepted in common with Gottsched could be better achieved by a freer use of the imagination in poetry than Gottsched was prepared to allow. They agreed in their philosophical analysis of the ends of art but disagreed in their empirical assessment of its most effective means.

By their advocacy of Milton and Shakespeare, the most imaginative poets of the preceding century, Bodmer and Breitinger prepared the way for subsequent artistic movements that emphasized the freedom of the imagination, even while they continued to work within the conceptual framework of Wolffian perfectionism. The same is true for two professional philosophers of the time who also worked within the Wolffian framework but took at least one step towards an aesthetic theory that could subsequently give the play of the mental powers equal importance with the sensible representation of truth by treating the aesthetic qualities of representations as parallel to rather than identical with their purely cognitive qualities. So let us now turn to the innovations of Alexander Gottlieb Baumgarten and his disciple and ally, Georg Friedrich Meier. Meier actually responded directly to Gottsched in a number of polemics, but since his views were based largely — although not entirely — on Baumgarten's, it will be better to treat them together than to treat Meier now.

3. Baumgarten and Meier: Aesthetics as the Analogue of Rational Cognition

Alexander Gottlieb Baumgarten (1714-1762), as previously mentioned, introduced the term “aesthetics” in his 1735 thesis Meditationes philosophicae de nonnullis ad poema pertinentibus (“Philosophical meditations pertaining to some matters concerning poetry”). Baumgarten's new name for the discipline did not, however, signify a complete break with earlier philosophical views , that is, with the perfectionist aesthetics of Leibniz and Wolff. By introducing the concept of “analogue of reason” Baumgarten did however make one key departure from the Wolffian model that would eventually open the way for much more radical reconceptions of aesthetic experience in Germany. But Baumgarten remained more a Moses who glimpsed the new theory from the shores of Wolffianism than a Joshua who conquered the new aesthetic territory.

3.1 Baumgarten

Baumgarten was the son of a Pietist minister from Berlin, but was orphaned by the time he was eight. He followed his older brother Jacob Sigismund (who would become a prominent theologian and historian of religion) to Halle when he was thirteen years old. The Baumgartens thus arrived in Halle just after Wolff had been expelled and the study of his philosophy banned, although the ban was less strictly enforced at the famous Pietist orphanage and school in Halle where they went first than at the university. The younger Baumgarten started at the university at sixteen (in 1730), and studied theology, philology, poetry, rhetoric, and philosophy, especially Leibniz, whose philosophy was not banned. He began teaching there himself in 1735, upon the acceptance of his thesis on poetry, and published his Metaphysics in 1739. In 1740, the same year as he published his Ethics, he was called to a professorship — or more precisely, ordered to accept it — at another Prussian university, in Frankfurt an der Oder. Georg Friedrich Meier (1718-1777), who had been studying with Baumgarten, took over his classes and was himself appointed professor at Halle in 1746.

Having published the textbooks for his metaphysics and ethics classes (which Kant would still use decades later), Baumgarten then returned to aesthetics, and began working on a major treatise in 1742. The first volume of his Aesthetica appeared in 1750. It was written in Latin, like Baumgarten's other works, and was the first work ever to use the name of the new discipline as a title. The next year, however, Baumgarten's health began to decline, and a second volume of the Aesthetica came out only in 1758, under pressure from the publisher. The two volumes cover just under a third of Baumgarten's original plan, although they may have included the most original part of the plan. Meanwhile, Meier had been publishing profusely in Halle since the early 1740s, with works in or relevant to aesthetics including a Theoretical Doctrine of the Emotions in 1744, a twenty-five part Evaluation of Gottsched's Poetics collected in book form in 1747, a three-volume Foundations of the Beautiful Sciences from 1748-1750, and a condensation of the latter, the Extract from the Foundations of the Beautiful Arts and Sciences in 1757. (Meier also published massive textbooks in logic, metaphysics, and ethics, as well as a memoir of Baumgarten and a German translation of Baumgarten's Latin Metaphysics). Although Meier thus published his main treatise in aesthetics before Baumgarten did, he claimed it was based on Baumgarten's lectures, and always presented himself as a disciple of Baumgarten — although we will see that one significant difference between their views emerged after Baumgarten left Halle.

Baumgarten's Meditations on Poetry conclude with his famous introduction of the term “aesthetics”: “The Greek philosophers and the Church fathers have always carefully distinguished between the aistheta and the noeta,” that is, between objects of sense and objects of thought, and while the latter, that is, “what can be cognized through the higher faculty” of mind, are “the object of logic, the aistheta are the subject of the episteme aisthetike or AESTHETICS,” the science of perception (Meditationes, §CXVI, p. 86). But this work says nothing about in what way the new discipline might be a general science of perception, and analyzes only the nature of poetry and our experience of it. We will first see what is novel in Baumgarten's theory of poetry, and then turn to his larger work to see what it suggests about the general character of the new discipline. Baumgarten begins the work with a series of definitions, defining “discourse” as a “series of words that bring to mind [intelligimus] connected representations,” “sensible representations” as ones “received through the lower part of the cognitive faculty,” “sensible discourse” as a “discourse of sensible representations,” and finally a “poem” as a “perfect sensible discourse.” The parts of sensible discourse are “(1) sensible representations, (2) their interconnections, and (3) the words, or the articulate sounds which are represented by the letters and which symbolize the words,” and sensible discourse is “directed toward the apprehension of sensible discourse”(Meditationes, §§I-IX, pp. 6-10). The key thoughts in this series of definitions is that poetry is aimed not just at conveying truth, but at conveying it by means of “sensible representations,” or imagery drawn from the senses, and that the “perfection” of a poem may lie in both its medium, that is, the words its uses, and the imagery it arouses, and indeed in the relationship between these two dimensions. Thus Baumgarten introduces the idea that the sensible imagery a work of art arouses is not just a medium, more or less perfect, for conveying truth, but a locus of perfection in its own right. This is a view that was barely hinted at by Wolff, and not at all in his discussion of imitation as the perfection of mimetic arts, but only in his discussion of mixed arts like architecture, where he took into account the appearance as well as the function of structural elements.

As he continues Baumgarten remains within the Wolffian framework by defining sensible representations as clear rather than obscure — thus he rejects poetry that aims at obscurity for its own sake (Meditationes, §XIII, p. 14) — but confused rather than distinct, and thus as conveying more representations packed together rather than fewer that are neatly separated. Or as he puts it, poems aim for extensive rather than intensive clarity, conveying more rather than less information but without separating the images from each other, as would be aimed for in scientific or “logical” discourse (Meditationes, §§XVI-XVII, p. 16). And since individuals are more fully determined, or more fully characterized, than any abstraction, “particular representations are in the highest degree poetic” (Meditationes, §XIX, p. 18): poetry achieves its goal of arousing a density of images by portraying individuals in particular circumstances rather than by trafficking in generalities and abstractions. Thus Baumgarten turns what is a vice in scientific knowledge — connoting too many ideas without clearly distinguishing among them — into the paradigm virtue of poetry.

What is particularly striking is that he then uses what we might call this quantitative conception of the aim of poetry, that it arouse more and denser rather than fewer and more clearly separated images, as the basis for an argument that poetry should be emotionally affecting. First he argues that poetry aims to arouse our affects or engage our emotions simply because they are sensible: “Since affects are more notable degrees of pain and pleasure, their sensible representations are given in representing something to oneself confusedly as good or bad, and thus they determine poetic representations, and to arouse affects is poetic” (Meditationes, §XXV, p. 24). But then he goes on to give an explicitly quantitative argument for this conclusion:

The same can be demonstrated by this reasoning also: we represent more in those things which we represent as good and bad for us than if we do not so represent them; therefore representations of things which are confusedly exhibited as good or bad for us are extensively clearer than if they were not so displayed, hence they are more poetic. Now such representations are motions of the affects, hence to arouse affects is poetic. (Meditationes, §XXVI, pp. 24-6)

Baumgarten thus arrives at a very traditional conception of the aims of poetry or art more generally by means of a very unconventional argument. In this way he innovates within the formal structure of Wolffian philosophy in order to accommodate a view of the aims of art that is not itself innovative. This aspect of Baumgarten's early poetics clearly impressed his student Meier, who devoted one of his earliest books to a Theoretical Doctrine of the Emotions, or “Gemüthsbewegungen,” literally, “movements of the mind.” Meier states that “Aesthetics is in general the science of sensible cognition. This science concerns itself with everything that can be assigned in more detail to sensible cognition and to its presentation. Now since the passions have a strong influence on sensible cognition and its presentation, aesthetics for its part can rightly demand a theory of the emotions” (Meier, Theoretische Lehre der Gemüthsbewegungen, §7, p. 7). However, since Baumgarten himself does not give as much emphasis to the emotional aspect of the experience of art in his Aesthetica as his earlier Meditations might lead us to expect, we will return to Meier's development of this theme only after we have considered Baumgarten's mature work.

Before we can turn to the Aesthetica, however, we must look at some of the key definitions Baumgarten lays down in the chapter on “Empirical Psychology” in his Metaphysics. Baumgarten begins by defining the “inferior” or “lower faculty of cognition” as that which works with sensible representations, which are in turn “indistinct, that is, obscure or confused” (Metaphysik, §§382-3, pp. 115-16). Sensible representations can be developed in either of two ways, however: either with increasing clarity of their component “marks,” in which case they acquire “greater clarity (claritas intensive maior),” or with increasing “multitude of marks,” in which case they acquire ”liveliness (vividitas, claritas extensive maior, cogitationum nitor)” (Nitor means brightness or splendor).” The former development of cognition leads to proofs, while what makes a perception lively is a “painterly” form of clarity (eine malende), thus one that consists in richness of imagery rather than analytical clarity (Metaphysik, §393, p. 119). It is this liveliness rather than probative clarity which is the basis of aesthetic experience.

Baumgarten then defines judgment as the representation of the perfection or imperfection of things. Judgment is initially divided into “practical” judgment, the object of which is “things foreseen,” and “theoretical judgment,” which concerns everything else (Metaphysik, §451, p. 139). Theoretical judgment is in turn divided into that which is distinct and that which is rather sensible, and the “ability to judge sensibly is taste in the broad,” that is, aesthetic sense. So taste is the ability to judge perfections and imperfections sensibly rather than intellectually. Perfections and imperfections, it should be noted, are defined entirely formally as the “agreement or disagreement” of the “manifold of a thing” (Metaphysik, §452, p. 139). Next, Baumgarten divides the sensible representation or judgment of perfections and imperfections into the “intuitive” and the “symbolic,” that is, those which consist in sensible properties directly and those which consist in sensible properties taken as symbols of something else, and then adds that the sensible cognition of a perfection is pleasing and that of its imperfection displeasing. If I have sensible cognition neither of an object's perfection nor its imperfection, then it is indifferent to me (Metaphysik, §478, p. 150). Finally, Baumgarten states that beauty is perfection perceived by means of the senses rather than by the pure intellect (Metaphysik, §488, pp. 154-5).

Thus far, then, Baumgarten has remained within the conceptual framework of Wolff. One key addition to Wolff that he makes in the Metaphysics, however, is the concept of the analogon rationis, the “analogue of reason.” He writes:

I cognize the interconnection of some things distinctly, and of others indistinctly, consequently I have the faculty for both. Consequently I have an understanding, for insight into the connections of things, that is, reason (ratio); and a faculty for indistinct insight into the connections of things, which consists of the following: 1) the sensible faculty for insight into the concordances among things, thus sensible wit; 2) the sensible faculty for cognizing the differences among things, thus sensible acumen; 3) sensible memory; 4) the faculty of invention; 5) the faculty of sensible judgment and taste together with the judgment of the senses; 6) the expectation of similar cases; and 7) the faculty of sensible designation. All of these lower faculties of cognition, in so far as they represent the connections among things, and in this respect are similar to reason, comprise that which is similar to reason (analogon rationis), or the sum of all the cognitive faculties that represent the connections among things indistinctly. (Metaphysik, §468, p. 146)

Baumgarten's departure from Wolff here may be subtle, but his idea is that the use of a broad range of our mental capacities for dealing with sensory representations and imagery is not an inferior and provisional substitute for reason and its logical and scientific analysis, but something parallel to reason. Moreover, this complex of human mental powers is productive of pleasure, through the sensible representation of perfection, in its own right.

The potential of this idea finally begins to emerge in the Aesthetica. Taking up where the Meditations had left off, Baumgarten begins the “Prolegomena” of this work with his famous definition of aesthetics: “Aesthetics (the theory of the liberal arts, the logic of the lower capacities of cognition [gnoseologia inferior], the art of thinking beautifully, the art of the analogon rationis) is the science of sensible cognition” (Aesthetica, §1, p. 107). Baumgarten's list of synonyms may be confusing, for it includes both traditional and novel designations of his subject matter. He explains in the preface to the second edition of the Metaphysics that he “adds synonymous designations from other authors in parentheses alongside [his own] defining expressions so that the latter might more easily be understood” (Vorreden zur Metaphysik, p. 43). Yet it is clear that he means his own new science to be broader in scope than some of the more traditional definitions he brackets: he intends to provide a general science of sensible cognition rather than just a theory of the fine arts or our taste for them. Although Baumgarten makes some broad claims for the new science, this is not where the novelty of the Aesthetica lies, for at least in the extant part of the work Baumgarten never actually develops this theme. Instead, the innovation comes at the beginning of the first chapter of the work, when Baumgarten writes that “The aim of aesthetics is the perfection of sensible cognition as such, that is, beauty, while its imperfection as such, that is, ugliness, is to be avoided” (Aesthetica, §14; Schweizer, p. 115).

Baumgarten's departure from Wolff's formula that beauty is the sensitive cognition of perfection may easily be overlooked, but in his transformation of that into his own formula that beauty is the perfection of sensitive cognition he is saying that beauty lies not — or as his subsequent practice suggests, not just — in the representation of some objective perfection in a form accessible to our senses, but rather — or also — in the exploitation of the specific possibilities of sensible representation for their own sake. In other words, there is potential for beauty in the form of a work as well as in its content because its form can be pleasing to our complex capacity for sensible representation —the analogon rationis — just as its content can be pleasing to our theoretical or practical reason itself. The satisfaction of those mental powers summed up in the analogon rationis is a source of pleasure in its own right.

What does this mean in practice? Baumgarten's recognition of the perfection of sensible cognition as well as the perfection of what is represented as a distinct source of pleasure in beauty leads him to recognize not just one but in fact three different potential sources of beauty in a work of art: “the harmony of the thoughts insofar as we abstract from their order and their signs,” or means of expression; “the harmony of the order in which we meditate upon the beautifully thought content,” and “the harmony of the signs” or means of expression “among themselves and with the content and the order of the content” (Aesthetica, §§18-20; Schweizer, pp. 116-117). Here Baumgarten is importing the traditional rhetorical concepts of inventio, dispositio and elocutio into his system, and conceiving of the latter two, the harmony of the thoughts and the harmony of the expression with the thoughts, as the dimensions in which the potentials for pleasure within our distinctively sensible manner of representing and thinking are realized. He thus recognizes those aspects of works of art, which were touched upon only in passing by Wolff and Gottsched, as sources of pleasure internal to works of art that are equally significant with the pleasure that arises from the content of works, considered as representations of perfections outside of the works themselves. The three main sections of Baumgarten's planned project, the “heuristic,” “methodology,” and “semiotics” were intended to cover these three sources of pleasure in works of art. (see Aesthetica, §13; Schweizer, pp. 112-13).

As it happened, Baumgarten was not quite able to complete the first of these three parts. Even the material he did complete suggests that he may have been more successful in making conceptual space for the appreciation of the particularly sensible aspects of art than in substantively changing how art is actually experienced. What Baumgarten does is to take a list of the categories of the perfections of the content of logical or scientific cognition and construct a parallel list by adding the adjective “sensible” to them to arrive at a list of sensible or aesthetic perfections (and Meier makes a similar addition to lists of the perfections of the organization and expression of scientific knowledge). Nevertheless, some of Baumgarten's categories of aesthetic qualities are important. The list of the perfections of every kind of cognition that Baumgarten gives in the first chapter of the Aesthetica is “wealth, magnitude, truth, clarity, and liveliness” (ubertas, magnitudo, veritas, claritas, certitudo et vita cognitionis), and thus beauty consists in the aesthetic versions of these perfections (Aesthetica, §§22-25; Schweizer, pp. 118-21).

However, in his classroom lectures on the Aesthetica, Baumgarten particularly emphasized the moral magnitude of the subject matter of works of art as a major source of our pleasure in them, and there mentions that works of art will therefore be touching. Baumgarten stressed that the moral content of a work of art is only one source of beauty, and that a work of art can be beautiful without any moral grandeur. “[A]esthetic dignity,” he claimed, “belongs to aesthetic magnitude as a part to the whole,” but if a work of art represents moral agents then it cannot be maximally beautiful without representing moral dignity, and it certainly cannot be beautiful if it conveys an attitude contrary to morality. What is important here, finally, is the moral standing of what is contained in the work of art, not the actual morality of the artist himself.

3.2. Meier

Baumgarten did not develop his comment that art must be touching, but this became central to Meier's aesthetics. In his early work on the emotions, Meier emphasized that aesthetics should deal with the passions because they have a “strong influence on sensible cognition.” His position is not just that the passions have influence on sensible cognition, but that they are themselves a great source of sensible pleasure, and that it is therefore part of the aim of art to arouse them. Meier analyzes the passions, in spite of their name (the German term Leidenschaft, like the Latin passio, etymologically means something that happens to someone rather than something that one does, an actio), as a form of mental activity: they are “efforts or strivings of the soul” that result in a desire or an aversion, more precisely particularly strong and firm desires or aversions (Meier, Gemüthsbewegungen, §27, p. 30). This might lead one to expect that desires and aversions can be sources of great pleasure or displeasure, depending upon whether they are realized or not, but Meier goes on to argue that “all emotions, the disagreeable ones not excluded, produce a gratification,” because they are active states or perfections of the soul, and “whenever the soul feels a perfection in itself, it is sensitive of a gratification.” And because they are so strong, the passions, whether desires or aversions, are those among our mental states that make us most aware of our own mental activity, and therefore are actually the strongest source of pleasure for us: “in the passions almost the entire lower power of cognition and desire is engaged, that is, almost the entire lower part of our soul. Thus in the emotions the soul is sensitive of the strength of its powers, that is, of its perfection.” It must therefore necessarily be gratified with its own strength. It must be joyous when it feels as much as it can” (Gemüthsbewegungen, §89, p. 124). In another essay Meier identifies this feeling of joy at the activity of our own soul with the category of the “life of cognition,” and thus makes it a central source of our pleasure in art. “ Living cognition becomes alive through the sensible representations. The lower powers of the soul, the desires and aversions, constitute the life of a cognition. Everything that leaves our powers in peace when we cognize it is a dead cognition” (Meier, “Daß das Wesen der Dichtkunst in unserer Natur gegründet ist” (“That the essence of poetry is grounded in our nature”), in Meier, Frühe Schriften, Part 3, pp. 160-4, at p. 162.). Art aims for the opposite. Indeed, Meier continues that it is by arousing our passions that art achieves its goal of a clear but confused, that is, manifold but densely packed, cognition. For Meier, moving our emotions is not just some small part of the beauty of art, as Baumgarten seems to suggest. Instead, the arousal of our emotions, even ones that considered by themselves should be disagreeable, is the strongest source of the pleasure at which art aims because it is the most intense form of mental activity.

With this emphasis on the arousal of emotions, Meier connected the austere aesthetics of Wolff and Baumgarten with the passionate aesthetics of the French Abbé Du Bos . With his connection of the pleasure in experiencing emotions to the pleasure of experiencing mental activity as such he brought Wolffian aesthetics a step closer to contemporary British aesthetics. Meier thereby prepared the way for the tremendous influence that British aesthetics would have in Germany by the end of the 1750s. But while Meier stressed the activity of the mind, neither he nor Baumgarten were ready to introduce the idea of the free play of our mental powers as the fundamental source of our pleasure in aesthetic experience. Baumgarten mentions play once, but only to recommend that children be allowed to play in order to develop their cognitive powers, not as the fundamental source of mature aesthetic pleasure (Poppe, §55, p. 102). Baumgarten also at least once characterizes the mental state of aesthetic experience as a form of harmony: he says that the “aestheticodogmatic” thinker (by which he means a thinker aiming to express a true doctrine aesthetically ) “should in his striving for truth put that before the eyes of his audience the truth of which he has known with certitude and which can be represented in its aesthetic truth on the basis of the harmony between the upper and lower faculties of cognition” ( Aesthetica, §573; Schweizer, pp. 254-5). The occurrence of this comment in the context of Baumgarten's discussion of aesthetic truth (or of how truths can be presented in ways agreeable to the senses) thereby makes clear that with this reference to “harmony” between the lower and upper faculties of cognition he is far from introducing the idea of a free play between them. That idea would be decisively introduced into German aesthetics only with Kant's unique synthesis of the preceding German tradition with the British tradition. Before that was to happen, however, the ideas, more Meier's than Baumgarten's, that art aims at arousing our emotions and at the pleasurable activity of the mind, and at the former as an instance of the latter, would be further developed by an intervening generation of German thinkers. Let us now turn to some of those.

4. Mendelssohn, Winckelmann, and Lessing: Mixed Emotions

4.1. Mendelssohn

In a review of Meier's 1757 Extract from the Foundations of all fine Arts and Sciences, Moses Mendelssohn (1729-86) rejected what he took to be the excessively abstract and a priori method of Baumgarten and Meier, writing that:

Just as little as the philosopher can discover the appearances of nature, without examples from experience, merely through a priori inferences, so little can he establish appearances in the beautiful world, if one can thus express oneself, without diligent observations. The securest path of all, just as in the theory of nature, is this: One must assume certain experiences, explain their ground through an hypothesis, then test this hypothesis against experiences from a quite different species, and only assume those hypotheses to be general principles which have thus held their ground; one must finally seek to explain these principles in the theory of nature through the nature of bodies and motion, but in aesthetics through the nature of the lower powers of our soul. (Review of Meier, pp. 197-8)

Yet the reference to the “lower powers of the soul” in the final line of the quotation suggests that Mendelssohn will continue to work within the general paradigm of Wolffian philosophy himself. He certainly does, but what he aims to do is to show that the perfections that can be realized in aesthetic experience are both more positive and more complicated than those recognized by Baumgarten. Mendelssohn's method allows him to recognize that all of our aesthetic experiences draw on a range of mental and even physical resources, and that because of this many aesthetic experiences can be understood only as “mixed” rather than simple feelings. Mendelssohn's analysis of the complexity of aesthetic experience places more emphasis on the powers of mind and body involved in such experience than on the objective perfections that art may represent or nature contain. His account further prepares the ground for the full-blown theory of aesthetic experience as based in a play of our powers that will subsequently be achieved by Kant and Schiller. But in his emphasis on the role of the body as well as the mind in aesthetic experience, Mendelssohn goes beyond his successors.

Mendelssohn followed his rabbi from Dessau to Berlin at the age of fourteen. At twenty-one, he became a tutor in the home of a Jewish silk manufacturer, at twenty-five his accountant, subsequently his manager, and finally a partner in the business, in which he would work full-time for the rest of his life. But by twenty-five Mendelssohn had also mastered not only literary German but Greek, Latin, French, and English as well as a vast range of literature and philosophy in all those languages . He had also become friends with the critic and playwright Gotthold Ephraim Lessing and the writer and publisher Friedrich Nicolai, and begun an active publishing career. In 1755, before he turned twenty-six, Mendelssohn published Philosophical Dialogues on the model of Shaftesbury, On Sentiments, and, with Lessing, Pope, a Metaphysician! The next year he published Thoughts on Probability and a translation of Rousseau's second discourse On the Origins of Inequality. From 1756 to 1759 he collaborated with Lessing and Nicolai on the Library of Fine Sciences and Liberal Arts, for which he wrote two dozen reviews of new works in aesthetics and literature, and from 1759 to 1765 he contributed nearly one hundred reviews to Nicolai's Letters concerning the newest Literature, discussing works not only in aesthetics and literature but also metaphysics, mathematics, natural science, and politics (Gesammelte Schriften, vol. 5.1 (1991), pp. 5-676). In 1761 he published the first edition of his Philosophical Writings, mostly on aesthetics, and in 1763 he took first place in a Prussian Academy of Sciences essay competition for an essay on Evidence in Metaphysical Sciences, beating out the entry by Kant. But as a Jew, he was denied entrance to the Academy by the “enlightened” Frederick the Great, even though he had the strong support of its members. In 1767, Mendelssohn published Phaedo: or on the Immortality of the Soul, loosely based on Plato's dialogue of the same name, an immensely popular work. In the 1770s, after the onset of a “nervous debility” that he would henceforth claim prevented him from serious philosophical work, Mendelssohn began a translation of the Pentatuech and Psalms into modern German (but printed in Hebrew characters) that he hoped would preserve the Jewish religion while simultaneously facilitating the assimilation of Jews into German culture and society . His masterpiece Jerusalem, or on Religious Power and Judaism, in which he argued for the civil rights of the Jews by arguing that the state had no right to recognize any religion at all and therefore must allow all religions freedom from interference, was published in 1783. In 1785, he returned to philosophy one last time with Morning Lessons, a magisterial summary of his own version of Wolffianism. By this time, however, he was caught up in a strenuous controversy with the fideist philosopher Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi over whether his lifelong friend Lessing had been a Spinozist . In the midst of this controversy he died of a stroke in January, 1786, at the age of fifty-six.

Mendelssohn worked within the framework of Wolffian metaphysics and psychology, and thus he accepted the definition of sensible perception as clear but confused cognition. He accepted Wolff's explanation that pleasure arises in the sensible perception of perfection, but also Baumgarten's transformation of that formula into the explanation of beauty as the perfection of sensible cognition: in Mendelssohn's terms, “the essence of the fine arts and sciences consists in an artful, sensibly perfect representation or in a sensible perfection represented by art” (“On the Main Principles of the Fine Arts and Sciences” (1757), Philosophical Writings, pp. 172-3). But Mendelssohn vigorously rejected any interpretation of the Wolffian premise according to which the confusion of sensible perception itself could be the source of our pleasure in it. For Mendelssohn, any “pure gratification of the soul must be grounded in the positive powers of our soul and not in its incapacity, not in the limitation of those original powers” (On Sentiments, Fourth Letter; Philosophical Writings, p. 19). Further, “neither fully distinct nor fully obscure concepts are compatible with the feeling of beauty,” for what is required is that an object offers enough “extensive clarity,” that is, richness and variety, to stimulate us, but enough unity so that we can easily take it in as a whole (On Sentiments, Third Letter, Philosophical Writings, pp. 14-15). Mendelssohn's explicit thesis is that while the parts of an object must be distinct enough to allow one to have a sense of their variety but dense enough to allow one to grasp them together with equilibrium and proportion, it is the latter that is the source of our pleasure; but it does not seem a stretch to read him as also suggesting that it is the play of the mind back and forth between its perception of the parts and its grasp of the whole that is pleasant. In this case he would at least be pointing toward the idea that the source of pleasure in beauty is the free play of the mental powers.

While rejecting any interpretation of obscurity or confusion as itself the source of our pleasure in beauty (On Sentiments, note h; Philosophical Writings, p. 79), Mendelssohn also rejects the idea of the Abbé Du Bos (and of Meier's theory of the emotions) that it is the mere arousal of feelings as such that is the aim of art (On Sentiments, Conclusion; Philosophical Writings, p. 71), as well as the idea of Charles Batteux that “the imitation of nature is the general means by which the fine arts please us, and [that] it is possible to derive all particular rules of the fine arts and sciences from this single principle” ("On the Main Principles of the Fine Arts and Sciences"; Philosophical Writings, p. 170.). Yet Mendelssohn no more rejects the idea that works of art do arouse our emotions and that they are, at least in many cases, imitations of nature than he rejects the idea that the perception of perfection and the perfection of perception is central to our experience of beauty and other aesthetic properties. So how does he fit all of these ideas together into his own distinctive theory?

Mendelssohn never presented his aesthetic theory in a full-length treatise. His most systematic presentation, the 1757 essay “On the Main Principles of the Fine Arts and Sciences,” discusses only three out of the four axes of potential perfection that he finds in the complete aesthetic experience . We therefore need to supplement what we can glean from this essay with suggestions from On Sentiments and the Rhapsody, or addition to the Letters on Sentiments that he added to his 1761 collection. The four axes that Mendelssohn identifies are the perfection in the object of the aesthetic experience, typically the perfection of what is depicted by a work of art but not always, since some arts, such as music and architecture, and all of nature are not mimetic at all; the perfection of our own perceptual capacities in the experience of an object, the “perfection of sensible cognition” that he adopted from Baumgarten; the perfection of our bodily condition that can be produced through the effect of our mental condition on our body, a dimension lacking from all previous accounts in the German rationalist tradition but perhaps inspired by Mendelssohn's acquaintance with Edmund Burke's account of the physiology of our feelings of the beautiful and the sublime; and finally, the perfection of the artistry that has gone into the production of an object, whether human artistry in the case of a work of art or divine artistry in the case of the beauties of nature. Perfection along any of these axes is a potential source of pleasure in the experience of an object, and the effect of these sources of pleasure can be additive, each increasing our pleasure in the same object. But these multiple dimensions to our pleasure in objects also create the possibility of the “mixed emotions” that we experience in the artistic representation of unpleasant or tragic objects, because in those cases our pleasure in the mental activity stimulated by the work of art, the pleasant effect of that on the body, and our admiration of the artistry that has gone into the object can outweigh any pain associated with the depicted content of the work.

Mendelssohn's characterization of the intrinsic perfection of objects in nature and thus of the objects depicted in representational art follows in the path already marked out by Wolff: the perfection of an object lies in the order, symmetry, and rational coherence of its parts, and its beauty lies in that perfection insofar as it can be grasped in sensible cognition. Thus in On Sentiments Mendelssohn writes that we “call the structure of the world beautiful in the proper sense of the term when the imagination orders its chief parts in as splendid a symmetry as that of the order that reason and perception teach us that they possess outside us” (On Sentiments, Third Letter; Philosophical Writings, p. 15.) . In the case of natural objects, this order is comprised by both the internal organization of an object to suit its overall goal and the part that the particular object plays in nature as a whole. In the “Main Principles,” Mendelssohn goes beyond this formalistic characterization of perfection and offers a more concrete list of the kinds of things that count as perfections in objects, whether objects in nature enjoyed in their own right or objects in nature enjoyed through the artistic depiction of them, which provide “the first level of satisfaction and dissatisfaction which alternately accompany all our representations.” Here he says that

Everything capable of being represented to the senses as a perfection could also present an object of beauty. Belonging here are all the perfections of external forms, that is, the lines, surfaces, and bodies and their movements and changes; the harmony of the multiple sounds and colors; the order in the parts of a whole, their similarity, variety, and harmony; their transposition and transformation into other forms; all the capabilities of our soul, all the skills of our body. Even the perfections of our external state (under which honor, comfort, and riches are to be understood) cannot be excepted from this if they are fit to be represented in a way that is apparent to the senses. (“Main Principles”: Philosophical Writings, p. 172)

When Mendelssohn refers to the capabilities of our soul and the skills of our body here, he is referring to them as objects for depiction or description in a work of art, thus as part of the content of works of art. This is how he fits into his model the representation of human intentions, actions, and responses to them, which are the subject matter of most mimetic art.

The next axis of perfection that Mendelssohn considers is the state of our mind in response to perfection or imperfection in a real or represented object. His clearest treatment of this may come in the Rhapsody, which begins by taking up the question of how we can be “powerfully attracted to the representation” of something unpleasant. Mendelssohn answers this question this by saying that

Each individual representation stands in a twofold relation. It is related, at once, to the matter before it as its object (of which it is a picture or copy) and then to the soul or the thinking subject (of which it constitutes a determination). As a determination of the soul, many a representation can have something pleasant about it although, as a picture of the object, it is accompanied by disapproval and a feeling of repugnance. (Rhapsody; Philosophical Writings, p. 132)

Several points about this passage need comment. First, while by “representation” (Vorstellung) here, Mendelssohn means a mental state that represents something other than itself and not an external object such as a painting or a poem that depicts or describes something, a mental representation can of course indirectly represent an external object that is not directly present to it but is indirectly presented to it by an external representation such as a painting or a poem which is its direct external object, and that is indeed how artistic representation typically works. Second, while Mendelssohn here refers to a mental representation as a “determination” (Bestimmung) or property of the mind, his further discussion suggests that he is actually thinking of representation as a kind of mental activity, an activity involving our capacities for both knowing and desiring, and that we enjoy representation because we enjoy mental activity. Thus he continues that while “elements of perfection” in a thing are “satisfying and comfortable to us” while “elements of imperfection…are perceived with dissatisfaction,”

In relation to the thinking subject, the soul, on the other hand, perceiving and cognizing the features as well as testifying to enjoying them or not constitutes something actual [Sachliches] that is posited in the soul, an affirmative determination of the soul. Hence every representation, at least in relation to the subject, as an affirmative predicate of the thinking entity, must have something about it that we like. For even the picture of the deficiency of the object, just like the expression of discontent with it, are not deficiencies on the part of the thinking entity, but rather affirmative and actual determinations of it….considered as a representation, a picture within us that engages the soul's capacities of knowing and desiring, the representation of what is evil is itself an element of the soul's perfection and brings with it something quite pleasant that we by no means would prefer not to feel than to feel. (Rhapsody; Philosophical Writings, pp. 133-4)

It is striking how Mendelssohn writes here in gerundives and infinitives rather than in substantives in order to convey a sense of mental activity: recognizing and approving or even disapproving are actions of the mind in knowing and desiring. We enjoy that mental activity, even when it is stimulated by the representation of something of which we disapprove, and we enjoy the representation even of something evil as long as our pleasure in the activity of representing is not overwhelmed by disapproval of the object of the representation.

The contrast between perfection or imperfection in the content of a representation and the enjoyable activity of the mind in representing that content is the heart of Mendelssohn's theory, so we can interrupt our catalogue of all four of the axes of perfection that he recognizes for some comments on this contrast. The first thing to be noticed is that Mendelssohn here emphasizes the engagement of our powers of both knowing and desiring in aesthetic experience, not merely the power of knowing. This gives him room to add an emphasis on our enjoyment of the arousal of our emotions to Baumgarten's emphasis on our enjoyment of the perfection of sensible cognition. Now, as we saw, Baumgarten in fact made room for this dimension of aesthetic experience in his early Meditations on Poetry, even though he did not take it up again in the Aesthetica, and Meier emphasized it in several of his works. But Mendelssohn adds a crucial point here, leading to a fundamental revision in the significance of artistic imitation: in order for us to enjoy the mixed emotions in a pleasing representation of something that is objectively displeasing, our sense of the difference between the represented content and our act of representing it cannot be allowed to collapse, and the rôle of artistic imitation is precisely to create enough distance between our representation and its object to allow us to enjoy the representation rather than to collapse that space by creating the illusion that we are in the actual presence of the depicted object. Mendelssohn writes, “If the objects gets too close to us, if we regard it as a part of us or even as ourselves, the pleasant character of the representation completely disappears, and the relation to the subject immediately becomes an unpleasant relation to us since here subject and object collapse, as it were, into one another” (Rhapsody; Philosophical Writings, p. 134). He then says that a “means of rendering the most terrifying events pleasant to gentle minds is the imitation by art, on the stage, on the canvas, and in marble, since an inner consciousness that we have an imitation and nothing genuine before our eyes moderates the strength of the objective disgust and, as it were, elevates the subjective side of the representation” (Rhapsody; Philosophical Writings, p. 138). Thus, contrary to Wolff, Mendelssohn does not suppose that what we enjoy in imitation is accuracy of representation taken to the point of illusion, but rather the room for the experience of our own mental activity that the knowledge that the depicted object is only being imitated allows.

In fact, Mendelssohn's analysis of our mixed emotions in the experience of tragedy is even more subtle than this, for a further aspect of it is that our knowledge that we are experiencing represented rather than real people allows us to enjoy sympathy with the perfections of the noble characters who are depicted rather than pity at their weaknesses or at the fate that overcomes them. But rather than pursuing this, I want to make to make one further point about Mendelssohn's general account of our enjoyment of the engagement of our powers of knowing and desiring. This explanation of a fundamental source of aesthetic pleasure as arising from the engagement of those two powers might seem to conflict with Mendelssohn's influential ascription of aesthetic pleasure to a third faculty, the “faculty of approval,” distinguished from both the “faculty of cognition” and the “faculty of desire.” Mendelssohn introduces this third faculty in the Morning Lessons, a quarter-century after his early writings on aesthetics. There he says that

One usually divides the faculties of the soul into the faculty of cognition and the faculty of desire, and assigns the sentiment of pleasure and displeasure to the faculty of desire. But it seems to me that between knowing and desiring lies the approving, the assent, the satisfaction of the soul, which is actually quite remote from desire. We contemplate the beauty of nature and of art, without the least arousal of desire, with gratification and satisfaction. It seems to be a particular mark of beauty that we contemplate it with quiet satisfaction; that it pleases, even if we do not possess it, and that is remote from the urge to possess it. (Morgenstunden, Lesson VII, p. 70)

This passage is often thought to be that from which Kant derived his conception of the disinterestedness of judgments of taste. And it may well have been. But Mendelssohn's explanation of the “faculty of approval” shows that his basic theory has not changed. By introducing this faculty, he wants to emphasize that the experience of beauty or other aesthetic qualities is not actual knowledge, nor does it lead to specific desires and actions (except perhaps the desire to be able to continue contemplating an object already found to have been beautiful). But what satisfies the faculty of approval is still the activity of the other mental powers. Thus Mendelssohn writes, first with reference to the power of cognition but then with reference to desire as well, that “We can consider the cognition of the soul in different respects; either in so far as it is true or false, which I call the material aspect in cognition; or in so far as arouses pleasure or displeasure, has as its consequence the approval or disapproval of the soul, and this can be called the formal aspect in cognition.” And he explains the latter aspect precisely in terms of mental activity:

Every concept, in so far as it is merely thinkable, has something that pleases the soul, that occupies its activity, and is thus cognized by it with satisfaction and approval….where the soul finds more satisfaction in one concept than in another, more agreeable occupation, then can it prefer the former to the latter. In this comparison and in the preference that we give to an object consists the essence of the beautiful and the ugly, the good and the evil, the perfect and the imperfect. What we cognize as the best in this comparison works on our faculty of desire and stimulates it, where it finds no resistance, to activity. This is the side on which the faculty of approval touches demand or desire. (Morgenstunden, Lesson VII, pp. 72-3)

Ordinarily, the faculty of cognition aims at truth, and the faculty of desire aims at action. The faculty of approval, however, aims just for the pleasing activity of the other two faculties without their usual results. The faculty of approval should be distinguished from the faculties of cognition and desire, since it does not aim at the same results they do. But it is itself satisfied by creations that set those faculties into an “agreeable play.” This is not a breach with Mendelssohn's earlier doctrine, but an explanation of it. Mendelssohn's introduction of the concept of play here may be just as influential for the development of Kant's aesthetics as is his insistence that the faculty of approval does not lead to actual knowledge or actual desire.

In the Morning Lessons Mendelssohn does not emphasize that the free play of the mind has a pleasing effect on the body, but he does in his earlier writings, so let us now return to this third item in Mendelssohn's catalogue of the axes of perfection in aesthetic experience. This is the effect of the activity of the mind in aesthetic experience on the state of the body, a point that Mendelssohn emphasizes in On Sentiments and the Rhapsody although not in the essay on the “Main Principles.” Mendelssohn says that if “each sensible rapture, each improved condition of the state of our body, fills the soul with the sensible representation of a perfection, then every sensible representation must also, in turn, bring with it some well-being of the body…And in this way a pleasant emotion [Affekt] arises.” He distinguishes between a “sensible rapture” (sinnliche Wollust) and an emotion because the former begins in a part of a body, that is, with an actual external perception, while the latter “arises in the brain itself,” but in either case the feeling of the pleasure “arrange[s] the fibers of the brain into an appropriate tone, employing them without fatiguing them,” and then “The brain communicates this harmonious tension to nerves of the other parts of the body and the body becomes comfortable” (On Sentiments, Twelfth Letter; Philosophical Writings, p. 53). In other words, although as a rationalist metaphysician Mendelssohn maintains the formal distinction between the mind and the body (the mind is simple and indivisible, while body is essentially divisible), as a psychologist and aesthetician he nevertheless sees them as in the most intimate interaction, with the perception of harmony by the body infusing the mind with a pleasant sense of harmony that then further stimulates the harmonious condition of the body.

Finally, the “Main Principles” introduce a fourth source of perfection and therefore pleasure in the aesthetic experience, namely our appreciation of the artistry that is manifested in the production of a beautiful object. In explaining this source of pleasure, Mendelssohn also makes another revision to the traditional theory that it is resemblance alone that is the source of our pleasure in imitation, because resemblance is easily produced by means far less complex and admirable than all of the faculties that go into artistry — a point that Plato had already made when he had Socrates argue that if it is mere imitation that the artist were after, he could just go around with a mirror (Plato, Republic, Book X, 596d-e):

All works of art are visible imprints of the artist's abilities which, so to speak, put his entire soul on display and make it known to us. This perfection of spirit arouses an uncommonly greater pleasure than mere similarity, because it is more worthy and far more complex than similarity. It is all the more worthy the more that the perfection of rational beings is elevated above the perfection of lifeless things, and also more complex because many abilities of the soul and often diverse skills of the external limbs as well are required for a beautiful imitation. We find more to admire in a rose by Huysum than in the image that every river can reflect of this queen of the flowers; and the most enchanting landscape in a camera obscura does not charm us as much as it can through the brush of a great landscape painter.(“Main Principles”; Philosophical Writings, p. 174)

Mendelssohn explicitly recognizes the physical skills as well as the mental powers of the artist as among the perfections that we indirectly admire in admiring the work of art; this is another example of his recognition of the close connection between mind and body in spite of their metaphysical distinction. He also stresses the superiority of artistic representation over the mere imitation of nature by observing that the artist can create “ideal beauty” by gathering “together in a single viewpoint what nature has diffusely strewn among various objects, for himself a whole from this and taking the trouble to represent it just as nature would have represented it if the beauty of this limited object had been its sole purpose” (“Main Principles”; Philosophical Writings, p. 176).

However, although human artistry may concentrate beauty more than nature does, that hardly means that artistic beauty is in all regards superior to natural beauty. Mendelssohn concludes the paragraph just cited by saying that “the most perfect, ideal beauty…is to be encountered nowhere in nature other than in the whole and is perhaps never fully to be attained in the works of art.” That is, the beauty of nature as a whole exceeds the beauty of any work of art, and accordingly our admiration for the skill and genius of any human artist must be exceeded by our admiration for and pleasure in the artistry that lies behind nature as a whole.

Mendelssohn concludes the essay on the “Main Principles of the Fine Arts and Sciences” with a brief but pregnant division of the arts. The basis of his division is a distinction between “natural” and “arbitrary” signs, which has precedents in Du Bos, in Leibniz and Wolff, and beyond all of them in St. Augustine. Signs are natural “if the combination of the subject matter signified is grounded in the very properties of what is designated,” as smoke is a natural product of fire or “The passions are, by their very nature, connected with certain movements in our limbs as well as with certain sounds and gestures” (“Main Principles”; Philosophical Writings, p. 177). Signs are arbitrary that “by their very nature have nothing in common with the designated subject matter, but have nevertheless been arbitrarily assumed as signs for it,” such as the “articulated sounds of all languages, the letters, the hieroglyphic signs of the ancients, and some allegorical images” (“Main Principles”; Philosophical Writings, pp. 177-8). The arbitrary signs could also be called conventional. Mendelssohn's chief distinction is then between those arts that convey their content by artificial signs, namely poetry and rhetoric, and those arts that employ natural signs, which convey both reference to content and the expression of feeling through natural signs and do “not presuppose anything arbitrary in order to be understood,” namely painting, sculpture, music, dance, and even architecture insofar as it conveys any meaning and expression. In fact, Mendelssohn distinguishes between the fine arts and the beautiful sciences, or between beaux arts and belles lettres, on this basis: the fine arts employ natural signs, and the beautiful sciences or belles lettres employ arbitrary or conventional signs (“Main Principles”; Philosophical Writings, pp. 178-9). Among the belles lettres, poetry and rhetoric are distinguished by the fact that “The main, ultimate purpose of poetry is to please by means of a sensibly perfect discourse, while that of rhetoric is to persuade by means of a sensibly perfect discourse.” Mendelssohn does not explain why the fact that poetry and rhetoric employ artificial rather than natural signs entitles them to be called sciences rather than arts; perhaps what he has in mind is that since the meanings of arbitrary signs can be codified, there is more room for precision in the interpretation of poetry and rhetoric than there is in the various fine arts (with the exception of their allegorical or iconographical aspects, which as Mendelssohn has suggested are more like arbitrary than natural signs). In the case of rhetoric, moreover, there was a long tradition going back to antiquity of formulating rules for how persuasion can be achieved, and perhaps this made it seem like more of a science than an art to Mendelssohn.

Be this as it may, the main point of Mendelssohn's distinction is that because its signs are arbitrary and can therefore be associated with any conceivable content, “the poet can express everything of which our soul can have a clear concept,” while the arts that employ natural signs are limited to the expression of those ideas and emotions the natural signs for which can be replicated in their specific media; each of these arts “must content itself with that portion of natural signs that it can express by means of the senses,” or more precisely by means of its particular way of engaging the senses. For example, “Music, the expression of which takes place by means of inarticulate sounds,” although it can express both the general ideas of harmony and all of the particular “inclinations and passions of the human soul which tend to make themselves known by means of sounds,” cannot possibly indicate particular concepts of objects such as “the concept of a rose, a poplar tree, and so on, just as it is impossible for painting to represent a musical chord to us” (“Main Principles”; Philosophical Writings, pp. 178-9).

Mendelssohn next assumes that only hearing and sight can convey natural signs, and then observes that “the natural signs that affect the sense of sight can be represented either successively or alongside one another, that is to say, they can express beauty either through movement or through forms” (“Main Principles”; Philosophical Writings, p. 179). The art of dance employs movements that naturally express human feelings and emotions, while the arts of painting and sculpture must “express beauties that are alongside one another” through line, color, and shape. This leads Mendelssohn to the point that although works of music, dance, and for that matter poetry themselves take place through a succession of moments and can thereby convey a succession of movements, painting and sculpture can represent only a single moment in the history of their objects. The painter and sculptor must therefore

choose the instant that is most favorable to their purpose. They must assemble the entire action into a single perspective and divide it up with a great deal of understanding. In this instant everything must be rich in thoughts and so full of meaning that every accompanying concept makes its own contribution to the required meaning. When we view such a painting [or sculpture] with due attention, our senses are all at once inspired, all the abilities of our soul suddenly enlivened, and the imagination can from the present infer the past and reliably anticipate the future. (“Main Principles”; Philosophical Writings, pp. 180-1)

Mendelssohn's thesis that the visual arts must convey all of their content through their representation of an object at a single moment while other arts can represent movements and actions in, as we would say, real time, would be used as a premise in a famous controversy between his friend Lessing and the renowned historian of ancient art Johann Joachim Winckelmann, to which we will turn in a moment. But before doing so, we must complete our survey of Mendelssohn's aesthetics with a comment on his discussion of the sublime.

Mendelssohn was instrumental in introducing the topic of the sublime into German aesthetics, publishing a lengthy review of Burke's book on the beautiful and the sublime just a year after it appeared in England (reprinted in Mendelssohn, Gesammelte Schriften, volume 4,pp. 216-36) and an essay “On the Sublime and Naïve in the Fine Sciences” the year before Burke's book appeared. In the latter essay, Mendelssohn makes a number of points that will become central to the subsequent German discussion of the sublime, especially in Kant. His premise, not surprisingly, is that “The sentiment produced by the sublime is a composite one” (“On the Sublime and the Naïve in the Fine Sciences”; Philosophical Writings, p. 195). For one thing, it may be produced by the perception or thought of an “immensity of extended magnitude” or of an “immensity of strength or unextended magnitude” (“The Sublime and Naïve”; Philosophical Writings, p. 194) — by the sight, image, or thought of something vastly big or of something vastly powerful. This distinction anticipates Kant's subsequent distinction between the “mathematical” and the “dynamical” sublime, and while it was not uncommon in British discussions of the sublime, Mendelssohn may have been Kant's source for it. Mendelssohn then says that either immensity of size or immensity of strength first “captures our attention” and “arouses a sweet shudder that rushes through every fiber of our being…giving wings to the imagination to press further and further without stopping.” “All these sentiments blend together in the soul,” becoming “a single phenomenon which we call awe” (loc. cit.). But the feeling of awe at immensity does not yet complete the complex experience of the sublime; for that, there must also be an element of admiration at a perfection — for remember that Mendelssohn's project is still to ground all aesthetic experience on the underlying principle of pleasure in perfection. So the immensity which inspires us with awe must also be interpreted as a manifestation of perfection. Mendelssohn then invokes the same distinction he employed in his discussion of artistry. The immensity which fills us with awe may be either a product of divine artistry, in which case “the properties of the Supreme Being which we recognize in his works inspire the most ecstatic awe and admiration because they surpass everything that we can conceive as enormous, perfect, or sublime,” or it can be due to human artistry. In that case we may not find the represented object so extraordinary but feel with pleasure how “the artist possesses the skill of elevating its properties and showing them in an uncommon light,” or alternatively we may be awed by both the represented object and the divine artistry that lies behind it and by the “great wit, genius, imagination, and capacities of the soul” of the human artist who produces the image of the work of divine artistry. “What especially pleases us in the case of art, considered as art, is the reference to the spiritual gifts of the artist which make themselves visibly known. If they bear the characteristics of an uncommon genius…then they inspire awe on our part” (“The Sublime and Naïve”; Philosophical Writings, pp. 196-7).

We may now turn to the famous controversy between Lessing and Winckelmann, built upon Mendelssohn's distinction between the arts of form and the arts of movement.

4.2. Winckelmann

Johann Joachim Winckelmann (1717-1768), the son of a poor cobbler from Prussia, studied at Halle and Jena, and from the age of twenty-four to twenty-nine was a school teacher. But at thirty-one he got a position as a librarian for a nobleman in Dresden, and gained access to the court of the Elector of Saxony, home of one of the great art collections of Europe, and also a Catholic court that ultimately gave him access to Rome. He established his reputation in 1755 with an essay “On the Imitation of Greek Works in Painting and Sculpture.” He moved to Rome later that year, in the service of the Papal Nuncio to the Saxon court, and in 1758 entered the service of Cardinal Allessandro Albani, the nephew of Pope Clement XI and owner of a great collection of antiquities. In 1764 Winckelmann published The History of Ancient Art to great acclaim. He was working on a revision of it when he was murdered in Trieste in June of 1768, while returning to Rome from Vienna, where the Empress Maria Theresa had awarded him a collection of gold and silver medallions.

Winckelmann spent his two years in Halle (1738-40) while Baumgarten was still teaching there and Meier was also a student. But his writing offers no evidence that he knew their works. His History of Ancient Art does cite Du Bos, Batteux, and the essays of Hume, however, and he had clearly absorbed some of the most general ideas of eighteenth-century aesthetics. A 1763 essay “On the Capacity for the Sentiment for the Beautiful in Art, and on Instruction in it” suggests several of the premises assumed throughout his work on ancient art history. He shares with Wolff and Batteux the assumption that art derives its beauty from the imitation of nature, and derives the most beauty from the imitation of beauty in nature . Thus he writes that “Art, as an imitator of nature, should always seek out what is natural for the form of beauty, and should avoid, as much as is possible, all that is violent, because even the beauty in life can become displeasing through forced gestures” (“On the Capacity for the Sentiment for the Beautiful in Art,” Essays on the Philosophy and History of Art, volume I, p. xlvi). However, Winckelmann believes that natural beauty itself lies not merely in the superficial appearance of bodies but, at least in the case of human beauty, is an expression of the thought and character of persons: "Above all things, one is to be attentive to the particular, characteristic thoughts in works of art, which sometimes stand like expensive pearls in a string of inferior ones, and can get lost among them. Our contemplation should begin with the effects of the understanding as the most worthy part of beauty, and from there should descend to the execution” — a point that he illustrates with examples from the paintings of Poussin, Corregio, and Domenichino rather than from ancient art (“The Sentiment for the Beautiful,” p. xlv). Winckelmann clearly belongs to the tradition that finds beauty in the truthful representation of the objective perfections of body and mind, rather than in the stimulation of the play of the mental powers of the audience for beauty.

Winckelmann's premises underlie his history of ancient art, the main claims of which are already evident in his 1755 essay “On the Imitation of the Painting and Sculpture of the Greeks.” This essay begins with the claim that “There is but one way for the moderns to become great, and perhaps unequalled; I mean, by imitating the ancients” (Reflections on the Painting and Sculpture of the Greeks, p. 2; in Essays on the Philosophy and History of Art, volume I). His topic is thus in the first instance the imitation of ancient art, not imitation in ancient art. Winckelmann then attributes the excellent of ancient Greek, art to three factors: first, nature in ancient Greece was particularly favorable to the development of beautiful bodies; second, the “natural” way of life in Greece was particularly favorable to the observation of beautiful bodies and thus to their imitation in art; and finally, Greek thought and character were particularly noble, and thus the external beauty of Greek bodies was an expression of the beauty of the Greek mind as the “most worthy part of beauty.” The first of these claims is in the tradition of the emphasis of the influence of climate on human character and society initiated by Du Bos and continued by many eighteenth-century thinkers, including Montesquieu in The Spirit of the Laws (1748).

Winckelmann's second point is that the Greek climate and way of life was conducive to the development of art. He makes the general claim that freedom is conducive to the development of art: “Art claims liberty: in vain would nature produce her noblest offsprings, in a country where rigid laws would choke her progressive growth, as in Egypt, that pretended parent of sciences and arts: but in Greece, where, from their earliest youth, the happy inhabitants were devoted to mirth and pleasure, where narrow-spirited formality never restrained the liberty of manners, the artist enjoyed nature without a veil.” Winckelmann then makes the specific point that freedom from excessive clothing among the Greeks, particularly in their gymnastic and athletic exercises, gave their artists unparalleled opportunity to observe and to learn to represent the beauty of their bodies: “The Gymnasies, where, sheltered by public modesty, the youths exercised themselves naked, were the schools of art….Here beautiful nakedness appeared with such a liveliness of expression, such truth and variety of situations, such a noble air of the body, as it would be ridiculous to look for in any hired model of our academies” (“Imitation,” pp. 9-10). Winckelmann's reference to expression and nobility here points the way to his last claim, that above all the bodily beauty of the Greeks is an expression of their mental and moral beauty: “The last and most eminent characteristic of the Greek works is a noble simplicity and sedate grandeur in Gesture and Expression. As the bottom of the sea lies peaceful beneath a foaming surface, a great soul lies sedate beneath the strife of passions in Greek figures” (“Imitation,” p. 30).

Winckelmann illustrates the last claim with a discussion of the famous statue of the Trojan priest Laocoön and his sons being strangled by the serpents Neptune sent to stifle his warnings against accepting the “gift” of the Trojan horse. The version of this statue that was unearthed near Naples in 1506 and quickly acquired by Pope Julius II for the Vatican, where it has been displayed ever since, is now thought to be a Roman copy of a Pergamese bronze from the second century BCE, and may or may not be the same one described by Pliny (Natural History, XXXV). Winckelmann took it to be a classical Greek work. He also must have known it only from illustration when he first wrote about it in “On the Imitation of the Painting and Sculpture of the Greeks,” since he moved to Rome only after that essay was published. Be that as it may, Winckelmann writes:

'Tis in the face of Laocoön this soul shines with full lustre, not confined however to the face, amidst the most violent sufferings. Pangs piercing every muscle, every labouring nerve; pangs which we almost feel ourselves, while we consider — not the face, nor the most expressive parts — only the belly contracted by excruciating pains: these however, I say, exert not themselves with violence, either in the face or gesture. He pierces not heaven, like the Laocoön of Virgil; his mouth is rather opened to discharge an anxious overloaded groan, as Sadolet says; the struggling body and the supporting mind exert themselves with equal strength, nay balance all the frame.

Laocoön suffers, but suffers like the Philoctetes of Sophocles: we weeping feel his pains, but wish for the hero's strength to support his misery.

The Expression of so great a soul is beyond the force of mere nature. It was in his own mind the artist was to search for the strength of spirit with which he marked his marble. Greece enjoyed artists and philosophers in the same persons; and the wisdom of more than one Metrodorus directed art, and inspired its figures with more than common souls.

The last paragraph of this is somewhat contorted: since Laocoön was not himself a classical Greek, but a pre-classical Trojan, Winckelmann does not quite attribute the “noble simplicity and quiet grandeur” that shines through his face even in the midst of his suffering to him and to nature as it might have been at work in Troy, but rather to the classical Greek artist whom he supposes did make the statue. But his basic point remains: since in his view the statue itself was Greek, the noble simplicity and quiet grandeur of the Greek soul inevitably manifests itself and elevates these figures caught in a moment of supreme suffering to the highest level of beauty.

Winckelmann's History of Ancient Art, published nine years after the essay on imitation, reaffirms his general commitment to contemporary aesthetics as well as his particular emphasis on a certain kind of mental condition as the ultimate source of physical beauty. It nevertheless gives a slightly varied and perhaps more plausible account of the Laocoön statue, which by then he had seen first-hand. To general statements on beauty as unity and simplicity (History, p. 196) and the beauty of youthfulness (p. 197) Winckelmann adds a passage on the expression of inward attitude that is reminiscent of his description of the “noble simplicity and quiet grandeur” of the Greeks in the earlier essay: “Expression is an imitation of the active and suffering states of our minds and our bodies and of passions as well as deeds…Stillness is the state most proper to beauty, as it is to the sea, and experience shows that the most beautiful beings are of a still and well-mannered nature” (History, p. 204). But, as noted, in the