Étienne Bonnot de Condillac

First published Thu Oct 17, 2002; substantive revision Thu Sep 21, 2017

Étienne Bonnot, Abbé de Condillac, was the chief exponent of a radically empiricist account of the workings of the mind that has since come to be referred to as “sensationism.” Whereas John Locke’s empiricism followed upon a rejection of innate principles and innate ideas, Condillac went further and rejected innate abilities as well. On his version of empiricism, experience not only provides us with “ideas” or the raw materials for knowledge, it also teaches us how to focus attention, remember, imagine, abstract, judge, and reason. It forms our desires and teaches us what to will. Moreover, it provides us with the best lessons in the performance of these operations, so that a study of how we originally learn to perform them also tells us how those operations ought to be performed. The pursuit of this tenet led Condillac to articulate an early developmental psychology, with explicit pedagogical and methodological implications. His concerns also led him to focus on the theory of perception, and to advance important and original views on our perception of spatial form. He offered a more searching, careful, and precise account of what exactly is given to us by each of the sense organs than any that had been offered up to his day, and presented a highly nuanced account of how this raw data is worked up into our beliefs about the world around us.

1. Life and Works

Condillac was born on September 30, 1714 in Grenoble as the third son of Gabriel Bonnot, Vicomte de Mably, and Catherine de La Coste. (“Condillac” was the name of an estate purchased by his father in 1720.) He is said to have had very poor eyesight and a weak physical constitution, factors that so retarded his intellectual development that as late as his twelfth year he was still unable to read. His education began only in his teens, first under the direction of a local priest, then at Lyons, where he went to live with his older brother, Jean, after the death of their father. Perhaps because of his reticence and his late learning his family regarded him as possessing limited intellectual abilities. He nonetheless managed to continue his education as a seminarian in Paris, at Saint-Suplice and at the Sorbonne. He took holy orders in 1740 and wore a cassock for the rest of his life, but did no pastoral work. After some years spent living the life of a man of letters in Paris, during which he came to be closely acquainted with Rousseau and Diderot, and published work that won him election to the Prussian Academy of the Sciences (1749), he accepted a position as tutor to the Prince of Parma, a post that he held from 1758–68. He returned to Paris in 1768 and was elected to the French Academy in that year, but he left the city shortly after, in 1773, and took up residence on a country estate he had purchased near Beaugency. He died there on August 3, 1780.

Condillac published two main philosophical works: the Essay on the Origin of Human Knowledge of 1746, and the Treatise on Sensations of 1754, both of which were devoted to expositing his views on the role of experience in the development of our cognitive capacities.

The earlier Essay was a less radical work. Though it sought to explain how the cognitive faculties are developed as a consequence of sensation, it took sensation itself largely for granted. Condillac explicitly rejected the views that the mind can make judgments that it is not aware of, and that we can confuse the products of inferential operations with immediately given sensations. As a consequence, he maintained, in opposition to Molyneux, Locke, and Berkeley, that we do not need to learn to perceive visual depth. However, the Essay was also more wide-ranging than the Treatise. It devoted attention to the development of language and its role both in the acquisition of our more sophisticated cognitive powers and in the generation of false philosophies. These are topics that Condillac later relegated to his works on logic.

In the Treatise Condillac focused just on our pre-linguistic cognitive abilities, which he came to think he might have underestimated when he wrote the Essay. He retracted his earlier claim that perception is a transparent process and accepted both that it involves unconscious inference from what is given in sensation and that sensation itself may contain more than it is at first perceived to contain. He also retracted his earlier claim that depth is immediately perceived by vision. To support these revised opinions, he proposed a famous thought experiment. He asked his readers to consider an originally inanimate and insentient human being (Condillac spoke of a being that is just a “statue” of a human being) and to consider what this being could come to know were it to acquire each of the senses in isolation from the others, or each in combination with just one or two others. In proposing this question Condillac was asking a more radical version of the question Molyneux had posed to Locke: would a person born blind and made to see perceive spatial features well enough upon first sight to be able to identify cubes and spheres without touching them? Condillac was asking what a person endowed with just a sense of smell would think upon acquiring the power of hearing, or what a person endowed with vision would know if unaffected by hunger, incapable of motion, and unaware of any tactile sensation. His answer to these questions sought not just to explain how this person would acquire ideas of space and of external objects, but to prove that nothing more would be needed for it to acquire all the knowledge and all of the abilities that we have other than just to experience a sufficiently rich array of sensations.

Condillac’s other philosophical works support and embellish the doctrines of the Essay and the Treatise. They are the Treatise on Systems of 1749, which is devoted to critiquing the metaphysics and the methodology of earlier philosophers, the Treatise on Animals of 1755, which attempts to explain how human souls differ from those of animals with respect to intelligence and free will, the “Dissertation on Liberty”, an important short work appended to the Treatise on Sensations that further addresses the issue of human free will, the “Summary [extrait raisonné] of the Treatise on Sensations,” originally included in the Treatise on Animals, and a textbook on Logic (1780). He also published a work on commerce and government, assembled a dictionary of synonyms, and put together a multi-volume course of studies that he had developed while tutoring the Prince of Parma. The latter dealt principally with history but also included some philosophical material, including a different presentation of logic. At the time of his death he left an incomplete a work entitled The Language of Calculation.

2. The Metaphysics of Condillac’s Sensationism

Condillac’s account of the development of our cognitive capacities was informed by a particular conception of the nature of the mind and the sensations it is originally given. He argued that the mind must be an unextended or immaterial substance (Essay I.i.1 §6).[1] When it senses, nothing actually passes into it from the outside world or the body. Instead the action of external objects on the sense organs brings about changes in the body and these changes serve as the merely occasional cause of the production of sensations in the mind.

Sensations are modifications of our being. To understand them as images of something distinct from us is to treat them as “ideas” rather than simply as “sensations,” and that is an operation that is so far from being automatic that it exceeds the capacities of animals. However, unlike Reid, who was later to argue for a rigorous distinction between sensations, considered as states of feeling experienced by the mind, and perceptions, considered as acts of thinking something about an object, Condillac maintained that sensations do lend themselves to being treated as ideas. He denied that sensations are “something that only occurs aside from thoughts and modifies them” and insisted that they are “as representative” as any other thought experienced by the mind (Essay I.ii.2 §9).

3. Sensation in the Essay

Most early modern philosophers were impressed by the facts of geometrical optics, which teach that light imprints an inverted, left-right reversed image of the external world on the concave surface of the back of the eye. If we accept that the eye is the means of visual perception, then this teaching appears to imply that the eyes filter out information about the distance at which objects are set outwards from us and transmit just information about position along the horizon and the azimuth to the mind. After all, while points at different angles of inclination upwards or downwards from the horizon, or at different compass directions will project light to different parts of the retina, points that differ only with reference to their distance outwards from the eye will project light onto the same part of the eye. But if differences in distance outwards make no difference to the impression on the eye, and the mind is only affected as a consequence of how the eye is affected, then information about outward distances is not conveyed to the mind. It would seem, therefore, that visual perception must originally lack information about distance outwards. It must consist of an awareness of images that are only two-dimensional projections of solid objects in a three dimensional space.

But the Condillac of the Essay was not impressed by these considerations. Though he admitted that the image imprinted by light on the eye is merely two-dimensional, he denied that the mind must therefore only be aware of a two-dimensional image (Essay I.vi §2). However he had little to say about how the mind might acquire information about outward distances, and instead confined himself to attacking the standard account.[2] On the standard account, when I perceive a three dimensional object, such as a uniformly coloured globe, I must really see a two dimensional projection of that object, variously shaded in its different parts, and then judge that this two-dimensional, variously coloured image is a representation of a uniformly coloured three-dimensional object (the classic presentation of this view is to be found in Locke’s Essay, book II, chapter ix, paragraph 8). But I am not conscious of seeing a flat, variously coloured circle, nor am I conscious of making a judgment about what this image represents. Instead, I seem to immediately see a uniformly coloured, three-dimensional object. Moreover, try as I might, I cannot make myself aware of drawing an inference. And I have so little awareness of the flat, variously coloured circle that I supposedly see that, without the aid of instruction in drawing or painting, I would have no idea that it bears any relation to a uniformly coloured globe. Condillac found this insupportable. The mind, he maintained, cannot be so deeply ignorant of what it senses or of what it does (Essay I.vi §§3–5).

Consistently with the view that we do not need to learn to perceive depth, Condillac maintained that we do not need to learn to perceive separation in any other spatial dimension. Consequently, a previously blind person, made to see for the first time, should see colours to be extended over all three dimensions. The alternative, in Condillac’s view is that the newly sighted person would experience just a “mathematical point” of colour, and he rejected this as patently absurd (Essay I.vi. §§12–14).

Condillac was aware that these claims had been challenged by such empirical studies of recovered vision as were available at the time. In 1728, the English surgeon, William Chesselden, had reported to the British Royal Society that subjects recovering from operations to remove cataracts that had blinded them since birth appeared to need to learn to associate what they saw with tactile experience before they could recognize shapes or objects. Condillac replied to this contrary evidence by claiming that it would take some time for newly sighted subjects to learn how to focus the eyes in order to perceive colours distinctly, and so to see their outlines. It would then take time for the subjects to attend to the shapes that distinctly seen colours exhibit, since we can expect that at first they would be overwhelmed and confused by the variety of information presented by the eyes, much like a person gaining a first glimpse of a Bosch painting. Finally, even after they came to see colours as, say, outlining square or round shapes, they might still hesitate to assume that simply because an object looks to have a certain shape, that therefore it must be felt to have that shape as well. For all of these reasons, time might pass and the subject might appear to be learning to associate visual experiences with tangible objects, even though the colours that are originally seen are already extended and shaped in three dimensions (Essay I.vi. §16).

4. Sensation in the Treatise

Condillac’s reply to the Chesselden data contained the germs of an insight that was to be central for the later Treatise: the claim that visual sensations, and indeed all sensations, might contain information that goes unnoticed by a subject simply because it is not attended to. This insight, already present in the Essay, was subversive. It challenged that work’s rejection of perception by means of unconscious sensations and unconscious inferences. It led to the Treatise’s claim that having a sensation does not imply being conscious of everything that sensation involves (Treatise I.xi.8, III.iii.6).

In his Logic, Condillac illustrated this point by asking his readers to imagine a group of people who travel by night to a chateau situated on a high point before a vast panorama of fields, mountains, cities, towns, and forests. At dawn, the windows are thrown open for just an instant. In that instant, each member of the company experiences a compound visual sensation consisting of multiple, simultaneously present colour patches disposed in space so as to depict all the parts of the panorama that lies out in a particular direction. But from the view obtained in just an instant, no one can say what it was that they saw. If the shutters are left open for more than an instant nothing new is presented to the company. That is, they do not have any sensation they did not have in the first instant. They come to perceive what it is they at first already sensed by selectively attending to each of its parts in turn and then noting how these parts are related to one another (Logic, Part I, Chapter ii).

Condillac had always appreciated that this act of attention is not an innate operation, any more than such higher cognitive operations as abstraction, judgment, or reasoning are innate operations. We need to learn how to attend to what we sense. Experience itself serves as our teacher. The operation of attention is invoked by our needs and interests. We attend first to what promises to satisfy our needs and interests, which are always with us and which always direct our thought. Our knowledge of what promises to satisfy our needs and interests is a product of past experience, which has made us aware of what objects are connected with the frustration or satisfaction of those needs and interests. The needs and interests themselves are developed as a consequence of a past experience of pleasure and pain, which in turn are intrinsic features not just of tactile experience, but of all of our sensations. However, in the Essay Condillac had not appreciated the full implications of this view. Recognizing those implications required being more careful about specifying what is originally given in sensation, what is originally attended to, and what leads us to attend to anything else. The device of the slowly animated “statue” was invoked to assist in making these determinations.

Condillac supposed that the most primitive form of experience would be the sense of smell. A being (Condillac’s “statue”) endowed with just this one sense but no motive power would, Condillac supposed, be capable of receiving pleasure or pain from the experience of different odoriferous objects. However, all that the being could do to avoid painful or acquire pleasurable sensations would be to try to distract itself with remembered or imagined smells when occurrent ones proved uninteresting or unappealing.

We would consider such a being to be a being who smells, say, a rose, and who is thereby affected in a certain way. Some might consider this effect to be a rose smell sensation that somehow stands before the mind as an object of contemplation. Others might consider the effect to be an act that has the scent of a rose as its intentional object, or an act of feeling a certain way (“rose-scentedly”). But Condillac maintained that the being itself would not at first have any conception of objects distinct from itself or even any conception of itself, let alone any views on the metaphysical status of its sensory states. When it smells a rose, it experiences itself as simply being the smell of a rose (Treatise I.i.2). If it smells more than one object at once, the smells likely amalgamate into a single, complex scent that it experiences as simple and unique. If it experiences different smells in succession, the memory of the earlier one may linger while the other comes to be present and then it may become aware of itself as having been something different from what it is now so will discover that is a thing that endures through time (Treatise I.ii.10).

If the being were allowed to have senses of sound in addition to smell, different, simultaneously experienced sounds would likewise be experienced by it as one noise, but Condillac supposed that any sound would be too different from any simultaneously occurring taste for the two to be amalgamated, as long as either one had once been experienced on its own. Thus, a being endowed with senses of both smell and hearing would experience itself as being both a smell and a sound, and so would experience itself as having a double existence (Treatise I.ix.3–4). It would not, however, necessarily experience itself as being two things at once, at least not if we take the term “thing” to refer to substances. Condillac claimed that, were each particular smell only ever experienced in conjunction with just one particular sound, and vice versa, the two would not be thought of as distinct things or substances, even though they would be distinguished from one another. Instead, the smell would be experienced as having a sound and the sound as having a scent. Otherwise put, each would play the role of property to the other. This is all that there ever is to our concept of substance, insofar as that concept has any meaning at all and is not simply a meaningless word invented by philosophers. Substance is not some substratum in which properties inhere, but a collection of sensations or qualities or properties commonly observed to occur together (Treatise I.xii.3, III.iv.2).

As has been noted, in the Treatise Condillac abandoned his earlier view that we immediately see depth. However, he continued to maintain that light and colours are extended over the remaining two dimensions. A being endowed with a sense of sight and presented with a variously coloured panorama would not experience all the different colours to be amalgamated into a point. Neither, Condillac supposed, would it blend the different colours with one another so as to see a uniformly coloured expanse. It would still continue to experience itself as simply being each of the colours it sees. Insofar as these colours are not merely multiple but outside of one another in space, the being would experience itself as not merely having a multiple existence, but also as being “outside” of itself. As Condillac put it, insofar as it is red it experiences itself as being outside of itself insofar as it is as green (Treatise I.xi.8).

It was at this point that Condillac’s thesis that sensing does not entail being conscious of all that one senses came to the fore. We would think that if colours are extended and different colours are simultaneously seen without being blended, then there must be edges between them, and shapes outlined by those edges. Condillac accepted that this would in fact be the case. But he denied that his “statue” would necessarily have to be aware of this fact. The “statue” would need some reason to turn its attention to the boundaries between colours, to identify the various parts of those boundaries, and to notice what shape they constitute. But if it only considered colour sensations to be its own states of being, and took pleasure or pain only in their chromatic qualities and not in their shapes (a rather large presumption that Condillac seems not to have realized making), it would have no reason to notice that colours have shapes or even that they have particular locations relative to one another. Consequently, even though it would experience colours as being extended and outside of one another, it would not notice that the array of simultaneously present colour sensations forms an unbroken continuum. It would experience its coloured self merely as an aggregate of distinct extensions, vaguely perceived as not having any definite boundaries or shapes, and not recognized as having any locations relative to one another. Consequently, it would have no developed concept of space (Treatise I.xi.8–9).

Condillac maintained that it is only through the sense of touch that a being first acquires an awareness of space as an external continuum extending outwards beyond the bounds of its body, and an awareness of other objects in this space. Touch then teaches us to attribute smells, sounds, tastes, and colours to external objects.

Like Thomas Reid, who some ten years later also set about investigating what each of the senses can lead us to learn, Condillac took the tactile sensation of solidity to be crucial for the development of an awareness of space and of external objects. Only whereas Reid maintained that we are innately so constituted as to understand the purely qualitative sensation of solidity as sign signifying a quality of external objects, Condillac attempted to explain how experiences of the sensation of solidity could put us in a position to infer that we have spatially extended bodies and that something else exists outside of our bodies (Treatise II.v).

These inferences arise as a consequence of the comparison of two cases, one where a being touches itself, the other where it touches something else. A being that touches itself experiences a sensation of solidity in its hand and an “answering” sensation of solidity in the part of its body that it touches, thereby experiencing itself as being solid, as being two instances of solidity, and as being two instances of solidity outside of one another. Were the being to lift its hand from its body and touch another part of its body, the pair of these sensations would cease and then after a time one member of the pair would recur in the company of a different partner. The being would experience a new sensation of solidity outside of the one it receives from its hand, but its awareness of the different body parts that it touches would be like its awareness of colours. Though experienced as being outside of one another, the touched body parts would not be experienced as forming a continuum or as spatially related to one another. However, were the being to move its hand over its body without lifting it, it would experience a continuous sequence of sensations of solidity arising from different body parts. Moving the hand repeatedly in the same way would always produce the same series of sensations. Condillac did not go into any more detail, but he seems to have presumed that this would be enough to warrant the inference that the touched body parts coexist and form a continuum. Thus, through moving its hands over itself, the “statue” is supposed to acquire an awareness that it has a spatially extended body.

When the “statue” touches another object, it experiences only one sensation of solidity without the answering sensation. The absence of the second sensation is supposed to induce the judgment that there is something else that is solid. An awareness of the shape of objects and their locations in an ambient space is then developed on this basis. The “statue” subsequently learns to attribute smells and sounds to objects by discovering that moving objects can make these sensations appear or disappear (Treatise III.i-ii). Moving its hands before its eyes and discovering how this causes colour sensations to appear or disappear leads it to think of colour sensations at first as being on the surface of its eyes, then as being outside of it beyond arm’s length, and then as being on the surfaces of particular tangible objects within arms length (Treatise III.iii.1–19). Having reached this stage of development, it is ready to learn to perceive objects to be at even more remote distances through discovering associations between such visual distance cues as the clarity and apparent size of visual images and the distance that must be crossed to touch an object. The interpretation of the cues then becomes so natural that we seem to be directly seeing depth. Condillac quietly ignored his earlier objections to this position (Treatise III.iii.20–33).

5. The Development of the Higher Cognitive Faculties

Condillac’s account of how sensation gives rise to the exercise of our higher cognitive faculties is broadly the same in the Essay and the Treatise. Such differences as there are between the two works arise from Condillac’s decision to focus the Treatise on pre-linguistic abilities. In the Essay Condillac defined perception as the impression first occasioned in the mind by the action of objects on the senses. He maintained that we are always conscious of perceptions, but that this consciousness comes in varying degrees, which are a function of the strength with which objects act on the senses, the degree of intrinsic painfulness or pleasantness of the perception, and, most importantly, the extent to which the perception has been associated with our needs, which are ultimately a function of the pleasure and pain we receive from our perceptions. A high degree of consciousness is what we call attention. Our attention is naturally drawn to those perceptions that are most pleasurable or painful, and consequently to those perceptions that we have connected with those that are most pleasurable or painful. Thus, experience of pleasure and pain is what first instructs us where to focus our attention. Learning where to focus attention is important, because many perceptions can be present at once, and a consciousness that is evenly distributed over a great number of perceptions knows none of them very clearly or distinctly (Essay I.ii.1. §§1–14).

Those perceptions that we attend to can seem to drown out the others and produce the illusion that they alone exist, whereas those perceptions that we are less conscious of can be so faint that it is impossible to recall that we have had them the instant after the stimulus that produced them fades. Those perceptions that we attend to can also continue for some time after the stimulus that produced them has ceased. This produces an experience that Condillac referred to as “reminiscence” (réminiscence). An object continuously acting on our sense organs causes us to now experience a particular perception while we are simultaneously conscious of an echo, as it were, of an identical past perception, produced just a moment ago. Condillac’s reasoning is less than explicit at this point, but he seems to have taken this experience to provide us with an awareness of what we might call the “pastness” of the echo, and at the same time of the continued existence of an identical self which experienced both the past perception and the current ones. The idea of self is thus not the product of a Cartesian intellectual intuition. Like the idea of one’s own extended body and of other extended things, it is discovered through having a particular kind of sensory experience, in this case, the experience of reminiscence (Essay I.ii.1. §15).

In the Essay, Condillac distinguished between reminiscence, understood as the perception that one is perceiving something that one has perceived before, and memory. Memory is not the process of forming an image of something one has experienced before. Condillac instead described it as the process of forming an idea just of signs or circumstances that have been associated with a previously experienced object. The operation of forming an image of a previously experienced object is not memory but “imagination,” or reminiscence, if the imagined object is thought of as one that has been experienced before. (Since signs are not discussed in the Treatise, the distinction between memory and imagination/reminiscence does not appear in that work, and both reminiscence and what the Essay calls vivid imagination are named “memory.” However, it is not clear that this is a doctrinal shift as opposed to a mere change of emphasis mandated by the different project of the Treatise.) Imagination becomes possible once a perception has become familiar from a number of previous experiences, which give the mind a facility to repeat that perception at will. The operation of imagination is enhanced if the perception is simple, composed of simple parts that are organized in accord with some guiding principle that can be invoked in reconstructing it, or customarily connected with other, presently occurring perceptions. Since connections with other, customarily connected perceptions need to be noticed, and attention is a function of need, which is in turn established by past experience of pleasure and pain, imagination is ultimately a function of past experience. The same can be said of memory, with the qualification that, insofar as memory involves the recollection of signs, its operation also presupposes the ability to make use of signs (Essay I.ii.2–3, Treatise I.ii).

6. Signs and the “Language of Action”

Like Reid after him, Condillac drew a distinction between three kinds of signs: accidental, natural, and instituted (Essay I.ii.4).

Accidental signs are objects or circumstances that have been frequently encountered in conjunction with an object, so that the occurrence of the former induces the mind to imagine the latter. Though he made a great deal of the significance of his employment of the principle of association when giving summary presentations of his work, one of Condillac’s great shortcomings is his treatment of association. He did little more than employ the term. Unlike Hume, he did not distinguish between resemblance, contiguity, and cause and effect, and he offered no detailed analysis of causal association. When compared with Hume’s accounts of how association is responsible for our beliefs about matters of chance and probability, our trust in testimony, our reliance on general rules, and our tendencies to allow our reasoning to be influenced by credulity, education, and passion, Condillac’s account of association is very impoverished.

Natural signs are the cries and gestures that we instinctively produce upon having particular experiences. Unlike Reid, Condillac insisted that we are not born with a knowledge of the meaning of natural signs; we are only born with the disposition to produce them on certain occasions. We produce them, moreover, without intending to do so and without intending to communicate anything by them. We only discover that they have a certain signification through hearing or seeing ourselves or others produce the sign on characteristic occasions, and so coming to associate the latter with the former. To go in the other direction, and produce the sign in order to induce the thought of some circumstance in others, would be to use the sign as an instituted rather than a natural sign.

The same might be said of accidental signs. To imagine dawn upon hearing the crow of a cock is to be affected by an accidental sign; to imitate the crow of a cock in order to signify dawn is to institute a sign, and is an operation of a higher order.

Reid was later to maintain that the creation of instituted signs presupposes an agreement among a community of speakers, which in turn presupposes language, and this led him to declare that there must be some language that is innately understood rather than established by convention. But Condillac had already explained how an artificial language can be instituted without innately understood signs (Essay II.i.1. §§1–4). Familiarity with the signification of natural signs, which are instinctively produced but not innately understood, will lead one to think of the sign upon witnessing the object that it signifies. For example, having learned to associate the cries that are made by those attacked by a wild animal with those circumstances, I will think of those cries upon seeing a wild animal approach and think of the effect that hearing them has previously had on myself and others. It is then a small, but momentous step to utter those cries in order, first, to signify the approach of a wild animal to others and induce them to flee, and then to signify this particular danger to oneself or others without bothering to imagine an approaching wild animal, as a way of abbreviating the process of thought. With this step, a move is made from being affected by accidental and natural signs we happen to chance upon in the course of experience to employing instituted signs to stand for experiences. The first stage in taking this step is the development of what Condillac called the “language of action,” a language composed of cries and gestures culled from natural language. A spoken language of arbitrary sounds and a written language are then gradually invented by users of the language of action (Essay II.i.1. §§5–8).

Since memory just is the imagination of signs, the development of instituted signs makes memory possible (natural and accidental signs are only ever sensed, not remembered). The institution of signs further allows us to set up names for groups of ideas that are too complicated to be distinctively yet collectively imagined, such as ideas of any number larger than six, of substances, of complex modes (notably moral and aesthetic qualities) and of genera and species of things (Essay I.iv). It is also supposed to give us control over our imagination and an ability to govern our attention (Essay I.ii.4. §46). This allows us to reflect on other aspects of our experience than those most immediately related to our needs. Reflection brings connections between objects to our attention that we would not otherwise notice and puts us in a position to refine our language by instituting names for what we have discovered. A more refined language facilitates yet more exact reflection, and language and our reflective capacities proceed to work in tandem to develop our cognitive abilities to their highest level (Essay I.ii.5).

7. Languages as Analytic Methods

In later works (Treatise of Animals [1755], Grammar, part of the Course of Study for the Prince of Parma, [1768], and Logic [1780]), Condillac explained more clearly the transition from a language of natural signs to the language of action made up of institutional signs.

He explicitly distinguished two types of “language of action.” The first one is “natural” (and thus appears to correspond to the use of natural signs also described in the Essay). Its signs depend on the conformation of the organs (Treatise of Animals II. 4, Grammar I.1, Logic II.2). As a consequence, different species of animals have a different natural language insofar as they have different organs (Treatise of Animals II.4). This language is innate in its expression since different signs are naturally caused by different ideas independently of any learning. However, the interpretation of this language is not innate: we have to learn to interpret its signs (Grammar I.1, Logic II.2). (Strictly speaking, cries, facial expressions, and gestures are signs only insofar as we interpret them: before any interpretation they are just the effects on our body of some ideas occurring in our minds.) The second type of language of action is institutional or artificial. Condillac makes clear that its signs are artificial but they are not arbitrary (Grammar I.1). They are not arbitrary because they are chosen according to a rule of analogy with the natural signs (Grammar I.1, Logic II.2).

The transition from the natural language of action to the institutional language of action is a gradual process dictated by the need to analyze natural signs. As Condillac explains, there is no succession of various ideas in the mind of the speaker of the natural language of action: the idea of the external object affecting him or her, a judgment about the object, and the passions it arouses occur more or less at the same time. In a similar fashion their visible and audible natural signs (the gestures, facial expressions, and cries made) occur more or less at the same time, although the beginning of a decomposition of these signs is already prompted by the mere spatio-temporal constraints of any visible action: it takes some time to jump around or to extend one own’s arm. Let’s imagine a situation in which we have a speaker of the natural language and its first interpreter. In the presence of an animal, previously experienced as dangerous, the speaker goes into a fright. The action that follows appears to be confused to the interpreter, since it is the immediate expression of a variety of ideas all occurring at the same time in the mind of the speaker. The desire to understand leads the interpreter to the beginning of an analysis of the action and, as a consequence, to an analysis of ideas: for example, the attention of the interpreter is drawn first to the object pointed at by the speaker’s finger and then to speaker’s face expressing fear. The related ideas that were simultaneous in the mind of the speaker become successive for the interpreter. The success and failure of the interpreter incites the speaker to be clear to herself and to others: the speaker is motivated to analyze her own ideas so that she may break down the corresponding visible and audible signs and be better understood. This breaking down of signs makes the job easier for the interpreter who in her turn replies by decomposing her own gestures in accordance with the analysis of ideas. This gradual process of decomposition or articulation of gestures, cries, and facial expressions marks the passage from a natural language of action to an institutional language of action (Grammar I.1 & I.7, Logic II.2).

Thus, language of action and analysis of ideas mutually enrich each other, according to a hierarchy of needs (at first, communication will be about food and immediate dangers). The decomposing of signs matching the analysis of ideas leads to the creation of new signs, following a rule of analogy with the signs already known and this process allows the consideration of further ideas. Conversely, no consideration of more refined ideas would be possible without the corresponding signs. An example that Condillac favors is that of the system of numeration based on the ten fingers, which allows for the progress of arithmetic: a single finger is first used to designate the unit but can subsequently be used for designating 10, 100, and so on (Language of Calculi I.1).

From the primitive artificial language of action a language of articulated sounds emerged, as Condillac had already explained in detail in the Essay: cries of different tonality were deemed suitable to express different emotions. This phenomenon is at the origin of the tonal accent of Greek and Latin, which Condillac took to be closer to the first spoken languages of humanity. Onomatopeia, he speculated, may have been at the origin of certain words used to designate certain things, while other words were chosen by way of analogy: for example, words for mental operations originally indicated words for the operations of the sense-organs (Essay II.i.2-3, Grammar I.7). Grammar gradually emerged, first reflecting the most basic needs of humanity and then gaining in complexity as needs multiplied. (Condillac makes the conjecture that in the syntax of these first languages the object of the action came first and preceded the verb, since the object was the most vital point of interest for primitive people: Essay II.i.9, Grammar II.8)

The first spoken languages of humanity combined a language of articulated sounds with the language of action. They resembled more a kind of chant accompanied by a “dance” of gestures and steps: this fact also explains why a Roman or Greek orator could be understood by a large crowd of people, while a modern Frenchman could not (Essay II.i.1-3).

After a phase in which the language of action had been fruitfully combined with the language of articulated sounds, different elements of this mix began to develop autonomously. They also recombined later in various guises. On this basis, Condillac attempted to account for the development of arts and forms of expression such as music, dance, theatre, poetry. For example, the language of action can dispense altogether with sounds of any kind, while extending the range of its expressive gestures: already impressed by accounts of ancient pantomimes, Condillac saw this point confirmed by the modern development of the language of signs for deaf-and-dumb people in the school of the Abbé de l’Epée (Essay II.i.4, Grammar I.1). By developing only the tonal part of the sounds, the language of action can turn into music, unaccompanied by any words and gestures (Essay II.i.5).

The details of this account of the development of arts are highly debatable, but Condillac thought that on its basis he had been able to explain the reasons for some disputes in art criticism. Whatever worked for an ancient language does not work for a modern language that has shed most of its language of action component. Thus we should not expect modern tragedy in French to replicate modes of expression precisely designed for a more expressive language like that of ancient tragedy. (Essay II.i.3)

The transition from the natural language of action to the artificial language of action and from this latter to the language of articulate sounds is recapitulated in an amplified form in the general movement of arts and civilization away from primitive forms of languages that are more expressive of emotions towards forms of language that are more descriptive. All historical languages can be considered as “analytic methods,” since their grammar, prosody, and vocabulary reflect a certain stage in the development of analysis. However, in the formation of historical languages various contingencies such as the climate and the temper of people played a role. Historical languages contain many errors made in the analysis of facts and these errors are passed on from generation to generation (Grammar I.1-8, Logic II.3-4). Science should strive to be based on a “well-formed language.” Late in his life, Condillac took algebra to be the best model of such a well-formed language (Logic II.5). In algebra we show clearly and by a limited number of steps how to find certain unknown quantities given certain known quantities. Condillac took himself to have done something similar for philosophy. What is initially known is sensation. Condillac took himself to have shown in his work the genesis of all mental life from this primitive element (Logic II.7-8).

8. The Animal Soul, Moral Laws, and Immortality

At the beginning the Essay, Condillac demonstrated that the soul is immaterial, in opposition to Locke’s hypothesis of thinking matter. According to Condillac, God cannot give to matter the power to think. The operations of thought show by themselves the unity of consciousness, and the unity of consciousness is only accountable by presupposing a simple and indivisible subject of inherence for consciousness itself. Condillac presents this line of argument by saying that individual perceptions are indivisible in their nature and so they cannot inhere in different substances. Even assuming that each individual perception inheres in a separate individual substance, the act of comparing perceptions could not occur without a simple and indivisible substratum. “However, a mass matter is not one; it is a multitude” or, as Condillac also said, matter is an assemblage or collection of things (Essay I.i.1 §6). Therefore, the soul must be an immaterial substance.

At the same time, Condillac made clear that after the fall of the first man and woman the soul has become dependent on the body: the building blocks of mental life, sensations, are occasioned by various physical motions caused by the external objects affecting the senses and the nervous system (Essay I.i.1 §8). If higher cognitive functions are ultimately to be explained merely in terms of transformations of sensations, then Condillac was left with the problem of showing the precise line of demarcation between humans and other animals. Two solutions to this problem were foreclosed to Condillac. One possible solution was the view of Aristotle: the human soul is characterized by a higher rational part in addition to the vegetative and animal parts (the vegetative part being responsible for nutrition and growth, and the animal part being responsible for sensation and motion). Condillac’s sensism argued precisely against this essentialist view of the difference between higher and lower cognitive functions and by extension against the essentialist view of the difference between humans and animals. The second solution, which in Condillac’s times was proposed by Buffon in his Natural History (1749-53), was the Cartesian hypothesis of a mechanical soul. According to Descartes, only the rational soul is responsible for consciousness. Animals, being devoid of this kind of soul, are mere machines and thus incapable of being conscious. Condillac, on his part, was rather inclined to endorse the common-sense view that makes animals capable of sensation and thus of consciousness.

In the Essay, Condillac had identified the use of language as necessary for higher cognitive functions, including memory, the control of the imagination, and reflection. Animals, which at best have the use of natural signs, can only recall (imagine) absent objects if a present object has been habitually associated with them. Unable to use at will signs standing for absent objects, they are without memory. Thus they live from moment to moment, without any proper notion of a continued past existence in which various events are connected. Everyday is like a new day for them, and they simply repeat habitual patterns of behaviour most conducive to their survival. They are at best capable of what Condillac calls ‘reminiscence’ and thus they can recognize an object as previously experienced. The case of a boy who grew up among bears in the woods between Lithuania and Poland appeared to provide confirmation for animals’ mental inferiority: found unable to speak, this youth only gradually learned the language, and afterwards could not recall his past life nor did he have any notion of having spent many years in the woods (Essay I.iv.2 §§23-25). Another case, that of a deaf-and-dumb boy who suddenly recovered his hearing, further confirmed Condillac’s hypothesis: after a period of learning, the boy confirmed that while he was deaf he could not attach any meaning to the sign of the cross that he saw his parents doing, nor did he have any notion of death, life after death, or God (Essay I.iv.2 §§13-22). (Condillac regretted that the examiners of the case had asked the boy merely about his religious beliefs.) Subsequently, as is evident in his correspondence with Cramer and Maupertuis, Condillac had come to believe that he had drawn too sharp a line between lower and higher cognitive functions and that thus he had in effect reintroduced a dualism of reason and sensation in the mind.

Condillac addressed this problem in the Treatise of Sensations by recognizing a level of pre-linguistic reflection that is common to animals and human beings. At the same time, Condillac insisted drawing a distinction between the pre-linguistic capacities of human beings and those of animals. He described at length how the statue acquires the ideas of extended objects by touch and how it comes to refer the causes of sensations received by the other senses to these objects. Touch is considered as a sort of pre-linguistic instrument of analysis: it originally discriminates parts outside of parts in its objects and by its means, sensations become ideas, that is, they acquire a reference to external objects. Condillac then argued that animals must be inferior to humans because their sense of touch is not as developed as that of human beings. He thought that human hands and fingers are uniquely adapted to receiving a multiplicity of different impressions and therefore the human sense of touch is able to discriminate more accurately the qualities of objects than that of other animals. From this difference of degree, Condillac went on to argue for a difference of kind between the soul of animals and that of humans: God in his benevolence would not trap a soul capable of superior operations in an inferior body like that of animals; therefore, the soul of animals must be of an inferior kind (Treatise, The Plan of This Work, Note).

In the Treatise of Animals Condillac further developed his views. He repeated what he had said in the Treatise of Sensations: animals are capable of pre-linguistic reflection, just like humans. They judge and compare ideas and by these means discover how to do things necessary for their survival. By this kind of reflection, all animals learn the proper use of their organs, in order to flee what is dangerous and search what is useful to them. Reflection is at the origin of the formation habits, like the one that makes us avoid a falling object that is heavy. As the actions originally done deliberately by reflection are gradually turned into habits, “the animal touches, sees, walks without reflecting on what it is doing” (Treatise of Animals, II.1). Thus, the more habits are formed, the less need there is for reflection. What is called instinct in animals is not an innate pattern of behaviour, but rather a well-developed habit (Treatise of Animals II.5). This habit bears witness to the effort of inventive reflection that originally taught animals the use of their organs: birds have to learn how build their nests and beavers have to learn how to build their shelters (Treatise of Animals II.2).

Condillac, however, thinks animals are less inventive than humans because they have fewer needs and also “fewer means to multiply their own ideas and make combinations of all sort” (Treatise of Animals, II.2). In different words, animals are more easily satisfied with their lot and they are less intelligent. Contrary to what many authors say, animals of the same species do not do the same things because they imitate each other. Rather, they all end up doing the same things, because they have the same needs and the same organs perfectly suited to the satisfaction of those needs. Thus, each animal acquires the same habits as any other animal of the same species, whether placed alone or in company. Paradoxically, humans end up being different from each other precisely because they are the only animals that imitate each other. There is relatively little communication of ideas by way of language among animals: their needs are more limited and therefore they do not need to learn from each other as much as humans do. Humans, on the contrary, desire to learn from each other more and so imitate each other. As they communicate more with each other, they also discover the differences in their talents and interests and put them to use for themselves and others (Treatise of Animals II.3). Animals keep to their subsistence economy, while humans develop a system of division of labour in order to satisfy their needs: one might start by trying to be a skilled hunter like his neighbour only to discover that he had better leave hunting to his neighbor and concentrate on the manufacture of bows and arrows. Since, individuals are often placed in different circumstances requiring different solutions, new needs emerge. As new needs emerge, useful discoveries are made and social ties get stronger. Just like in the Essay, the intertwined factors of language and social intercourse make humans superior to animals in their capacities.

The difference between humans and animals is still characterized by Condillac as difference of degree. For example, animals have a natural language of action, just like humans, and they use it to communicate with each other their needs and to help each other. The signs of this language vary among different species not only according to the different ideas they have but also according to the variety of organs (external conformation) they possess, since these organs condition the way ideas can be expressed. Animals of different species whose external conformation resembles each other can communicate with each other, at least to a certain extent: Condillac describes the case of dogs that can go as far as understanding not simply the language of action but also the language of articulate sounds of humans. But animals whose external conformation is widely different from ours cannot communicate with us, as the case of the parrot shows: it can articulate sounds, but both his ideas and his language of action is widely different from ours (Treatise of Animals II.4).

Condillac seems to have thought that only humans have organs that allow for the language of action to be relatively more expressive, thus keeping a kind of parallelism between the cognitive capacities of the mind and the complexity of the structure of the body (a complexity not simply reducible to that of the brain but also including that of the peripheral organs).

What ultimately sets apart humans from animals is the knowledge of God and morals. In the middle of the Treatise of Animals, Condillac inserts a long chapter he claims to have submitted as an anonymous dissertation to the Academy of Berlin just a few years before. Here Condillac proceeds to demonstrate the existence of God. Condillac insists on a natural progression of ideas: at first, humans realized that their happiness or unhappiness depended completely on external causes and posited deities equivalent to the powers of nature. Then they came to posit a first cause in order to avoid an infinite regression in explanation of these natural powers. Finally, the presence of design leads them to recognize this cause as intelligent and free (Treatise of Animals II.6). While the details of this chapter are not original, they set the stage for Condillac’s moral argument for the immortality of the soul.

Condillac first insists on the spontaneous emergence of moral laws. The more humans reflect on their common needs, the more they realize how necessary it is to help each other and refrain from certain kinds of action. Thus “they come to agree on what is allowed and what is forbidden, and their conventions become laws to which action must be subordinated: this is the beginning of morality” (Treatise of Animals, II.7).

At first they think of these laws as conventions they designed to enhance their well-being, given the needs that they have and the scarcity of means to satisfy them. But as they discover the existence of God, they recognize that God, by disposing of everything in nature, is the ultimate source of goods and evils that may befall human beings. Moral laws then acquire a providential meaning: by obeying these laws, humans obey God himself, who is the author of nature. The laws of morality are both natural laws and laws of divine institution, since nature is God’s creation. But given that the proportion of goods and evils in this life does not correspond to the merits and demerits of individuals, it is necessary to postulate a life after death where the just will be rewarded and the wicked will be punished.

Thus, According to Condillac, the immortality of the human soul is not a consequence of its immateriality. All created beings, whether immaterial or material, are naturally contingent: “if we consider only the nature of the soul, it can cease to be. Who created it can let it go back to nothingness. It will continue to exist only because God is just. But in this way immortality is guaranteed to the soul as if it were a consequence of its essence” (Treatise of Animals II.7). Immortality is guaranteed to the human soul since the human soul is capable of knowing God’s laws and God is supremely just: only in this derivative sense, “immortality is guaranteed to the soul as if it were a consequence of its essence.”

Unlike human beings, animals are incapable of knowing moral laws. God has not granted them the means to distinguish between what is right and what is wrong and so “he has shown that he does not expect anything from them” (Treatise of Animals II.7). “Nothing is enjoined and nothing is forbidden to beasts. Their only rule is force. Incapable of merit and demerit, they have no right to divine justice. Their soul is thus mortal” (Treatise of Animals II.7). But the soul of animals is immaterial, just like the one of humans. Thus, we see how Condillac was able to separate the question of the immateriality of the soul from the question of the immortality of the soul.

An objection could be raised against Condillac: if small children, who are still too young to know moral laws, suffer and die, would they be rewarded in the afterlife as compensation for their sufferings? And should we not think the same of animals, who are like small children, suffering and yet incapable of knowledge of moral laws? Condillac appears not to have appreciated the strength of this objection: for him, the sufferings of animals are either a means to warn them of danger or a necessary consequence of the laws of nature instituted by God. That an analogy could be drawn to children or mentally disabled people is not considered by Condillac.

9. Commerce and Government

In the Treatise of Sensations, Condillac said that “The words ‘goodness’ and ‘beauty’ express the properties through which things contribute to our pleasure. As a result, every sentient being has ideas of goodness and of beauties relative to himself” (Treatise IV.iii.1). He further said that “the good and the beautiful are not at all absolute: they are relative to the nature of the man who judges them and to his makeup” (Treatise, IV.iii.3). He clarified in a footnote that he was not referring to goodness and beauty in themselves but about the judgments that a man, who lives alone (as the statue of the Treatise of Sensations), may make of them: not everything that such a man judges as good will be morally good, nor everything he judges beautiful will be really beautiful. Indeed we have seen that Condillac thought that people in society could come to an agreement about moral laws and that these should be taken as objectively valid. At the same time, Condillac insisted on a certain degree of relativity in the estimation of goods and evils. The human stage of development is characterized by a multiplication of needs, and it appears that this by itself would allow for a variety in preferences, given the different conditions of people. Humans are the first creatures that can turn self-love in a proper desire for self-preservation, since animals cannot have the notion of death. But humans may conceive of a variety of ways of satisfying the same material needs. Moreover, their needs multiply well beyond the mere material sphere of self-preservation. To describe this potentially unlimited development of needs, Condillac went as far as to say that even if humans were able to satisfy all their needs they would still be unable to satisfy their most pressing need, which is the need to desire (Treatise of Animals II.8).

In one of his later works, Commerce and Government (1776), Condillac considered what he took to be some of the economic and political implications of his views. The book was published three months before Adam Smith’s Wealth of Nations, and it is rightly considered a milestone in the tradition of laissez-faire economics and classical liberalism.

Condillac began with an examination of economic value, which he thought was determined by the utility and relative scarcity of a good (Commerce and Government I.1). Since people in different situations of life estimate goods differently, social cooperation based on the division of labour becomes possible through the market. As Condillac said, thus anticipating by one century the insights of marginalists, in every voluntary market transaction each party gives what he or she values less in exchange for what he or she values more (Commerce and Government I.6). It follows that every free exchange is to the mutual benefit of both parties. Condillac justified property rights in a Lockian fashion by original occupation, appropriation by labour, or voluntary transfer (Commerce and Government I.12). The government’s main task is to maintain the order of society both internally and externally (Commerce and Government I.10), but the welfare of citizens is better guaranteed by the removal of barriers to free enterprise and free trade, as Condillac argued at length in the second part of the work. Government’s various “blows” against the freedom of commerce, such as taxes on consumption, monopolies, cartels, trade barriers, price controls, currency manipulations, public debt, and wars, only benefit a few privileged people who are politically connected. Economic interventionism leads to an unhealthy and “excessive” multiplication of needs in the group of people privileged by these measures. This multiplication of needs is manifested by the rise in the consumption of luxury products (Commerce and Government I.27, preface to Part II, II.16). (This unhealthy and excessive multiplication of needs, manifested by a taste for luxury, should be contrasted with the healthy development of needs that characterizes the rise of humans above the mere level of animal economy described by Condillac in the Treatise of Animals.) On the other hand, economic interventionism pushes back the majority into a sort of animal economy, where they are constantly threatened by poverty and starvation. Thus, policies of economic intervention exacerbate social inequalities. The equilibrating mechanism of the market would mitigate inequalities by lowering the prices of goods thanks to open competition among entrepreneurs (Commerce and Government II.1). Whatever inequalities remain in a free market society would just reflect a difference in talents and would rather be to the benefit of all. Certainly, the desire for human welfare cannot legitimately justify measures such as price controls on goods of first necessity such as wheat. These measures are not only unjust but also turn out to be counterproductive, notwithstanding the best intentions of advocates of restrictions on private property rights: “The rights of humanity opposed to those of property! What gibberish!” (Commerce and Government II.15)

10. Problems with Condillac’s Sensationism

10.1 Idealism

In the Essay Condillac not only claimed that sensations are occasioned by the action of external objects on our sense organs, but also that they are images or representations of those objects. More precisely, he claimed that the objects that affect our sense organs must be extended and hence material things, though they may not have the precise shapes or sizes that our senses represent them as having, and though they do not have colours on their surfaces or bear qualities of smell and taste (Essay I.i.2. §§11–12). But if “we never leave ourselves and never perceive anything other than our own thoughts,” as Condillac claimed at the outset of the Essay (I.i.1. §1), then what could entitle us to maintain that our sensations bear this degree of resemblance to external objects or that there even is an external world containing objects that occasion our sensations?

In the Essay, Condillac contented himself with replying to this question by claiming that while we have a clear idea what it means to attribute extension to an object, we have no clear idea what it means to say that objects are coloured or scented, and that while there is evidence that proves that we do not always perceive the sizes or shapes of objects correctly, there is no evidence that proves that we are wrong to think that external objects have some form of extension (Essay I.i.2. §§11–13). Neither claim is compelling. Indeed, it is astounding how someone familiar with Descartes’s dreaming argument could have made the latter one. But both were asserted without any further elaboration or defence. As Diderot later pointed out in his Letter on the Blind, for Condillac to rest his case against scepticism about the existence of an external world on such facile grounds was to ignore the powerful reasons for denying the existence of material things that had been articulated by Berkeley.

This is not a problem that Condillac rectified in the Treatise. Instead, he attempted to side-step it by focusing just on the question of how experience leads us to form the idea that there are extended, external objects that bear the qualities of colour, taste, and smell exhibited in our sensations, while eschewing any over-confident metaphysical claims about the extent to which this idea may be correct. Indeed, towards close of the Treatise he admitted that the question of whether material things exist is not one that we are in any position to answer. We cannot be sure that objects are extended, shaped, and mobile, yet colourless, odourless, and tasteless. For all we know the objects that cause our sensations may not only be extended and solid, but endowed with qualities that resemble our sensations of smell, taste, and colour. Or they may be not only colourless, odourless, and tasteless but unextended (Treatise IV.v).

However, Condillac had no right to simply-side step the metaphysical question of the nature of body. His account of how touch instructs the eyes to see figures and locations describes the hands as extended objects that move through space and touch various parts of the extended surfaces of the eyes (Treatise III.iii.1–9). One cannot remain agnostic about whether spatially extended objects really exist if one’s theory of perception presupposes that one’s sense organs are themselves extended and mobile.

10.2 Materialism

Condillac’s account of sensation also fit uneasily with his claim that the mind is immaterial. He took sensations to be modifications of the mind’s being. He also stipulated that such things as colours and scents are sensations. In the Essay, he specified that there is nothing in bodies that resembles colours or scents and that these qualities are something that belongs to sentient creatures alone (Essay I.i.2. §12). In the Treatise, employing a striking turn of phrase, he claimed that while we might think of a being who possessed only the sense of smell as a being who scents a rose, for itself this being will simply be the smell of a rose. “From its perspective,” he wrote, “the odours are nothing other than its own modifications or manners of being” (Treatise I.i.2). The same holds of colours. A being whom we would describe as seeing red would at first experience itself as simply being red. Touch would instruct it to attribute this redness to other objects. But this instruction cannot be known to be correct, whereas there can be no question that the sensation of red is a modification of the being of a sentient creature. Red is not, therefore, what might be called the intentional object of an act of sensing, or if it is, it is so only derivatively; it is primarily a quality of the sentient being, who experiences itself as literally turning red when it has this sensation (Treatise I.xi.8).

The problem with this position becomes clear when it is considered that Condillac also maintained that colours are extended. In the Essay he claimed that were we to have no other sensations than those of light and colour they would “trace (traceront) extension, lines, and figures before our eyes” so that we would find these ideas to be contained in our sensations (Essay I.i.2. §9). Moreover, this discovery is not an effect of learning or association. Extension and shape are original features possessed by visual sensations, discernible simply by attentive reflection. Someone blind since birth and newly made to see would not originally perceive everything before him as if it were a “point” (i.e., an unextended spot of colour), but would experience “light distributed (répandue) in every direction [outwards as well as above, below, to the left and to the right]” (Essay I.vi. §§12, 14). Condillac continued to retain this view in the Treatise, though with some refinements: Whereas in the Essay he had maintained that colours are extended over all three dimensions, in the Treatise he endorsed the Berkeleyan position that we learn to perceive depth. He also maintained that we do not immediately appreciate that colours are bounded and figured even in two dimensions, but need to learn that they have these features. But he continued to maintain that the colours we originally experience are extended over two dimensions. “Colour presents [offre] extension to the soul that it modifies,” he wrote in the Treatise, “because it is itself extended. This is a fact that cannot be brought into doubt. It is demonstrated by observation” (Treatise I.xi.8). Insofar as colours are extended they must have shapes, even if those shapes are not immediately perceived. The process of learning to perceive shape does not transform our colour sensations and lead them to acquire properties they did not previously have; it merely leads us to discover ones that were there all along. This is the point of claiming that not everything that is necessarily involved with a sensation need be perceived by it.

Condillac thus appears to have been committed to four mutually antagonistic propositions:

  1. Colours are extended.
  2. Colours are sensations.
  3. Sensations are modifications of the mind’s being.
  4. The mind is unextended.

Hume had confronted the conflict between these propositions by denying (3) and (4). For Hume, our visual impressions are compounds that consist of a number of minimally visible, coloured points that are disposed alongside another in space, but the notion that impressions and ideas inhere in some mental substance is unintelligible, whether this substance is taken to be material or immaterial. Reid, in contrast, had insisted on (3) and (4) but had declared that the term “colour” is used equivocally in (1) and (2). We experience sensations of colour, which are unextended states of feeling experienced by the mind in just the same way as it experiences feelings of pleasure or pain. But colour terminology is most often used to refer to some unknown thing in external objects that causes us to experience these sensations. These external, so-called “coloured” objects are conceived as being extended and figured, but the mind does not become aware of them by contemplating some internal, iconic representation or image. It has a thought that refers to them. Affection of our sense organs does not produce an impression or image; it occasions a thought. The thought itself is unextended, like the mind whose state it is, but it is a thought of or about an object. The object is thought to possess a quality of extension, as well as to be a cause of a certain concomitant sensation of colour. But the thought that this object is extended and a cause of a sensation of colour is itself neither extended nor coloured. So for Reid, either “colours” are powers in extended, external objects to bring about sensations in us, in which case they are not sensations had by the mind, or they are sensations had by the mind, in which case they are not extended.

However, unlike Hume and Reid, Condillac was unwilling to deny or qualify any of (1)-(4). Unlike Hume, he insisted on the existence of an immaterial mind who is the subject of sensations of colour (Essay I.i.1. §6). And unlike Reid, he insisted that colours are unequivocally both modifications of the mind’s being and literally extended. These commitments exposed him to charges of tacit materialism. Most notably, René Réaumur, writing under the pseudonym of the Abbé de Lignac, observed in the supplements to his Lettres à un Américan (1756), that just as Condillac had accused Buffon of supposing that machines have a quality that is essential to spirits, sensibility, so Condillac was liable to the charge of supposing that spirits have a quality that belongs uniquely to machines, three dimensionality.

Condillac’s response to this charge, in his “Lettre de M. l’abbé de Condillac à l’auteur des Lettres à un Américan” (1756, and appended to subsequent editions of the Treatise on Animals) was to claim that, “If I say that our sensations give us an idea of extension, it is only because we take them for qualities of objects when we refer them to something external. But I have proven many times that they certainly do not give us this idea when we consider them as a manner of being of our soul.” This echoes claims made in the Essay and the Treatise. In the Essay, Condillac claimed that we attribute the extension or shape we find in colours to something outside of us rather than to ourselves considered as thinking subjects (I.i.2. §11), presumably because extension is incompatible with the simplicity that must be ascribed to a thinking being. In almost the same breath, he claimed that we are wrong to imagine that the chromatic quality of colours (as opposed to the extension and shape they map out) actually lies on the surface of external objects, purportedly because we have no clear idea of what it would mean for a body to be coloured (I.i.2. §12). But such claims are hardly adequate to avoid the problem and perhaps not even coherent. Either the chromatic qualities that we experience as modifications of our being are extended or they are not. If they are extended, then the claim that we do not recognize this fact when we think of them as modifications of our own being is merely an evasion. If they are not extended, then if we never experience anything other than our own sensations, as Condillac claimed at the outset of the Essay, it is mysterious how we come to attribute extension to external objects.

In the Treatise, Condillac was no longer willing to declare that objects can be known to be either extended or colourless. He simply claimed that its experiences would lead his “statue” to first conceive of colours as modifications of its own being, then to conceive them as modifications of its extended sense organs, and finally to conceive them as modifications of external objects (Treatise III.3). But this was not to answer the metaphysical problem but rather to ignore it. If colours are in fact extended, as the Treatise continued to insist, yet the mind ultimately only knows its own sensations, however variously they might be transformed by cognitive processing, then we can only come to be in a position to attribute colours to external objects if we first experience those colours, which suggests that they must modify our being.

Though Condillac’s official reply to the charge of materialism, as expressed in the letter to Lignac, is something of a disappointment, scholars have occasionally read the Treatise as taking some steps towards a more radical way of dealing with the problem. Recall that in that work Condillac advanced the view that even though colours are in fact extended and bounded, it is not intuitively evident that they are. We need to learn to see their shapes. Interestingly, what teaches us to see these shapes are tactile sensations of solidity and observations of the appearance and disappearance of colours consequent upon moving our hands before our eyes. Since neither sensations of solidity nor the tactile sensations that accompany hand motions are patently extensive in character, and colours themselves might as well not be so far as the early learner is concerned, some scholars have suggested that the Condillac of the Treatise meant to claim that our perceptions of space are constructed from raw data that, as they are at first experienced by the mind, are in no way spatial. Insofar as the Treatise does move towards this more radical view, it can be seen as a precursor of such 19th century Berkeleyan theories of vision as those of Steinbuch, Mill, Helmholtz, and Wundt. However, those later theories invoked notions of local signs (sensations specific to which nerve is being stimulated) and made explicit appeals to kinaesthetic sensations that are simply absent from Condillac’s work. Lacking those notions, Condillac claimed that an awareness of space cannot be generated from aspatial sensations, and he represented his statue, not as constructing space, but as discovering the spatial features that were already present in its sensations from the first. Viewing him as a precursor of 19th century Berkeleyanism risks overlooking this fact and, as a consequence, misrepresenting his thought.

10.3 Memory and Liberty

In both the Essay and the Treatise Condillac set out to show that all of our cognitive and conative faculties are generated from sensation and can be derived from that operation alone. To this end he identified perception, consciousness, and attention as all being different aspects of the one operation of sensation. Perception is the impression sensation makes upon the mind, consciousness is this impression considered as something experienced by the mind, and attention is simply a more vivid perception. But when Condillac came to account for memory and reminiscence, this project stalled. It is not implausible to maintain that a sensation might continue to be experienced after the object that occasioned it has ceased to act on the sense organ. But such an “echo” of a past sensation is itself a present phenomenon. It might be fainter than other sensations that are now occurring, but being experienced to be faint is not the same thing as being thought to have originated in the past. Rather than explain how sensation can give rise to an awareness of pastness Condillac simply helped himself to the notion. In the Essay, he defined “reminiscence” as the awareness that a perception has been had “before” without anywhere explaining how the idea that one thing can be “before” another could arise simply from sensation (Essay I.ii.1. §15). In the Treatise he distinguished the memory of a sensation from a current sensation by calling the former “weakly sensing what one was (sentir foiblement ce qu’elle a été)” and the latter “vividly sensing what one is (sentir vivement ce qu’elle est).” But then he immediately went on to say that recalled sensations can sometimes be more vivid than current ones (Treatise I.ii.8–9). So what necessarily distinguishes remembered sensation from current sensation, on this account, is just that remembered sensations are of what “was.” But this is not to explain how we could get the idea that a sensation is of what was as opposed to what is.

Similar difficulties arise in connection with the will. In the Essay, Condillac supposed that the imagination is initially outside of our control. Unless driven by need to conceive the means of achieving an end, we imagine what we do only because in the course of experience we sense accidental or natural signs that suggest particular ideas to us. The use of instituted signs is supposed to change this circumstance and give us a new ability to control our thoughts (Essay I.ii.4.§§45–46). But it is not clear why this should be the case (note, in this regard, the apparent contradiction between Essay I.ii.4. §39 and §46). Just because a being has acquired the ability to produce signs in order to induce thought, it does not follow that this ability must be under the subject’s voluntary control, and if the production of instituted signs is outside of our control, it is not clear how their use can give us a power to control our thoughts.

The “sensationist” label notwithstanding, there is some suggestion that Condillac may have taken both memory and volition to be primitive functions of the soul that are not in fact reducible to sensation. In the Essay he described our awareness of the temporal sequence of our perceptions as a “fundamental experience (première expérience)” (Essay I.ii.1. §15) and in the Dissertation on Liberty (§§9–10) he seems to have taken freedom of choice and the ability to spontaneously direct attention to be original abilities that the soul has whenever it is not impelled by some pressing need.

These views of memory and will are not necessarily inconsistent with Condillac’s sensationism, his repeated claims to derive all the mind’s capacities from the operation of sensation notwithstanding. There are stronger and weaker ways of understanding Condillac’s sensationism. On the stronger understanding, Condillac meant to say that sensation produces all of the other capacities of the soul. On the weaker understanding, he only meant to say that sensation instructs us in the proper employment of our capacities. The weaker reading is compatible with allowing original, irreducible powers of memory and free choice, provided that we take those powers to be ones that we do not at first know how to effectively direct or employ. The stronger reading attributes an absolutely rigorous empiricism to Condillac — one that does not admit that the mind is endowed with any innate abilities. It is not clear what Condillac would have had to gain by insisting on such a rigorous empiricism. Locke’s rejection of innate ideas and innate principles was bound up with a reaction to unquestioned authority and a demand that all knowledge claims be demonstrable by appeal to common experience. But allowing that we possess innate cognitive capacities and innate conative abilities does not interfere with this demand, particularly if we stress, as the weak reading does, that we need to learn how to employ these capacities and abilities, and that experience serves as our best and only true teacher. The pedagogical and methodological conclusions that Condillac most wanted to draw still follow from that qualification, without having to invoke the strong reading.

Bibliography

Primary Literature

Condillac’s Works

  • Lettres inédites à Gabriel Cramer, Georges Le Roy (ed.), Paris: Press Universitaires de France, 1953. For important revisions to Le Roy’s dating of Condillac’s letters, see Petacco 1971.
  • Les Monades, Bongie, Laurence (ed.), in Studies on Voltaire and the Eighteenth Century, 187, 1980.
  • Oeuvres philosophiques, Georges Le Roy (ed.), 3 volumes, Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 1947–1951.
    • Volume I (1947) contains the Essai sur l’origine des connoissances humaines, Traité des Systêmes, Traité des Sensations, “Dissertation sur la liberté,” “Réponse a un reproche qui m’a été fait sur le project exécuté dans le Traité des Sensations,” “Extrait raisonné du traité des sensations,” Traité des Animaux, “Lettre de monsieur l’abbé de Condillac à l’auteur des ‘Lettres à un Américan,’” “Discours de réception a l’académie Françoise,” and selections from the Cours d’études pour l’instruction du Prince de Parme, including the introduction to the course of studies, Grammaire, De l’art d’écrire, De l’art de raisonner, and De l’art de Penser, It is prefaced by Le Roy’s introduction, surveying Condillac’s life, the development of his thought, and his influence.
    • Volume II (1948) contains excerpts from the treatment of ancient and modern history in the Cours d’études, Le Commerce et le Gouvernement, La Logique, La Langue des Calculs, and correspondence.
    • Volume III (1951) contains the Dictionnaire des synonymes and a bibliography containing directions regarding Condillac manuscripts and correspondence.
  • Condillac, Lefèvre, Roger, Vienne: Segliers, 1966. This contains substantial selections from Condillac’s works interpersed with running commentary. It is an excellent introduction to his thought.
  • Essay on the Origin of Human Knowledge, Hans Aarsleff (trans.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2001.
  • La Logique/Logic, W. R. Albury (ed. and trans.), New York: Abaris, 1980. This is a bilingual edition with English translation and a facsimilie reproduction of an early French edition on facing pages. Unfortunately, the editor neglects to indicate which edition is being reproduced.
  • Condillac’s treatise on the sensations, Geraldine Carr (trans.), London: Favil Press, 1930.
  • An Essay on the Origin of Human Knowledge: being a supplement to Mr. Locke’s essay on the human understanding, Thomas Nugent (trans.), London: J. Nourse, 1756. Reprinted in facsimilie, 1971, Gainsville: Scholar’s Facsimilies and Reprints.
  • Philosophical Writings of Etienne Bonnot, Abbé de Condillac, 2 volumes, Franklin Philip (trans.), Hillsdale NJ: Lawrence Erlbaum, 1982–87.
    • Volume I (1982) contains A Treatise on Systems, A Treatise on Sensations, and Logic, or the First Developments of the Art of Thinking. The translation of Condillac’s introduction to the Treatise on Sensations, contains a translation of the “Extrait rasonné,” without acknowledgement or separation from the rest of Condillac’s original introduction. The translation of the Treatise on Sensations, omits the “Dissertation on Liberty.”
    • Volume II (1987) contains a judicious abridgment of the Essay on the Origin of Human Knowledge, and the introduction to the Course of Study for the Prince of Parma,
  • Commerce and Government Considered in Their Mutual Relationship, Shelagh Eltis (trans.), with an introduction by Shelagh Eltis and Walter Eltis, Indianapolis: Liberty Fund, 2008.

Related Primary Source Material

  • Buffon, Georges-Louis Leclerc, Comte de, Histoire naturelle, générale et particulière, Paris: Imprimerie Royale, 1749–53.
  • Bonnet, Charles, 1755, Essai de psychologie, Hildesheim: Olms, 1978.
  • Chesselden, W., 1728, “An Account of some Observations made by a young Gentleman who was born blind ... and was couch’d between 13 and 14 Years of Age,” London: W. Innys, 1729; reprinted in Royal Society of London, Philosophical Transactions, 35 (402): 447–450.
  • Diderot, Denis, 1749, “Letter on the Blind for the Use of Those Who See,” in Diderot’s Early Philosophical Works, Margaret Jourdain (trans.), New York: Burt Franklin, 1972.
  • Helvetius, Claude A., 1760, De L’esprit, or, Essays on the mind and its several faculties, New York: Burt Franklin, 1970.
  • Hume, David, 1739, A Treatise of Human Nature, Book I, David Fate Norton and Mary J. Norton (eds.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000.
  • Lignac, Joseph Adrien Lelarge, Abbé de [Réaumur, René Antoine Ferchault de], 1756, Suite des “Lettres à un Américan” sur les IV et V Volumes de l’ “Histoire Naturelle” de M. de Buffon, et sur le “Traité des Animaux” de M. l’abbé de Condillac, 4 vols., Hambourg. (Cited by Le Roy in Condillac, Oeuvres philosophiques, vol. I: 381 n.19.)
  • Reid, Thomas, 1764, An Inquiry into the Human Mind on the Principles of Common Sense, Derek R. Brookes (ed.), University Park: The Pennsylvania State University, 1997.
  • Tetens, Johan Nicolai, 1777, Philosophische Versuche über die menschliche Natur und ihre Entwicklung, Wilhelm Uebele (ed.), Berlin: Reuther & Richard, 1913.

Secondary Literature

  • Aarsleff, Hans, 1975, “Condillac’s Speechless Statue,” Akten des II. Internationalen Leibniz-Kongresses (Volume 4), Wiesbaden: 287–302.
  • Aarsleff, Hans, 1982, From Locke to Saussure: Essays on the Study of Language and Intellectual History, Minneapolis: University of Minnesota.
  • Aarsleff, Hans, 2006, “Philosophy of Language,” in Knud Haakonssen (ed.), The Cambridge History of Eighteenth-Century Philosophy, Volume 1, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Albury, W. R., 1986, “The order of Ideas,” in John A. Shuster (ed.), The Politics and Rhetoric of Scientific Method, Dordrecht: Kluwer.
  • Baertschi, Bernard, 1984, “La statue de Condillac, image du reel ou fiction logique?” Revue Philosophique de Louvain, 82: 335–364.
  • Baguenault de Puchesse, Gustave, 1910, Condillac: sa vie, sa philosophie, son influence, Paris: Plon-Nourrit.
  • Beal, M. W., 1973, “Condillac as Precursor of Kant,” Studies on Voltaire and the Eighteenth Century, 102: 193–229.
  • Bertrand, Aliènor (ed.), 2002, Condillac: L’origine de langage, Paris: Presses Universitaires de France.
  • Bertrand, Aliènor (ed.), 2002, Le vocabulaire de Condillac, Paris: Ellipses.
  • Bongie, Laurence L., 1978, “A new Condillac Letter and the Genesis of the Traité des sensations,” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 16: 83–94.
  • Cassirer, Ernst, 1951, The Philosophy of the Enlightenment, C.A. Koellin and James P. Pettegrove (trans.), Boston: Beacon.
  • Charrak, André, 2003, Empirisme et métaphysique: L’Essai sur l’origine des connaissances humaines de Condillac, Paris: J. Vrin.
  • Dagognet, François, 2004, L’animal selon Condillac: Étude sur le Traité des animaux, Paris: J. Vrin.
  • Derrida, Jacques, 1987, The Archaeology of the Frivolous, John P. Leavy (trans.), Lincoln: University of Nebraska.
  • Duchesneau, François, 1974, “Condillac critique de Locke,” Studi Internationali di Filosofia, 6: 77–98.
  • Falkenstein, Lorne, 2005, “Condillac’s Paradox,” Journal of the History of Philosophy, 43: 403–435.
  • Funke, Gerhard, 1957, “Natur und zweite Natur im konsequenten Sensualismus. Condillacs Transformationstheorie,” Philosophia Narturalis, 4: 101–125.
  • George, Rolf A., 1991, “The Tradition of Thought Experiments,” in Tamara Horowitz (ed.), Epistemology in Thought Experiments in Science and Philosophy, Lanham: Rowman & Littlefield.
  • Gilot, Michel and Sgard, Jean, 1981, “Biographie,” in Jean Sgard, ed., Corpus Condillac, Geneva: Slatkine.
  • Grandi, Giovanni B., 2008, “Reid and Condillac on Sensation and Perception: A Thought Experiment on Sensory Deprivation,” Southwest Philosophy Review, 24: 191–200.
  • Hasnaoui, C., 1977, “Condillac, chemins du sensualisme,” in M. Duchet and M. Jalley (eds.), Langues et langages de Leibniz à l’ encyclopédie, Paris: U.G.E.
  • Heidsieck, François, 1985, “La métaphysique de Condillac,” Archives de Philosophie, 48: 643–652.
  • Hine McNiven, Ellen, 1979, A Critical Study of Condillac’s Traité des Systems, The Hague: M. Nijhoff.
  • Jacquette, Dale, 2015, “Condillac’s Analytic Dilemma,” History of Philosophy Quarterly, 32: 141–160.
  • Joly, Andre, 1985, “Cartesian or Condillacian Linguistics?” Topoi, 4: 145–49.
  • Knight, Isabel F., 1968, “Bibliographical Essay,” in Isabel Knight, The Geometric Spirit: The Abbé de Condillac and the French Enlightenment, New Haven: Yale.
  • Knight, Isabel F., 1968, The Geometric Spirit: The Abbé de Condillac and the French Enlightenment, New Haven: Yale. Though dated, this work remains unsurpassed as the authorative treatment of Condillac’s thought in English.
  • Kourim. Z., 1974. “Le discours de la méthode de Condillac,” Revue de métaphysique et de morale, 79: 177–195.
  • Kreimendahl, Lothar, 1982, “Condillac und die Monaden. Zu einem neuaufgefundenen Text des Abbés,” Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie, 64: 280–288.
  • Kreimendahl, Lothar, 1984, “Bibliographie des Schrifttums zu Condillac (1840–1980),” Zeitschrift für philosophische Forchung, 38: 311–321.
  • Kreimendahl, Lothar, 1994, Hauptwerke der Philosophie. Rationalismus und Empirismus, Stuttgart: Reclam.
  • Krüger, Lorenz, 1973, “Empirismus und Sensualismus: ein Exkurs über Condillac,” in Lorenz Krüger (ed.), Der Begriff des Empirismus. Erkenntnistheoretische Studien am Beispiel John Lockes, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Koana, Akiko, 1985, “La theorie musicale dans l’epistemologie de Condillac,” in Peter McCormick (ed.), The Reasons of Art, Ottawa: University of Ottawa.
  • Lenoir, Raymond, 1924, Condillac, Paris: F. Alcan.
  • LeRoy, Georges, 1937, La psychologie de Condillac, Paris: Boivin.
  • Malherbe, Michel, 2004, “Introduction” to Condillac, Traité des animaux, Paris: J. Vrin.
  • McRae, Robert, 1961, The Problem of the Unity of the Sciences: Bacon to Kant, Toronto: University of Toronto.
  • Morgan, Michael J., 1977, Molyneux’s Question. Vision, Touch and the Philosophy of Perception, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • O’Neal, John C, 1996, The Authority of Experience: Sensationist Theory in the French Enlightenment, University Park: The Pennsylvania State University.
  • Oppenheimer, Angelika, 2006, “Introduction”, Angelika Oppenheimer (trans.), Versuch über den Ursprung der menschlichen Erkenntnis, Würzburg: Königshausen & Neumann.
  • Paganini, Gianni, 1992, “Psychologie et physiologie de l’entendement chez Condillac,” Dix-huitieme siecle, 24: 165–178.
  • Paganini, Gianni, 1988, “Signes, imagination et mémoire: De la psychologie de Wolff à l’Essai de Condillac” Revue des Sciences Philosophiques et Theologiques, 72: 287–300.
  • Paradis, André, 1993, “De Condillac a Pinel ou les fondements philosophiques du traitement moral,” Philosophiques, 20: 69–112.
  • Pastore, Nicholas, 1971, Selective History of Theories of Visual Perception: 1650–1950, New York: Oxford.
  • Pécharman, Martine, 1999, “Signification et langage dans l’Essai de Condillac,” Revue de métaphysique et de morale, (1): 81–103.
  • Petacco, Piero, 1971, “Note sul carteggio Condillac–Cramer,” Belfagor, 26: 83–95.
  • Robert, Thomas, 2012, “Les deux langages d’action condillaciens: corps, langage, connaissances,” Rivista italiana di filosofia del linguaggio, 5: 150–162.
  • Roberts, Lissa, 1992, “Condillac, Lavoiser, and the Instrumentalization of Science,” Kennis Methode, 16: 172–190.
  • Rousseau, Nicholas, 1986, Connaissance et langage chez Condillac, Geneva: Droz.
  • Sgard, Jean (ed.), 1981, Corpus Condillac, Geneva: Slatkine.
  • Sgard, Jean (ed.), 1982, Condillac et les problèmes du langage, Geneva: Slatkine.
  • Wells, G.A., 1987, The Origin of Language: Aspects of the Discussion from Condillac to Wundt, Chicago: Open Court.
  • Wojciechowska, Wanda, “Le sensualisme de Condillac,” Revue philosophique de la France et de l’étranger, 158: 297–320.

Copyright © 2017 by
Lorne Falkenstein
Giovanni Grandi <Giovanni.Grandi@ubc.ca>

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