Types and Tokens

First published Fri May 1, 2026

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by David Liebesman replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

I leave a note for my daughter: ‘Remember: homework, homework, homework!’. How many words are in the note? On the one hand, there are only two: ‘remember’ and ‘homework’. On the other hand, there are four: three inscriptions of ‘homework’ and one of ‘remember’. Both answers are correct. When we count word types, the answer is two. When we count word tokens, the answer is four. A similar distinction can be made in a variety of cases. Given three orange tabby cats, we can distinguish between the number of token cats (three) and the number of cat types (one). Given three Honda Civic cars, we can distinguish between the number of token cars (three) and the number of car types (one). The type/token distinction is a general metaphysical distinction thought to underlie the aforementioned cases.

Distinguishing types and tokens is important for a variety of theoretical purposes. Consider, for example, the claim that mental states are identical to physical states. Distinguishing type and token mental states is essential for disambiguating this claim. In endorsing it one could hold that each mental state type is identical to a physical state type, or that each mental state token is identical to a physical state token (even if one rejects the type identity claim). The type/token distinction has been utilized in a wide range of discussions both in philosophy and outside of it.

Its wide applicability makes the type/token distinction difficult to investigate, and even more so given the lack of consensus as to the features of the distinction as well as which entities count as types. To surmount this difficulty, this entry will primarily focus on three influential applications of the distinction: words, repeatable artworks, and mental states. As we’ve already seen, in the case of words the type/token distinction is thought to distinguish abstract words from their specific instances—usually utterances or inscriptions. Repeatable artworks are artworks that can, in some sense, have multiple instances. ‘Hey Jude’, for example, can be performed many times. Here, the type/token distinction is thought to distinguish the abstract song itself from (at least) its particular performances. Mental state types, like repeatable artworks, can have a multitude of different instances. Pain, for instance, can be manifested in a variety of particular mental states both within and across individuals.

The entry begins by discussing the origin of the distinction in the work of C.S. Peirce, as well as some early investigations of the distinction in §1. §2 considers what tokens are. §3 considers what types are. §4 considers the relationship between types and tokens. §5 discusses whether the type/token distinction can be understood in terms of other distinctions, where candidates include property/instance, universal/particular, set/member, and kind/member. §6 concludes by sketching some remaining challenges in understanding the type/token distinction.

1. The Introduction of the Distinction and its Uptake

The type/token distinction was introduced a little over a century ago by C.S. Peirce, though it has taken on a life of its own since Peirce’s introduction. We’ll begin our discussion with Peirce, as he is often cited as a touchstone in discussions of the distinction and his remarks are still sometimes used to defend particular claims about types and tokens.[1] Peirce’s discussion (Peirce 1906, 505–6) is surprisingly brief, given its influence. Despite its brevity, the discussion brings out an impressive number of philosophical issues that we will explore in detail. It is worth quoting in nearly complete form:

A common mode of estimating the amount of matter in a MS. or printed book is to count the number of words. There will ordinarily be about twenty thes on a page, and of course they count as twenty words. In another sense of the word “word,” however, there is but one word “the” in the English language; and it is impossible that this word should lie visibly on a page or be heard in any voice, for the reason that it is not a Single thing or Single event. It does not exist; it only determines things that do exist. Such a definitely significant Form, I propose to term a Type. A Single event which happens once and whose identity is limited to that one happening or a Single object or thing which is in some single place at any one instant of time, such event or thing being significant only as occurring just when and where it does, such as this or that word on a single line of a single page of a single copy of a book, I will venture to call a Token. An indefinite significant character such as a tone of voice can neither be called a Type nor a Token. I propose to call such a Sign a Tone. In order that a Type may be used, it has to be embodied in a Token which shall be a sign of the Type, and thereby of the object the Type signifies. I propose to call such a Token of a Type an Instance of the Type. Thus, there may be twenty Instances of the Type “the” on a page.

A number of themes from this passage will play a central role in our discussion. I’ll begin by flagging them; more comprehensive investigation will take place in subsequent sections.

First, Peirce uses counting and individuation judgments to introduce the distinction: he observes that when we count the words on the page there are two different acceptable answers, and these correspond to the type and token counts. Our introduction of the distinction echoed this, and such judgments will be important for several reasons. Not only are they helpful in introducing the distinction, but they can also let us disambiguate terms that apply to both types and tokens. ‘Word’ for instance, can apply to both types and tokens, as Peirce observes above. We can use counting and individuation to force one or the other reading. For example, if ‘rose’ is inscribed twice on an otherwise blank board, we can force the type reading of ‘word’ by speaking of the (or even the one) word on the board. We’ll discuss counting and individuation data several times, most prominently in our discussion of whether types exist in §3.1.

Second, Peirce sketches an ontology of word types with several controversial aspects. Word types, according to Peirce, do not exist, though they do determine things that exist. Peirce’s non-existence claim is surprising, as it conflicts with the way theorists ordinarily think of the type/token distinction, on which both types and tokens exist (so they can, for instance, witness true counting claims). However, Peirce’s notion of existence differs from those more familiar to contemporary theorists: he distinguishes reality from existence, and existence requires ‘reaction with the environment’ (collected papers 5.503). So, in Peirce’s sense of ‘exist’, causally inert abstracta do not exist, despite being real.[2] All of this makes Peirce’s negative existence claim about types less controversial, as it merely amounts to the claim that types lack causal properties. For Peirce, in addition, types cannot have the familiar properties we ascribe to ordinary material objects: they cannot be heard or lie visibly on the page. This latter aspect of Peirce’s ontology of types coheres well with views on which types are abstract and abstracta cannot stand in causal relations or have spatiotemporal properties. We’ll investigate these issues further in §3.3.

Third, Peirce sketches an ontology of word tokens. Word tokens, by contrast with types, are particular things with spatiotemporal locations. Peirce gives us an example: ‘this or that word on a single line of a single page of a single copy of a book’. (The wording of the first example is imperfect, as Peirce has already observed that ‘word’ can pick out both types and tokens, but we can grant him his preferred token reading here.) We’ll investigate the nature of tokens further in §2.

Fourth, Peirce makes several claims about the relation between types and tokens. Despite their abstract nature, Peirce thinks there is a sense in which we can use types, though this is mediated through tokens. Peirce claims that in order to use a type, we embody that type in a token, and that when such embodiment occurs, the token is a sign of a type. The seems to amount to the view that tokens in some sense represent types. As we’ll see, Szabó 1999 develops a version of this view, which we discuss in §4.3. In addition, Peirce also claims that tokens are instances of types. This suggests that we may usefully understand the type/token relation in terms of other relations that are sometimes understood in terms of instantiation, e.g. universal and particular. We’ll consider this in §4.

Prescient as his remarks were, we won’t discuss Peirce’s specific views in any more detail. Nor will we tackle the relevance of the type/token discussion in his more general theory of signs. After Peirce introduced the terminology, a series of papers considered and elaborated on Peirce’s ideas, including Stebbing 1935, Williams 1936, and MacIver 1937. These theorists were all focused on the distinction as applied to words. Chapters 1 and 2 of Hutton 1990 provide a useful historical overview of the place of the type/token distinction in Piece’s philosophical system, as well as early works that directly engage with Peirce on the distinction. By the late 1950s, the distinction was extended beyond words in, e.g., Stevenson 1957, a paper on poems. Around the same time, type-identity theories in philosophy of mind were discussed in Place 1956 and Smart 1959, though the type/token terminology wasn’t utilized in discussions of those views until a little while later.

2. What is a Token?

Peirce’s discussion suggests that word tokens contrast with word types insofar as the former are concrete while the latter are abstract. Similar remarks plausibly apply to other cases such as repeatable artworks. Consider, for instance, the song ‘Hey Jude’. Taking this to be a type, it seems that its paradigmatic tokens are concrete performances of that song. The situation may be a bit different when it comes to mental states. Taking the mental state Pain to be a type, its paradigmatic tokens will be specific instances of pain. These specific mental states, however, are not uncontroversially concrete. After all, it is controversial whether mental states—type or token—are concrete at all. Still, token mental states seem to be particulars while mental state types are not.[3]

Generalizing, we may then ask two questions about tokens: are they all concrete, and are they all particulars? Focussing first on word tokens, while it is certainly plausible that the most familiar word tokens—inscriptions and sonic events—are concrete, there may be examples of word tokens that are not. Kaplan (1990: fn. 7) discusses two cases. Consider inscribing a word in a large rock by chipping away at the rock. The word token does not seem to be the rock itself, but rather something like the space that the rock occupied before the chipping/inscription. As Kaplan points out, this space has some curious properties: it can be moved and modified. In his other case, consider tokening a word by removing some black ink from a large rectangle of ink. As with the stone, the remaining ink does not seem to be the inscription of the word (it merely surrounds the inscription). Rather, it is the absence of the ink that somehow constitutes the token.

As suggestive as these examples are, they do not conclusively establish that some word tokens are not concrete. One could, for instance, identify both word tokens with absences/spaces and take absences/spaces to be concrete.[4] Whatever the correct view ultimately is, the cases do show that tokening a word is not always as straightforward as it is in paradigmatic cases of inscription and utterance, and we should not overgeneralize from such cases to claims about the properties of all word tokens. And, of course, these examples do nothing to show that not all tokens are particulars, as whatever one thinks about the tokens in these examples, they do seem to be particular.

Another way of arguing that not all tokens are concrete is to identify types which have non-concrete tokens. At least prima facie, it may seem that there are types of numbers, e.g. prime numbers. After all, in normal discourse it would be reasonable to name prime numbers as one type of number. If particular numbers, e.g. the number two, are the tokens of the type prime number, and particular numbers are not concrete, then there are tokens that are non-concrete. Of course, all of this depends on some significant assumptions: that there is such a type (the type prime numbers) and that its tokens are particular numbers. In order to evaluate these claims, we’ll have to investigate the nature and existence of types, as well as the relation between types and tokens. We discuss these topics in §3 and §4 respectively.

What about the other question: are all tokens particulars? Here is an argument against this view. Assume that there are types of properties, e.g. color properties. If specific color properties like blueness are the tokens of these types, and blueness is not a particular, then it follows that there are tokens that are not particulars: blueness is a token of the type color properties. This argument resembles our above argument that there are non-concrete tokens, and it similarly depends on significant assumptions. In this case, the assumptions are that there is a type color properties, and individual properties are its tokens.

Whether or not one endorses the view that non-particulars can be tokens, it does seem as if ordinary discourse allows us to speak of types of all sorts of things and, if we take such discourse as a window into the ontology of types, it seems that the notion of a type that we ordinarily utilize allows for a plenitude of types. Should we take such discourse as a guide to the ontology of types, and, if so, just how extensive is the plenitude? We’ll revisit these questions in §3.1.3.

If, in fact, there are as wide a variety of types as ordinary discourse suggests, then our question in this section—what is a token?—may be misguided. After all, it seems that everything (or close enough) will be a token of some type. But we should hardly expect an informative answer to the question, what is everything?

Our discussion in this section has assumed what may seem to be a particularly innocuous component of our intuitive picture: that tokens exist. Is this as innocuous as it seems? It depends on how we understand the claim. One question we can ask is whether the things we commonly take to be tokens exist. In other words, do the following exist: inscriptions of words, performances of symphonies, and states of being in pain? And the answer here is relatively uncontroversial: yes. Another question we can ask is whether there are things with the property of being a token? This question is not as easy to answer. Consider, for instance, somebody who rejects the existence of types, perhaps because they are a nominalist and they think that if types exist, they would be abstract.[5] Such a theorist may reason as follows: the type/token relation is a dyadic relation and for it to be instantiated its relata must exist. But no types exist; therefore, nothing instantiates the relation, and it follows that nothing has the property of being a token. Obviously, there are many ways to reject this reasoning, but it shows that, at the very least, we should have a better understanding of why types are taken to exist before we accept without scrutiny the claim that tokens exist. We now turn to discussion of the existence and nature of types.

3. What is a Type?

In our paradigmatic examples, tokens were relatively familiar particulars. What about types? Usually, they are taken to be abstract, which would make their existence controversial. So, in this section, we’ll begin by discussing arguments to believe in types (§3.1). Of course, merely believing in types doesn’t give us the full picture; we’d also need to know which types exist, even granting that some do (§3.2). In light of these discussions, we will then revisit the claim that types are abstract (§3.3).

3.1 Do Types Exist?

In this subsection, we’ll consider three arguments that types exist. While these certainly aren’t the only arguments in favour of types, they do plausibly capture the often implicit motivations for types in extant discussions.

3.1.1 The Counting Argument

Following much of the literature, we introduced the type/token distinction using counting and individuation judgments.[6] In Peirce’s example, when there are 50 inscriptions of the word ‘the’, there is a sense in which it is true that there are 50 inscriptions of just one word, and another sense in which there are 50 different words. Our initial purpose in discussing this and similar examples was to illustrate the type/token distinction by claiming that the distinction gives rise to these two readings, plausibly due to the polysemy of ‘word’. However, there is another use for these examples: to motivate the existence of types. While this argument has not been made explicit in the literature, given that theorists like Peirce and Quine use counting judgments to introduce the type/token distinction, it is instructive to see how one to construct an argument for types based on those judgments.

Imagine a page that contains 50 inscriptions of ‘the’ and nothing else. Focus on the claim that there is exactly one word inscribed on the page. Here is an argument for the existence of types: (i) the claim is true (i.e. has a true reading), and (ii) its truth requires a witness (an entity that makes the claim true), (iii) that witness is a type.

Premise (i) is motivated by the fact that counting claims such as ‘one word is on the page’ (in the scenario envisioned) seem perfectly assertable in ordinary discourse. Of course, one could hold that the claim is nonetheless false, but notice that the cited counting judgment is just one instance of a common phenomenon. In the introduction to this article we already considered to analogous cases. When we have three instances of the same car model, it is not hard to get a seemingly true reading of “there is exactly one car”: imagine, for instance, that a factory produces only Honda Civic cars. Even when there are three particular Civics, we can get a true reading of “There is exactly one car produced by this factory: the Honda Civic”. We can produce similar examples in a variety of domains. An error theory, it seems, would have to reject all of these claims or find some relevant disanalogies between them.

Granting for the sake of argument that (i) is true, what motivates (ii)? It may be made independently plausible by standard semantic proposals for number words, where, e.g., a claim of the form ‘Exactly one P is Q’ requires that the intersection of the set of Ps and set of Qs is a singleton.[7] This singleton’s member would then be the witness.

Even granting that at least one of these versions of the argument establishes that there must be a witness to the quantificational claim, what justification is there for (iii): that that witness is a type? One may be inclined to read this as a matter of stipulation by reasoning as follows: Peirce introduced the type/token distinction with this example and intended the reading in question to be about types—whatever they may be—so if the claim has a witness, then it must be a type. This reasoning, however, is too quick.[8] The type/token distinction has taken on a life of its own after Peirce’s introduction, so relying solely on his text to infer that types are whatever witness the relevant claims is misguided. The mere fact that Peirce introduced the distinction does not entail that his claims about the distinction are to be treated as sacrosanct. In fact, as we’ll discuss in §3.1.4, there are several theorists who agree that there is something in addition to specific inscriptions of words, but think this thing is not a type. These theorists will reject the last step of the Counting Argument. This move—taking there to be a unique thing that witnesses the claim that there is exactly one word inscribed on the page, but rejecting that this thing is a type—will have parallels for our other arguments in favour of types as well, so we’ll delay discussion of the move until the other arguments are presented.

All of that said, even if it reasonable to take the witness of our counting claim to be a type, we shouldn’t overemphasize the importance of counting and individuation judgments in understanding the type/token distinction. Given that the type/token distinction is a metaphysical distinction rather than, say, a linguistic or psychological distinction, it is possible for there to be a language in which there is no term ambiguous between word types and tokens. This is easy to imagine. Consider a variant of English that lacks the word ‘word’ but instead contains two words: ‘wordy’ that ranges just over word types and ‘wordo’ that ranges just over word tokens. In Peirce’s scenario, there no ambiguity for speakers of such a language: there are fifty wordos and one wordy. However, the mere fact that this language lacks such an ambiguous term doesn’t undermine the claim that wordys and wordos stand in the type/token relation.

3.1.2 The Type-Level Truths Argument

While the Counting Argument begins with quantificational claims and argues that the truth of these claims requires the existence of types, another set of considerations may establish the existence of types more straightforwardly. If there are true sentences that are directly about types, by containing terms that refer to types (rather than merely quantifying over them), then the truth of such sentences can be taken to establish that types exist.

Consider the following:

(1)
‘The’ is the most commonly used word in English.

Sentence (1) is true[9] and ‘the’ as it occurs in the sentence seems to refer to a word type—the same one seemingly quantified over in the Counting Argument—rather than any word token. After all, no single word token is commonly used.

Similar arguments can be given for repeatable artworks and mental states.

(2)
War and Peace has been printed thousands of times.
(3)
Pain is common after surgery.

No single copy of War and Peace has been printed thousands of times, and no single instance of pain is common after surgery. So, both of these sentences seem at least prima facie to contain reference to non-tokens.

Once we notice how many uncontroversially true sentences seem to not be about tokens, we can extend this argument far beyond our central examples. Wetzel (2009, ch. 2) does just this. She examines an issue of The New York Times’ “Science Times” from January 2, 1996 and finds articles that contain reference to non-tokens in linguistics, biology, physics, and computer science. She argues that there’s a strong prima facie case for reference to types in each of these articles. Note that Wetzel’s examples are drawn from both ordinary and theoretical discourse, so those who take one or the other to better reveal our ontological commitments are free to choose. We’ll stick with ordinary discourse for ease.

Having sketched some instances of the Type-Level Truths argument, we can now examine its form. Each instance contains the following steps:

(i)
There is a true sentence S that contains the term τ.
(ii)
The occurrence of τ in S cannot be interpreted as referring to tokens.
(iii)
The term τ in S is nonetheless referential.
(iv)
Therefore, the term τ refers to a type.

Such arguments can be disputed at every step. Starting with (i), a theorist could endorse an error theory on which all sentences containing terms that denote types are false. The problem is that true sentences that seem to designate non-token artworks, words, and mental states are exceptionally common in ordinary discourse. And things get worse when we consider the ubiquity of other similar claims.

What about (ii): that the key term in question cannot be interpreted as referring to tokens? To defend this step, one must first identify the relevant tokens. In the case of words, these are individual inscriptions/utterances; in the case of mental state types, these are particular states/events; in the case of artworks, these are copies/performances. Once the tokens are identified, the main argument that the terms don’t refer to those tokens comes from an assertion that the tokens don’t have the ascribed properties. So, for instance, no token of ‘the’ could have the property of being the most commonly used word of English, presumably because no single token is commonly used. Of course, these arguments are only as good as the claims that the tokens in question do not have the ascribed properties. However, those particular claims are fairly uncontroversial.[10]

Perhaps a more promising rejection of (ii) holds that while the terms in question do not refer to individual tokens, they refer to pluralities of tokens. For instance, on this view, ‘the’ in (1) refers to a plurality of inscriptions/utterances,[11] ‘War and Peace’ in (2) plurally refers to individual copies, and ‘pain’ in (3) refers to a plurality of states. On such a view, these pluralities collectively instantiate the ascribed property. So, for instance, the plurality of tokens of ‘the’ collectively instantiate the property of being the most common word of English. There are a host of familiar worries for such a view.[12]

One worry is that there can be type-level truths without a corresponding plurality. The most extreme version of this worry comes from the possibility that there may be token-less types. Imagine, for instance, that I coin a new word ‘notokes’ without using or even mentioning it (perhaps by describing it), and then the world ends before the word is used. It is intuitively true at the time of my introduction that ‘notokes’ starts with an ‘n’, but there are no tokens for the term to refer to.[13]

A second worry is that even in cases in which there are tokens, the plurality of these tokens do not have the right sorts of properties. Imagine that I write a song, being sure to carefully stipulate that it is 3 minutes long, and while the song is performed twice, both of its performances fail to satisfy my stipulation due to the incompetence of the musicians. In such a case, it does seem true that my song is three minutes long, despite the fact that neither performance is.

A third worry is that pluralities have the incorrect modal and/or temporal profile for analyzing seeming type-level truths. Go back to my three-minute song. It was only performed twice, but it may have been performed many more times. However, it does not seem true of the plurality of both performances that it could have contained many more entities.

All of these worries are familiar in discussions of the metaphysics of pluralities, and none of them are decisive.[14] That said, they do point to some immediate problems with taking apparently type-referential terms to refer to pluralities. And insofar as the responses to these worries require more sophisticated notions of pluralities, it may be that the proponent of the plurality view will have admitted something that seems quite different from the tokens themselves, and this would undermine the initial motivation for the view, which was to reject an ontological commitment beyond tokens.

(iii) (that the relevant term is genuinely referential) is likely the most popular step to dispute. The most straightforward way to dispute (iii) is to hold that claims with apparent reference to non-tokens are, in fact, tacitly quantificational claims about tokens. This may be easiest to see with a sentence where we do seem to be expressing a generalization that pertains to tokens, e.g. (4):

(4)
‘Color’ starts with a ‘c’.

Sentence (4) seems true, and it doesn’t seem to be about any individual token of ‘color’: it expresses something more general than that. But, even if ‘color’ in (4) can’t be taken to designate any individual token of ‘color’, it nonetheless is tempting to take the sentence to express a generalization over tokens that doesn’t contain reference to any types.

For this move to work, those wishing to undermine the argument from type-level truths will have to hold that every sentence that can be used to run the argument in fact expresses a quantificational claim about tokens. This requires, at the very least, giving a truth-conditionally equivalent quantificational paraphrase for every sentence that seems to exhibit type-reference. It should be noted, though, that even truth-conditional equivalence is likely not enough to disarm the argument. After all, non-quantificational referential sentences may be truth-conditionally equivalent to quantificational sentences, but semantically inequivalent. And in such cases, mere truth-conditional equivalence doesn’t straightforwardly undermine the ontological commitments of the referential sentence. However, we can set this worry aside because even finding truth-conditionally equivalent paraphrases for all apparent type-reference is already an exceptionally difficult, and plausibly impossible task. Wetzel 2009, chs 3–5 argues for this in detail regarding sentences that contain apparent reference to word types, and Liebesman and Magidor 2025, ch. 13 argues for this regarding sentences that contain apparent reference to artworks as distinct from their instances.

To grasp the sorts of considerations found in those discussions, consider an attempt to understand type-level claims as implicit universal quantifications, such that (4) is understood as (5):

(5)
Everything that is a token of ‘color’ starts with a ‘c’.

One immediate worry about (5) is that doesn’t obviously rid us of commitment to types.[15] After all, the predicate ‘is a token of ‘color’’ seems to contain reference to a non-token: the word ‘color’. While this worry is reasonable, we’ll set it aside and grant that proponents of this strategy can provide paraphrases that lack reference to types. As we’ll see the view faces more pressing worries.

(5) is strong: it is a universal generalization. Read unrestrictedly, it is clearly false and therefore inequivalent to (4), which is true. To appreciate the falsity of (5), consider misspellings.[16] We normally take it to be possible to misspell a word, and when a word is misspelled, the word is nonetheless tokened. After all, that is how that very word is misspelled. Imagine that a child spells ‘color’ with a ‘k’. Insofar as they’ve misspelled that very word, rather than, say, spelled another word or failed to spell any word at all, then we have a tokening of ‘color’ that falsifies (5), read unrestrictedly.

So, if we are going to attempt to analyze (4) as a generalization in the vein of (5) that relieves us of commitment to types, we need a more subtle proposal. Two alternatives suggest themselves. The first alternative is to replace (5) with a restricted universal generalization. The idea is that (4) is best understood as expressing something about some suitable class of tokens of ‘color’, and that class does not include misspellings. The second alternative is to replace (5) with a generic generalization, the sort of generalization expressed in English without the use of explicit quantifiers in sentences like ‘Dogs bark’. The idea here is that generics can be true despite the existence of exceptions: dogs bark even though basenjis, a type of dog, do not. But both of these views are problematic.

Begin with the view that (4) is best understood as expressing a restricted universal generalization. We can take the quantificational claim not just to quantify over any token of ‘color’, but, rather, over normal or properly-formed tokens. On this view, (4) is truth-conditionally equivalent to (6).

(6)
Everything that is a normal/properly-formed token of ‘color’ starts with a ‘c’.

Of course, one challenge for such a view is to say more about what it is to be a normal or properly-formed token of a word. Even setting this aside, however, the view faces a substantial objection. When words have multiple acceptable spellings—as many do—such paraphrases will fail. To see this, consider (7) and its corresponding (8).

(7)
‘Tire’ contains an ‘i’.
(8)
Everything that is a normal/properly-formed token of ‘tire’ contains an ‘i’.

While (7) is true, (8) is clearly false: ‘tyre’ is an acceptable spelling of the word in British English. Note, also, that the problem of multiple acceptable spellings undermines the unrestricted universal quantification view as well. After all, it is false that all tokens of ‘tire’ contains an ‘i’. Of course, one may try to formulate ever-more subtle versions of the view that account for this, but already it should be clear that it will be very difficult to do this.

On the second approach, we can take sentences like (4) and (7) to express generic claims. On such a view, the form of (4) is (9).

(9)
Gen x [ is a ‘color’-token (x)][is spelled with a ‘c’(x)]

It is hard to evaluate whether (9) is truth-conditionally equivalent to (4) without a worked-out semantics for ‘Gen’, which is a controversial topic (to put it mildly).[17] But even if (9) does in fact match (4) truth-conditionally, there’s independent reason to think that not all apparent reference to types can be paraphrased in such terms. Consider the following:

(1)
‘The’ is the most frequently used word in English.
(10)
The Handmaid’s Tale has been printed millions of times.
(11)
Pain is evolutionarily useful.

What would a generic analysis of these sentences be like? In each case, the purported paraphrase would generically quantify over individual tokens of ‘the’/copies of The Handmaid’s Tale/episodes of pain and ascribe them the property in the relevant sentence. But the problem is clear: as we’ve already mentioned, individual tokens of ‘The’ aren’t plausibly the most frequently used words in English, and similar remarks apply in the other cases. Single copies of books are not printed millions of times, and single episodes of pain are not evolutionarily useful.

Perhaps this shouldn’t be surprising. Type-level talk sometimes seems to express claims that generalize about the individual tokens of the type being discussed. In other cases, however, we seem to talk about the type itself and ascribe it properties that the individual tokens lack. These cases are not plausibly analyzed as quantification over types, no matter the nature of that quantification. This lesson is in fact taken for granted in the literature on generics, where it is standard to distinguish between generics that quantify over instances of a kind, and those that refer to kinds directly.[18]

Of course, even if one agrees that individual tokens of ‘the’ are not the most frequently used word in English, and mutatis mutandis for The Handmaid’s Tale and Pain, and their respective properties, one may note that what makes it the case that ‘the’ is the most frequently used word is something about its tokens: namely that is has more tokens than any other word. Plausible as this observation is, it does not help as it does not allow us to give a paraphrase that doesn’t quantify over types. After all, what it is to be the most frequently used word of English (to a first approximation) is to be a word type that has more tokens to any other word type. But this paraphrase contains quantification over types and it is hard to see how one would even in principle eliminate such quantification. What’s worse, there are properties of types that they don’t have in virtue of any tokens. Recall our 3-minute song that has only ever been performed incorrectly. That song is 3 minutes long, but not in virtue of any of its tokens being 3 minutes long.

The upshot of all of this is that the strategy of rejecting (iii) and holding that sentences that contain apparent reference to types are such that they are tacitly quantificational faces substantial challenges that would require much more subtle and detailed work to overcome.

This leaves us with just one remaining way to reject The Type-Level Truths Argument: to reject (iv) and hold that while the terms in question are genuinely referential, and don’t refer to tokens, they also don’t refer to types. On this view, ‘War and Peace’ in (2), for instance, does refer, and it does not refer to any copies (individually or plurally), but it does not refer to a type. We will return to discussion of this strategy in §3.1.4, but only after discussing one more argument in favour of the existence of types.

3.1.3 The Explicit Type-Talk Argument

Thus far, we’ve considered arguments for the existence of types that might appear somewhat surprising. According to the Counting Argument, some fairly uncontroversially true counting sentences require types as their witnesses, and according to the Type-Level Truths Argument, some fairly uncontroversial truths from both ordinary and theoretical discourse contain reference to types. These arguments might be apt to surprise because they purport to find commitment to types in discourse that don’t at first glance appear to commit us to types, or at least not obviously so. The Explicit Type-Talk argument shifts to discourse that, by contrast, does at first glance appear to be about types, in virtue of using the word ‘type’.

While ‘token’ is not a common everyday term, ‘type’ is. For any noun N, we can seamlessly use the phrase ‘type of N’ in a variety of constructions. Consider the following:

(12)
Two types of animals bark.
(13)
I saw that type of animal yesterday.
(14)
Dash is that type of animal.

(12)–(14), taken at face value, suggest that we can explicitly quantify over types, refer to types, and categorize animals as belonging to types. Note, also, that ‘type’ is just one of a family of terms which also includes ‘kind’ and ‘sort’ that seem to behave similarly.

Thus, the Explicit Type-Talk Argument: (i) there are uncontroversially true sentences containing ‘type’, (ii) such sentences require the existence of types, (iii) therefore, types exist. As with the others, one this argument is not unimpeachable.

Rejecting (i) would lead to a pervasive error-theory as ‘type’ discourse is ubiquitous. We’ll set this aside. What’s more plausible is rejecting the argument by rejecting (ii) and holding that such sentences don’t really require the existence of types. One may argue that apparent reference to types shouldn’t be taken seriously, and try to provide analyses of (12)–(14) that do not require the existence of types.[19]

To determine whether this view is plausible, we can look to available semantic theories to adjudicate whether the apparent ontological commitments are genuine. As a matter of fact, analyses of ‘type’ sentences in e.g. Carlson 1977 and Wilkinson 1995 do take such sentences containing ‘type’ to commit us to an ontology of types. Of course, one could scrutinize the details and attempt to defend a non-committal semantics.

There is, however, a complication in utilizing the Explicit Type-Talk Argument. Recall that our main aim in this discussion is to understand the type/token distinction as it has been utilized in philosophy, with a focus on three well-known applications: words, repeatable artworks, and mental states. However, the way we ordinarily use ‘type’ does not obviously track these applications. To see this, consider the following continuation of (12).

(15)
Two types of animals bark: Dogs and Dingos.

The Explicit Type-Talk argument suggests the following picture: ‘Dogs’ in (15) refers to a type (of animal) and the tokens of that type are individual dogs. On our standard applications of the type/token distinction, the idea is that there is a type word ‘the’ and its tokens are particular inscriptions/utterances and, similarly, that there is a type musical work Hey Jude, and its tokens are particular performances. If this is right, and we’re taking ordinary discourse to track types, we would expect there to be analogs of (15) for words and repeatable artworks. In particular, we would predict that when there are fifty inscriptions of ‘the’ on the page, we can truly say in English that there is one type of word on the page, and then go on to name it. Similarly, when there are three performances of Hey Jude, we would predict that we can truly say in English that there is one type of song performed, and go on to name it. However, this is not what we find, as both (16) and (17) are anomalous. A pithier way of putting this is that in ordinary English we simply don’t speak as if words or repeatable artworks are themselves types. We do not, for instance, say ‘ ‘The’ is a type of word, or ‘ ‘Hey Jude’ is a type of song.[20]

(16)#
One type of word is on the page: ‘the’.
(17)#
One type of song was performed: “Hey Jude”.

The reason that (16) seems bizarre is that doesn’t seem as if ‘the’ is a type of word: it is a word! Similar remarks hold for (17): it seems that “Hey Jude” is a song not a type of song. But this breaks the analogy. Recall that the picture was that ‘Dogs’ in (15) refers to a type of animal and its tokens are individual dogs. The analogy would seem to suggest that ‘the’ refers to type of words and its tokens are inscriptions/utterances of ‘the’, mutatis mutandis for ‘Hey Jude’. One may reply that the analogy holds, but it is not best exemplified by (16)/(17), the problem being that ‘the’ is not a type of word, but a type of something else—and similarly for “Hey Jude”. But what is that something else? None of the obvious suggestions seem to solve the problem. For instance, one may hold that ‘the’ (the word) is a type of inscriptions/utterances, but this view wrongly predicts that (18) is true. Similarly, the suggestion that “Hey Jude” is a type of performance wrongly predicts that the barely sensical (19) is true.

(18)#
One type of inscription/utterance is on the page: ‘the’.
(19)#
One type of performance was performed: “Hey Jude”.

All of this shows that our ordinary use of ‘type’ doesn’t align perfectly with even the paradigmatic entities people have taken to be types: words and repeatable artworks.[21] This should make us wary of utilizing explicit ‘type’ talk to defend the existence of types in the sense in which philosophers have used the term.

Interestingly, mental state types don’t seem so disconnected with ordinary ‘type’ talk. Consider (20):

(20)
One type of mental state is exemplified: pain.

(20) isn’t the sort of sentence we’d expect the folk to utter over coffee, but it isn’t odd in the same way as (16) or (17). This disanalogy brings up an intriguing possibility: that there isn’t a single type/token distinction but rather a family of distinctions. Perhaps the distinction between mental states and their instances just isn’t the exact same one as the distinction between words and their inscriptions. Interesting as this proposal is, we won’t pursue it further, as evaluating it would require delving deeper into the nature of the entities in question (words, artworks, mental states) than we can reasonably do in this discussion.

What is the upshot of all of this? Explicit type talk does seem to commit us to some entities, and in ordinary English it is reasonable to call these ‘types’. But it is not obvious that explicit type talk commits us to the sorts of things we have taken to be types in the most prominent discussions of the type/token distinction, so we should be wary utilizing explicit type talk to illuminate that distinction.

3.1.4 Resisting the Arguments by Denying Typehood

The three arguments we’ve just considered have a common form: they hold that a certain sort of claim commits us to something beyond tokens, then they go on to hold that this commitment is to a type. In this subsection we’ll consider views that reject this last step: they agree that the claims in question commit us to non-tokens, but they reject that this additional commitment is to a type. This may seem like a tight logical corner to occupy but, as we’ll see, some have.

Kaplan (1990) is one such theorist. He thinks that words exist, and not just word tokens: words are not identified with those tokens, though we transmit them by tokening them. But he rejects the view on which non-token words are types:

Now what are these words that we transmit by means of their utterances and inscriptions? Well, the prevailing view, especially among those trained in the traditions of logic (as I am), is that words are the types of which utterances and inscriptions are tokens. This, I now think, is quite wrong. And misleading, even as a model (1990, 97; emphasis in original).

Kaplan gives several reasons for thinking that words are not types. He takes types to be eternal unchanging Platonic abstracta. Words, he claims, are neither eternal or unchanging. Furthermore, Kaplan argues that the type/token model is best combined with a view on which words are orthographic types, so tokening a word is determined by having a certain orthography. He, however, claims that this is false given the variety of different ways there are to spell (and pronounce) one and the same word.

In their response paper, Hawthorne and Lepore (2011) hold that one can take words to be types without taking on all of these various commitments that led Kaplan to reject the view that words are types. To emphasize this point, they consider an analogy to species. One may, they claim, hold a view on which species are abstract objects without holding that membership is due to any intrinsic features of creatures (including their shapes). They call this a ‘bare-bones’ view (of species).

Kaplan in turn responds by (mostly) conceding the point: “I have now concluded that the type-token terminology is too powerful and too useful metaphorically to make it the focus of attack (2011, 509)”.[22] This concession presumably recognizes that in criticizing the claim that words are types in his (1990), Kaplan had in mind some particular commitments about the nature of types—that they are unchanging eternal abstracta—as well as some commitments about which types are words on the envisioned view—that they are orthotypes. The Hawthorne and Lepore criticism points out that one could hold a type view of words without these commitments. That said, if one’s view of types is so bare-bones as not to bring with it any commitments whatsoever, it is hard to see how it will be interesting or illuminating. So while Hawthorne and Lepore seem correct to hold that it is possible to hold a view of words as types without Kaplan’s commitments, it remains to be seen how this view can be developed in such a way that it remains substantial.

In their work on the metaphysics of repeatable artworks, Caplan and Matheson (2006/2008) and Tillman (2011) defend views on which musical works exist and are not identified with their performances, but also on which such works are not types. The key claim of both views is that musical works are themselves material objects. The thought goes that if musical works are types, then they are abstract. So, these theorists again agree with Kaplan, Hawthorne, and Lepore, that whatever types are, they are abstract.

What motivates Caplan and Matheson, and Tillman? Repeatable musical works themselves seem to stand in a variety of relations that are more familiarly instantiated by ordinary material objects. For instance, I can hear a song and a song can be 3 minutes long. But, the thought goes, perceptual relations and durational properties are more uncontroversially instantiated by material objects.[23]

Implicit in Caplan/Matheson’s and Tillman’s discussion is a view about the central features of types—what we can think of as a fleshing-out of a ‘bare-bones’ view of types, in Hawthorne and Lepore’s terminology. First, as already mentioned, they take types to be abstract objects. So, any view that takes repeatable artwork (word or mental state) terms to refer to material objects would be a view on which such entities are not types. Second, they take the relation between types and their instances to be quite different than the relationship between artworks and their manifestations, on the materialist view.

To understand this latter point, it will be helpful to focus on Caplan and Matheson’s materialist view. We’re using the term ‘manifestation’ to encompass at least performances of a musical work—though perhaps other things like scores as well. On Caplan and Matheson’s view, the manifestations of a musical work are parts of that work. The work is the mereological fusion of its performances. They take this to contrast their view with a type view: on a type view, the manifestations of a musical work are not parts of that work.

We began this subsection by noting that holding that the terms in sentences like (1)-(3) do not refer to tokens but also not to types may seem difficult. But now we can see just how one can motivate such a view. If one takes types to be abstract, or one holds that the type/token relation is non-mereological (tokens are not parts of their types), then one can reasonably hold that the relevant terms are referential but do not refer to types by claiming that the relevant terms refer to non-abstracta, or that have their instances as parts. And, of course, if one holds even stronger views about the nature of types—as Kaplan (1990) does—then it will be even easier to reject the view that the terms are type-referential. All of this, of course, requires settling these difficult questions about the metaphysics of types.

3.2 The Domain of Types

Let’s now set aside resistance to our three arguments in favour of types and assume that they succeed. The next natural question is just how far they succeed, i.e. assuming the arguments establish that there are some types, just which types do they commit us to?

We’ll tackle the arguments in reverse order. Begin with the Explicit Type-Talk Argument. If this argument works, it would seem to commit us to an extremely plenitudinous view of types. After all, for any noun N, the phrase ‘type of N’ is perfectly grammatical, and we can form true sentences using that phrase. But then there would be at least as many types as there are non-intersubstitutable nouns (on the assumption that non-intersubstitutable nouns do not co-designate). And if one accepts that conclusion, it would be hard to resist the view that there are additional types that we don’t happen to have nouns for. After all, we could have easily spoken a language with additional non-actual nouns, and in such a language we could form similar type-referring expressions. But it would be odd to think that the contingent fact that we don’t speak such a language ensures that these types don’t exist.

Similar remarks apply to the Type-Level Truths argument. As is discussed in Liebesman and Sterken 2021, it seems that we can use many nouns in a taxonomic sense such that they don’t refer to tokens. An easy way to do this in English is to use the noun in sentence-initial position (plural form if it is a count noun) and combine it with a predicate that doesn’t seem to apply to tokens:

(21)
Dogs are widespread pets.
(22)
Water is ingested by most living organisms.

One worry about the Type-Level Truths argument is whether it coheres with independent work on the semantics sentences like (21) and (22), which are usually called ‘kind predications’. We have envisioned a theorist taking such an argument to establish that there is at least a type for every common noun, and that these types are the referents of the subjects of sentences like (21) and (22). However, these sentences are familiar in the semantics literature and while most semanticists do take the sentence-initial terms to be referential, they take them to refer to kinds, not types, hence the term ‘kind predications’.[24]

There are two ways the type-sympathizer may meet this worry. They may draw a sharp distinction between types and kinds, and argue that the terms in question are type-referential, not kind-referential. Alternately, they may claim that types as philosophers theorize about them and kinds as semanticists theorize about them are just one and the same thing. If that’s right, then the type/token distinction would just be the same as the kind/member distinction. We’ll revisit this issue in §5.

What about the Counting Argument? Again, this sort of argument does seem to be pervasive. Perhaps, though, not quite as pervasive as the others. To formulate an instance of the Counting Argument, we need a noun that allows us to formulate a quantificational sentence with a witness that must be a type. We have no obvious a priori reason to think that every noun allows this, even if many do. Furthermore, note that instances of the Counting Argument are most convincing when a noun has two readings, corresponding to type and token, as is the case with ‘word’. But not all nouns do allow this, and, as was stressed in §3.1.1, we shouldn’t read anything too deep into the observation that a language happens to have a term with both type and token readings.

3.3 Are Types Abstract?

Perhaps the most commonly held assumption about types is that if they exist, they are abstract. But, still, it is worth scrutinizing. There are two reasons one may doubt that types are abstract, even if one believes that types exist.

The first reason to doubt that types are abstract is that they do seem to differ from paradigmatic abstracta. Focussing on word types and repeatable artworks, it certainly seems as if they are non-eternal and have contingent intrinsic properties. For instance, the word ‘the’ didn’t seem to exist before Middle English, and Hey Jude didn’t seem to exist before it was composed. And words may have been spelled differently than they actually are while musical works may have had different sonic profiles. In fact, some actual words have shifted their spelling over time: ‘doubt’ used to be spelled ‘dout’. Taking numbers to be paradigmatic abstracta, they seem to differ in both of these respects.

There’s a familiar response to this worry: to take there to be abstract entities that differ from paradigmatic abstracta like numbers but are nonetheless still abstract. Artifacts like fictional works and characters are perhaps the most familiar sorts of entities people take to have this profile, but some have taken words to as well.[25] Of course, such a view comes with a burden. Given the disanalogy between numbers and abstract artifacts, why think that abstract artifacts are genuinely abstract? Seriously examining this question would take us too far afield, see the entry on Abstract Objects for an inventory of views on what makes an object abstract. It is perhaps worth mentioning the most straightforward view: what makes abstract artifacts genuinely abstract is their lack of spatial properties. At least at first glance, this does seem to cohere with the way we talk about word types and repeatable artworks. There’s something tempting about the thought that the word ‘the’ itself lacks a spatial location, even if its tokens are located in many places, and mutatis mutandis for repeatable artworks like The Moonlight Sonata. This is not uncontroversial, however, and we’ll mention shortly.[26]

The second reason to doubt that types are abstract is that in many cases we seem to speak is if types share properties with their instances, and these properties may conflict with being abstract. Here, for instance, is Wollheim (1968, 50–51) reflecting on the relationship between types and tokens in a discussion of the nature of artworks:

With types we find the relationship between the generic entity and its elements at its most intimate: for not merely is the type present in all its tokens like the universal in all its instances, but for much of the time we think and talk of the type as though it were itself a kind of token, though a peculiarly important or pre-eminent one. In many ways we treat the Red Flag as though it were a red flag (cf.‘We’ll keep the Red Flag flying high’).

Wollheim (1968, 51) goes on to say that many properties are such that they are genuinely shared between a type and its instances, and in fact he thinks the same goes for universals:

In the cases of both universals and types, there will be shared properties. Red things may be said to be exhilarating, and so also redness. Every red flag is rectangular, and so is the Red Flag itself. Moreover, many, if not all, of the shared properties will be transmitted.

On Wollheim’s view, the type the Red Flag will itself have the property of being rectangular (along with many other properties of its tokens). If one holds that no abstracta can be rectangular, then the type cannot be abstract.

Of course, the mere fact that we often speak as if types and tokens share properties is compatible with several different views. Liebesman and Magidor (2017, 2025), like Wollheim, hold that in many cases repeatable artworks do have some of the same properties as their tokens. In fact, they take this view farther than Wollheim because they hold that repeatable artworks can have some locational properties, which Wollheim denies.

Zalta 2021 provides another model based on the distinction between encoding and exemplifying.[27] The idea is that there are properties that are encoded by types and exemplified by tokens. Given that encoding and exemplifying are both predication relations, there is a sense in which those properties characterize both the types and the tokens, but the differences between encoding and exemplifying plausibly defang the worry that types cannot be abstract: i.e. a type may encode a property P such that if P were exemplified it would conflict with being abstract, but encoding that same property presents no conflict.

4. What is the Relation Between Types and Tokens?

In addition to inquiring after the nature of types and tokens, we can investigate the relation between them. In this section, we’ll consider a series of issues in understanding this relation.

4.1 Adicity

Thus far we’ve taken it for granted that the type/token relation is two-place. However, this is not uncontroversial. Hugly and Sayward 1981 defends the view that it is a four-place relation. Here is their statement of the view:

[the type/token relation] does not just relate these two items; one has to at least add the language as a third item. But this isn’t enough. Note that it is only because of the Morse Code that objects made up of dots and dashes are tokens of expressions of English. A perceptible particular is a token of an expression of a language L only relative to some tokening system. Being a token of is a 4-place relation between perceptible particular, expression, language and tokening system. (1981, 186)

Why do Hugly and Sayward wish to add these two additional argument places to the type/token relation? While they are not fully explicit in their reasoning, it is fairly straightforward to provide some motivation for their position. Consider an arbitrary inscription of the English word ‘car’, in some English sentence inscription. That inscription of ‘car’ is orthographically identical to an inscription of a French word with an entirely different meaning (it means because). What makes it the case that the inscription is a token of the English word type ‘car’ rather than the orthographically identical French word type? It seems nothing intrinsic to the inscription does, as the reasoning goes, so we need to add an argument place for a language to the type token relation.

Yet, Hugly and Sayward argue, even this additional argument place is not enough. There are many different ways to token the English word ‘car’, for instance one can do so in morse code. So we need yet another argument place for a system that determines what counts as tokening an expression in a particular language. Hugly and Sayward call this a “tokening system”.

Szabó (1999, 146) considers and responds to a somewhat similar worry about taking there to be a single dyadic type/token relation. As Szabó puts the worry, an inscription with the orthography of ‘car’ may either be an inscription of an English word or a French word. Given this, the worry goes, we shouldn’t take there to be a single type/token relation but, rather, a distinct relation for each language.

These two lines of reasoning are related. Where Hugly and Sayward add extra argument places to the type/token relation, Szabó’s hypothetical objector simply multiplies relations. The lines of reasoning can be resisted in similar ways.

Szabó suggests that instead of relativizing (or multiplying) the type/token relation, we should relativize the relata itself. The idea would be that we individuate tokens not just by their orthotype but also by something much more complex: what language they belong to. What language a token belongs to will be a highly extrinsic property. But possession of this property may suffice to fix which type is tokened, even without complicating the adicity of the type/token relation or multiplying type/token relations.

This provides us with a general response to Hugly and Sayward’s reasoning. Instead of adding arguments to the type/token relation, we can simply recognize that (as with many relations) whether the type/token relation is instantiated depends on extrinsic properties of the relata. So, for instance, whether an inscription of ‘car’ tokens an English or French word depends on whether it is an inscription in English or French, and this is not determined by the intrinsic properties of the inscription.

This response does recognize an insight in the Hugly and Sayward passage, though: whether a pair of objects instantiates the type/token relation may be dependent on a wide variety of extrinsic factors. And, in fact, this may be unsurprising when we consider other sorts of types. Take, for instance, a repeatable artwork like a song. Some particularly butchered performance of ‘Hey Jude’ may count as a token of that song because of a historical and/or intentional connection between the performer and the song, rather than any intrinsic properties of the performance.

4.2 One/Many

Another aspect of the type/token relation we’ve taken for granted is that it is typically one/many, i.e. there are many tokens for a given type. We can now ask whether this is a contingent feature of the cases we’ve been considering or rather anything inherent in the relation of itself.

Certainly, it seems possible for a type/token relationship to be one/one. There may be a word, song, or mental state that, for whatever reason, has only been tokened once. What’s more controversial is whether there can be a case of a type that lacks tokens altogether. At first glance this does seem possible. Perhaps I compose a song that’s never performed, or coin a new word by mentioning rather than using it, and the word happens to never be tokened. Yet, the possibility of token-less types has proven controversial.[28]

Hawthorne and Lepore (2011, 456–7) discuss just such a case in order to criticize their interpretation of Kaplan’s (1990) view of words. (Kaplan 2011 sheds doubt on this interpretation.)

Suppose the impositor proclaims, “The sequence of morphemes ‘un-’ followed by ‘voke’ is to mean such and such.” It is intuitively clear that his speech serves to introduce the word ‘unvoke’ into the language. Suppose soon after his decision, the world blows up. The word ‘unvoke’ has been introduced by a description and so has become a constituent of the language, but it has never been used in discourse.

There are two ways to respond to this sort of example. One is to deny that a word has been successfully created in such a case. The second is to hold that, despite appearances, it has been tokened.

Whether or not one finds it plausible that a word has genuinely been created in Hawthorne and Lepore’s case, note that in analogous cases it is very hard to deny creation. If I carefully construct a score for a song, it does seem as if I’ve created a song, whether or not it is ever performed.

What about the second route: holding that the word(/song) has been tokened? To make this move, one would have to expand our tokens beyond the most familiar sort. Perhaps, for instance, in Hawthorne and Lepore’s example, the impositor mentally tokens ‘unvoke’. Or perhaps my score for the song itself counts as a token of the song. Whether these claims are plausible is hard to settle as it doesn’t seem like we have clear judgments to push us in one or the other direction. Ultimately, we can hope that a more developed metaphysical view of the type/token relation may indirectly shed light on whether these sorts of entities count as tokens or not.

4.3 Knowledge of Types

We know many things about types. Recall our discussion in §3.1.2: we know that ‘the’ is the most commonly used word in English, that War and Peace has been printed thousands of times, and that pain is common after surgery. This knowledge of types poses a challenge for understanding the type/token relation, which has been most extensively discussed in Bromberger 1992a and Szabó 1999.

Notice, first, that knowing about types may seem prima facie challenging if one takes types to be abstract. After all, there have been extensive discussions dedicated to understanding how we can know anything about abstracta.[29]

Types, however, pose an additional challenge. In many familiar cases, our knowledge of types depends on a knowledge of their tokens. This may be easiest to see with words. To know that ‘the’ is the most commonly used word of English is to know something about the distribution and frequency of its tokens. And more generally, it may seem that our epistemically significant relations are to tokens, not types. As Szabó (1999, 146) puts it: “what we hear or see are concrete sounds or inscriptions, not the types themselves”.

For Szabó, understanding how seeing and hearing word tokens can generate knowledge of types places a constraint on the type/token relation. In fact, he uses the term ‘the type/token problem’ as explaining what relation R can be such that, for some type T, “it is in virtue of R that empirical information about tokens of T can play a role in justifying knowledge about T” (1999, 146).

Of course, one may try to deflate this problem. One possible deflationary strategy challenges the view that our knowledge of types is genuinely parasitic on our contact with tokens. Perhaps, one may hold, our knowledge of types is generated by some direct faculty of rational contact to types. While possible, this view has no extant defenders as it does seem hard to deny that at least some of the substantial things we know about types comes from contact with their tokens. Another possible deflationary strategy holds that what looks like knowledge about a type itself is really just a hidden generalization over tokens. On this view, knowledge about tokens is all of the knowledge there is. This view is in effect undermined by our discussion in §3.1.2: there we saw that it is not possible to uniformly understand claims about types as hidden generalizations over their tokens.

In discussing this problem, Szabó’s focus is on word types, so we’ll begin by following him in introducing his menu of positions. However, as we’ll soon see, the epistemic challenge generalizes beyond words to other types. Szabó distinguishes two main approaches to the problem, which he dubs ‘the instantiation view’ and ‘the representation view’. On the instantiation view, types are taken to be natural/genuine kinds such that moving from knowledge about tokens to knowledge about types is nothing more than familiar inductive generalization (however we ultimately understand it). On the representation view, word tokens represent their types and our acquaintance with tokens explains our knowledge of types in just the way that our knowledge of representations can more generally lead to knowledge of what is represented. Consider, for instance, a map of Canada. By examining this map and seeing that a representation of Alberta is to the left of a representation of Ontario, we come to know that Alberta is west of Ontario.

Adjudicating between these options in the case of words is subtle, and Szabó himself mounts a defense of the representation view utilizing some intricate thought experiments. But, as alluded to earlier, a larger question remains: how should we think about the epistemic problem more generally, when expand our focus beyond words?

Thinking about artworks and mental state types may make the representation view look implausible.[30] Even if one finds it plausible, as Szabó argues, that word tokens are artifacts which function in part to represent word types (just as maps are artifacts that function to represent places) one may find it quite implausible that performances of a symphony represent that symphony itself, or, more bizarrely, that a token pain state functions to represent a type of mental state.

This leaves open an intriguing possibility: perhaps there is not a single solution to the epistemic problem. It may be that the way in which we come to know of types via their tokens varies depending on the types and tokens in question. This view becomes all the more plausible if we adopt the plenitudinous conception of types suggested in §3.2. After all, if there is a plenitude, and accompanying diversity of types, then it is plausible that we our knowledge about these types is not achieved in a uniform manner.

Would adopting a heterogeneous solution to the epistemic problem require us to reject the view that there is a unique type/token relation? No: we could hold that there is a single general relation but it holds in different ways between different entities, and these different ways are partly manifested in epistemic differences.

5. Type/token and Other Similar Distinctions

The type/token distinction is just one distinction in a family that includes the kind/instance, set/member, and universal/particular. How, we may wonder, does the type/token distinction relate to these others? In particular, one may wonder whether the type/token distinction can be understood wholly in terms of any of these other distinctions.

In this section, we’ll sketch two sorts of motivations for holding that the type/token distinction cannot be so-understood. One motivation holds that the type/token distinction relates different sorts of entities than these other distinctions. The other motivation holds that the relation between types and tokens is different from the relations encoded in these other distinctions.[31]

Our discussion will be somewhat brief. That’s because evaluating whether the type/token distinction can be understood in terms of another distinction requires a conception of both distinctions in question, and there are relatively few uncontroversial fixed points to which we can tether our discussion. Still, we can make some general remarks as well as identify issues that deserve further investigation.

5.1 Arguments from Different Relata

Consider, first, the set/member distinction. Sets, as the traditional view goes, have their members eternally and necessarily. This would very straightforwardly distinguish sets from types, as types can have different tokens at different times and in different possible worlds. Of course, this leaves open more sophisticated views on which we explain this data using a tool like counterpart theory, advance a non-standard view of sets, or attempt a more sophisticated set-theoretic treatment of types. At the very least, though, it is clear that understanding the type/token distinction in terms of the set/member distinction is no straightforward task.

What about Universals? As Wetzel (2018, §3) makes clear, types seem to have many of the properties that are familiarly attributed to universals. In earlier work, Wetzel (2009) holds that the similarities are significant enough for types to be considered universals; as she puts it (2009, xii): “Having instances is to my mind the hallmark of a universal, and since types are the sort of thing that have instances, they are universals.”[32]

That said, shortly below her claim that types are universals, Wetzel goes on to note (2009, xii) that “there certainly are important differences between types and such classic examples of universals as the property of being white or the relation of being between.” Here, she specifically mentions Wollheim’s discussion of property-sharing between a type and tokens, which we discussed in §3.3. Recall that on Wollheim’s view, there are many properties shared by types and their tokens. Furthermore, Wollheim thinks this applies to universals as well: many universals share properties with their instances (1968, 51). However, Wollheim (1968, 76–7) does think that we can distinguish types from familiar universals such as being white in a number of ways. Most prominently, he holds that it is much for common for a type to share properties with its tokens than it is for a universal to share properties with its instances.

Of course, investigating the relationship between types and universals more comprehensively would require a more comprehensive understanding of universals, and there are many alternative views. One could hold that types count as universals in virtue of meeting a minimal sufficient condition for being a universal—being capable of having an exemplification. However, the fact would remain that types seem distinct from the most familiar universals, so simply asserting that types are universals in virtue of meeting some minimal criterion may not advance our understanding of types.

The kind/instance distinction is perhaps the most plausible candidate for assimilation to the type/token distinction. In fact, theorists often move between ‘kind’ and ‘type’ without commenting or even seeming to notice.[33] Notice, first, that if we are going to identify types and kinds, our notion of kind cannot be limited to natural or genuine kinds. After all, works of art and words are hardly natural kinds in any plausible sense. However, there is a much more encompassing notion of kind on offer, which can be found in the linguistics literature on kind reference.[34] There, it is emphasized that seemingly every count or mass noun can have an occurrence that refers to non-particulars, as in ‘Dogs are widespread’ and ‘Water is essential for life’. Many theorists take the referents of ‘dogs’ and ‘water’ in these sentences, and other similar occurrences of nouns, to refer to kinds. On this notion of kinds, there at least seem to be enough kinds to plausibly identify them with types. There’s a complication, though, which we already mentioned in §3.1.3: the expression occurrences linguists take to be kind-referential don’t straightforwardly align with those that refer to types as identified by philosophers. Of course, this may be a shallow fact about language rather than a deep metaphysical fact, but it does show that there may be a clear distinction between the way theorists talk about types and kinds.

5.2 Arguments from a Different Relation

Another way in which the type/token distinction may be distinguished from other nearby distinctions is if the relation between types and tokens is different than the relation that holds between these other pairs of entities. Our discussion in §4 bears directly on this issue. For instance, if the considerations mentioned in §4.1 were convincing, and we had to add additional relata to the type/token relation—taking it to be 3 or 4 place—then this may distinguish it from these other relations which are usually taken to be dyadic. Similarly, if we followed Szabó in taking the type/token relation to be representational, this would plausibly distinguish the relation from the relations between these other sorts of pairs, which are not plausibly representational.

Similarly, recall that Caplan and Matheson (2006)/(2008) hold the view that the type/token relation is non-mereological. That is, tokens are not parts of their types (or at least not in virtue of standing in the type/token relation). This would show that the type/token relation is different from the part whole relation, though, to be fair, perhaps that view was not attractive to many in the first place.

This discussion of arguments for distinguishing the type/token distinction based on the relation between types and tokens has been brief. That’s because so little is uncontroversial about the type/token relation. Better developed views about this relation have the promise to yield some insight into the way in which the type/token distinction relates to these other distinctions

6. Conclusion and Outstanding Questions

At the beginning of this article, we mentioned that there has been relatively little work done on the type/token distinction as such, despite some notable exceptions. This means that there’s lots of work left to do. We’ll conclude by highlighting some key areas for future research, as brought out by the preceding discussion. Of course, this list has no pretensions to exhaustivity.

Several times throughout our discussion we’ve raised the possibility that there isn’t a single type/token distinction at all. Rather there are a family of distinctions with metaphysically important differences. A related proposal is that while there is a single type/token distinction, it can be exemplified in different enough ways that there is little underlying metaphysical uniformity (if any). Evaluating these proposals requires delving into the details of particular applications of the distinction to see whether uniformity between these applications is plausible.

Related to the question of whether there is a single type/token distinction at all is the question of whether we can give a single minimal characterization of types themselves. This minimal characterization would have to be compatible with the multitude of applications of the distinction while at the same time not being so general as to rob the distinction of any interest.

A major challenge in giving such a characterization of types is that, as noted in §3.1.3, our use of the natural language word ‘type’ does not align perfectly with philosophical uses of types. A major outstanding project, then, would be to better understand the relationship between philosophical and natural-language types, as it were.

And finally, the very topic of §5 was left open. Until we have a better understanding of types, tokens, and the distinction between them, it is hard to reach a clear verdict on the relationship between the type/token distinction and other related distinctions.

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