Intergenerational Justice

First published Thu Apr 3, 2003; substantive revision Fri Jul 17, 2026

Central questions of intergenerational justice are: first, whether present generations can be duty-bound because of considerations of justice to past and future people; second, whether other moral considerations should guide those currently alive in relating to both past and future people; and third, how to interpret the significance of past injustices in terms of what is owed to the descendants of the direct victims of the injustices.

Discussions of what we owe to future people go back to ancient times (Auerbach 1995: 27–35) and ancient philosophy provides resources and insights for intergenerational ethics (Lane 2012). Important contributions within the utilitarian tradition include the analysis of the moral status of future sentient beings (see, e.g., Sidgwick 1907 [1981: 414]), of optimal savings (Ramsey 1928, see entry on Ramsey and intergenerational welfare economics), and of obligations of reproduction (Narveson 1967; see §2.2). Within a theory of justice we owe the first systematic account of obligations to future people to John Rawls (see §4.4/§4.5). Derek Parfit’s analysis, particularly of the non‑identity problem, has been central for approaches that rely on person‑affecting principles, and it continues to frame key questions about how present actions bear on future people (see §3).

1. How Intergenerational Relations Differ from Relations Among Contemporaries

It may seem that considerations of justice do not apply to intergenerational relations, because there is a lack of direct reciprocity between generations of people who are not contemporaries. Among non-contemporaries, there is no mutual cooperation and there are no exchanges in kind (see Barry 1989b: 189–203; Barry 1991: 231–234; Heyd 2009a: 167–176; but see Gosseries 2009, Gosseries 2023, Mazor 2010, Scheffler 2013 and Brandstedt 2015) for conceptions of indirect and transgenerational reciprocity that do not require that the initial contributor is among the final beneficiaries). This fact about the relations between present and remote past or future generations is closely related to a second feature of intergenerational relations: the permanent asymmetry in power-relations between living people and those who will live in the future. These power relations are qualitatively different from those among contemporaries, which are relatively fluid and subject to change (Barry 1977: 243–44; Barry 1989b: 189).

Not only can the present generation influence the conduct of future people by affecting their desires and circumstances, it can also exercise power by setting back the interests of future generations. It can, for example, pursue a natural-resource policy with long-term negative consequences. In this case, the present generation imposes upon future generations the risk of having their options reduced to an inadequate range—unless, that is, future generations will have available to them and can afford to use technologies that allow them to adapt to the circumstances (Barry 1999; Beckerman 1999; Heyward 2017). By contrast, remote future people cannot at all affect the well-being of the lives of the presently living, at least not today and according to conceptions of well-being that have a subjective component. Still, such future people might nevertheless be considered able to set back the interests of or even wrong present or past persons insofar as the latter have, or had, interests with respect to posthumous future states of affairs. In the same way, the presently living may be morally constrained in their actions that relate to people who lived in the remote past.

Third, those presently alive can affect the very existence of future people (whether or not future people will exist), the number of future people (how many future people will exist), and the identity of future people (who will exist). In short: future people’s existence, number, and specific identity depend (are contingent) upon currently living people’s decisions and actions. A decision taken by present generations could conceivably result in the termination of human life (see, e.g., Scheffler 2013; Mulgan 2015; McKinnon 2017); there is a long tradition of institutionalized population policy whose goal is to control the size of future generations (see, e.g., McMahan 1981); and, more prosaically, a couple can certainly decide whether or not to have children (see §2.2 and §3.2). Furthermore, many of our decisions have indirect effects on how many people will live and who they are, for many of our decisions affect who meets whom and who decides to have children with whom. To explain such “different people choices”, Parfit adopts the genetic identity view of personal identity: the identity of a person is at least in part constituted by the DNA the person has as a result of which ovum was fertilized by this or that spermatozoon in the creation of this person. Our actions thus have an effect on the genetic identity of future people in so far as they affect from which particular pairs of cells future people will grow—and any action that affects people’s reproductive choices, directly or indirectly, will do that. Many of our actions in fact have an indirect effect on when future people will be conceived. If we decide between two long-term policies regarding the use of natural resources, for example, we know that depending on which we choose, different (and most likely also a different number of) future people will come into existence. For example, the European Commission finds that more than one million babies may have been produced as a result of the Erasmus Programme (the European Community Action Scheme for the Mobility of University Students, and with more than 15 million people participating since 1987), most of who would very likely not have come to existence without at least one of their parents participating in the Programme (European Commission 2014: 130–131; see also D’Arcy 2021).

By contrast, when we make decisions affecting our contemporaries, we do not face different people choices. Our decisions may affect their existence only with respect to their survival; their number only with respect to how many survive; their identity only in the sense that we might be in a position to change their conditions of life, character, and self-understanding. Of course, we can affect neither the number nor the identity of past generations.

Lastly, our knowledge of the future is limited. While we can know the particular identities of presently existing people (and very many previously living people), we are normally not in a position to refer to specifically identifiable future persons. It is not that all predictions about the future decrease in certainty at some constant rate (see Cowen & Parfit 1992: 148). Indeed, many predictions are more likely to be true concerning the further future than the more immediate future. For example, the prediction that some policy will have changed or that certain resources will have been exhausted is more likely to be true in the further future. Nonetheless, we cannot know the specific identities of persons in the further future. Our lack of certain knowledge of the future also means that we often will be in a position to know at best merely the likelihood of normatively relevant consequences of alternative long-term policies.

These differences between our relations to one another and our relations to subsequent or antecedent generations give rise to a number of important debates. Among them are the following: The first concerns the normative significance of the non-changeable fact that remote future people as well as deceased people do not even have the potential for exercising power over presently living people. According to the Will Theory, for a person to have a right vis-à-vis another person requires the former to be able to exercise his or her rights with respect to the conduct of the latter (Hart 1955: 183–184; Hart 1982: 183; Wellman 1995: 91–92; Steiner 1994: 59–73). Thus, the unchangeable power-asymmetry among non-contemporaries will exclude the possibility of future non-contemporaries and deceased people being bearers of rights claims against presently living people (Steiner 1983; Steiner 1994: 249–261; Fabre 2001; see also Ackerman 1980: 70–75). Consequently, for the proponents of the Will Theory considerations of justice (as understood in this entry) do not apply to intergenerational relations. According to the Interest Theory of Rights (Raz 1984; Raz 1986: 166–188; Raz 1994: 45–51; Kramer 1998: 60–101) being able to exercise one’s rights—to demand or waive the enforcement of a right—is neither sufficient nor necessary for someone to be the bearer of the right. For a person to hold a right, the right, when actual, necessarily preserves one or more of the persons’ interests (Kramer 1998: 62). Understanding the relations between currently living people and future non-contemporaries in terms of justice assumes that for a person to have a valid justice claim vis-à-vis another person (who stands under the correlative duties) does not depend upon being able to harm or benefit the other person (Barry 1989b: chs. 4–6; Buchanan 1990; but see Gauthier 1986; Heyd 2009a; Hiskes 2009: 9).

The second debate concerns the normative significance of the contingency of future people upon currently living people’s decisions and actions. If and insofar as the existence, identity, or number of future people depend upon present decisions and actions, to what extent can the former be said to be harmed by the latter? Furthermore, can presently existing persons, in making such decisions, be guided by the interests of future persons? These are the questions that underlie the so-called “Non-Identity Problem” (see §3 and §4; see also entry on nonidentity problem).

The third debate concerns the status of previously living people. Is it possible for currently living people to harm past people, and do currently living people have duties toward them?

A fourth debate concerns the question of what political institutions are required to address these structural asymmetries and to prevent the disenfranchisement of future generations. Because future people cannot participate in any present political processes, some theorists argue that existing institutions systematically privilege present interests and are prone to structural presentism. This has led to proposals for institutional innovations—ranging from constitutional provisions and long-term constraints to various forms of trusteeship or future-oriented offices—aimed at ensuring that current political decisions do not unduly determine the context of future generations’ choices (González-Ricoy and Gosseries 2016; Karnein 2016; Karnein 2025; Thompson 2016; Wallimann-Burger et al. 2017; Gosseries 2023, ch. 5).

Other important debates include the interpretation of the significance of our limited knowledge of the future. As we know at best merely the likelihood of the differing consequences of alternative policies, how should we assess the imposition of differing risks on and the likely or uncertain provision of benefits for future people? (See, e.g., Birnbacher 1988: 140–172, 175–179; Jonas’ notion of a “Heuristik der Furcht” (heuristics of fear) in 1979: 63–64; Mintz-Woo 2019). Some focus on how to assess the imposition of differing risks of rights violations (see, e.g., McCarthy 1997; Oberdiek 2012; Perry 2014; Meyer & Stelzer 2018, 2025). Another issue is whether we have reasons to discount the future in the sense of discounting future persons’ well-being (see, e.g., Sidgwick 1907 [1981: 414]; Ramsey 1928: 261; Rawls 1971: 263; Parfit 1984: appendix F; Cowen & Parfit 1992; Broome 1994; Mintz-Woo 2021). A further debate concerns the motivation that currently living have for fulfilling their supposed duties to future people, given that currently living people know neither future people’s individual identities nor their particular preferences. Partly due to these features as well as the unchangeable asymmetry in power-relations between currently living people and remote future generations, currently living people’s compliance with their obligations to remote future people is likely to be less reliable (see Birnbacher 2009; Pirni 2023; Scheffler 2025, 439-442).

A further issue concerns what Stephen Gardiner has termed the “tyranny of the contemporary” (Gardiner 2011; Gardiner 2025): a structural dynamic in which each generation’s pursuit of modest present benefits predictably imposes severe cumulative costs on all successors, and in which both prevailing moral theories and existing institutions appear ill-equipped—or even structurally disinclined—to resist this pattern. Since Gardiner’s analysis concerns a structural dynamic that shapes intergenerational decision-making rather than an account of the grounds or content of intergenerational justice, it is not addressed in detail here (for discussion see, e.g. Sparenborg 2022).

The relationship between the justice claims of present people and those of future people also raises further questions that this entry does not address. The principles discussed in §4.1 – §4.3 are universal in scope: they apply to all persons whose interests are affected by long-term policies, whether these persons live now or in the more distant future. This entry does not address the question of how potential conflicts between the justice claims of present people (or those in the nearer future) and those of more remote future generations should be resolved, nor whether justice duties to contemporaries differ in kind, strength, or justificatory basis from duties owed to future individuals, a point touched on in §3.2. These questions have been explored in a growing literature. For example, Darrel Moellendorf (2022) argues that certain commitments regarding what must be secured for present individuals—such as avoiding forms of deprivation—shape how we should understand what justice requires for future generations, thereby suggesting that intragenerational and intergenerational justice may be normatively intertwined. Others have examined related issues from different angles, including the structure of trans- and intergenerational claims (Gosseries 2023, ch. 1; see also Andina & Corvino 2023), the comparative treatment of age groups and the normative symmetry or asymmetry between young and old (Bidadanure 2021), and the distinctive moral position of the present generation in virtue of its capacity to determine the conditions under which future people will live (Shue 2022).

The entry will report in detail on the second debate and indicate how the third is systematically connected to it, since both raise questions about how to assess harm when identity is contingent. In both debates one needs to be clear about how one assesses an act as harmful or beneficial. Owing to the contingency of future people and the fact that present individuals may have claims arising from historical injustice even though they would not have existed had the past been different, the question of how present claims can be grounded when identity is contingent is problematic. According to the so-called person-affecting view, an act can be wrong only if that act harms, or will harm or can be expected to harm, a person who does or will exist (see especially Parfit 1984: 363, 295–396; Heyd 1992 and 2014: 2–3; Boonin 2008; Roberts 2013). One important issue is whether one should adopt a person-affecting view or an impersonal view. Some interpret duties of intergenerational justice on the basis of what might be called a weak person-affecting view. According to this view, in assessing whether an act is harmful or wrongful what matters is what has been done to a particular existing or future person. A weakly person-affecting assessment does not require that the act under scrutiny make an existing or future person worse off or harm that person by comparing how well off the person was before. Concerning the questions of whether a future person will be harmed or wronged by having been brought into existence under certain conditions the weak person-affecting view relies neither on a comparison with the state the person would have been in had she not been brought into existence, that is with the person’s never-ever existing, nor on a comparison with how well off other people would have been had currently living people acted differently. People who never exist and people who potentially exist do not count; only those people who actually exist at some time count.

This weak person-affecting view stands in contrast to a strong person-affecting view, according to which an act harms a person only if that same person is worse off than she would otherwise have been at that time. Both the weak and the strong person-affecting views differ from impersonal views, according to which the value of states of affairs is not reducible to their effect on the interests of actual people. Currently living people ought to choose the state of affairs in which more of the morally relevant values are realized, regardless of who the future people are who will live. Many theorists claim that a plausible understanding of intergenerational ethics must be impersonal or must combine person-affecting and impersonal considerations (see especially J. Harris 1992: 94–95; Singer 1998; Buchanan et al. 2000: 249; Harman 2004: 101–102; McBrayer 2008: 304; Holtug 2009: 71–92; McMahan 2009: 49–68; Temkin 2012: 313–362; Williams & Harris 2014: 347; Heyd’s interpretation of Parfit 2011 in Heyd 2014; Parfit 2017). The differences between the person-affecting and impersonal understandings will come to the fore in §2.2 and §3, which address intergenerational duties grounded in what is owed to future people as a matter of justice, as well as in §4.6 on the limits of a rights-based account of intergenerational ethics.

2. Rights of Future People vis-à-vis Presently Living People

On a person-affecting view, future people count if, and insofar as, they have interests, just claims, or rights vis-à-vis currently living people. Some philosophers deny that this can ever be the case. In addition to an argument reflecting the Non-Identity Problem (§§2.2; 3–4.3) we can distinguish at least three further arguments in support of the denial of the possibility of future people having rights vis-à-vis us.

2.1 Doubts about the Possibility of Future People Having Rights

First, some philosophers have denied that future people can have rights (or even claims), simply on the grounds that they will live in the future. Consider the following claim:

Future generations by definition do not exist now. They cannot now, therefore, be the present bearer or subject of anything, including rights. (De George 1981: 161; see also Macklin 1981: 151–152; Beckerman & Pasek 2001: 14–23; Herstein 2009: 1180–1182)

Claiming that we can violate the rights of future people now does not, however, imply that future people have rights now (though see Partridge 1990: 54–55, who suggests that future people have rights in the present). That implication would hold only if it were conceded that presently existing rights alone constrain present action. But we can safely assume, first, that future people will be bearers of rights in the future; second, that the rights they have will be determined by the interests they have at that time; and third, that our present actions and policies can affect those interests. If we can violate a person’s rights by severely frustrating her interests, and if we can likewise severely frustrate the interests of future people, then we can violate their future rights (see Hoerster 1991: 98–102). Their merely future existence is thus insufficient to ground the claim that we cannot now violate the rights of future persons (see also Caney 2010: 72–76).

According to the second argument, for future people to have rights vis-à-vis us we would have to ascribe a right to existence to them. However, we are not committed to the claim that if we are able now to violate the rights of future generations, it is their rights to existence that we violate. Since it is implausible that anyone has a right to existence as such, it is implausible that future persons have rights to existence. Furthermore, when we prevent someone’s existence, we do not thereby harm the hypothetical interests of this potential subject. Thus, claiming that actual future people have rights vis-à-vis currently living people now cannot commit us to claiming that possible future people have a right to existence (see also Caney 2010, 78-80).

The third argument points to the fact that our epistemic situation does not allow us to relate to future people as individuals. Can our present actions nonetheless be constrained by rights of future generations that are based on interests other than existence as such, interests such as subsistence, etc.? This is possible only if attributing rights to people does not require us to make reference to individual persons (Herstein 2009: 1180–1182). However, third, lack of particular knowledge of future people as individuals does not stand in the way of attributing to them welfare rights, such as a right to subsistence. [1] The corresponding obligations do not depend on the particular identity of future persons. Rather, such obligations are grounded in the fact that future persons are human beings; that is, they share those properties of being human that permit and require us to relate morally to them as fellow humans who should be able to pursue their own well-being (see also Caney 2010: 82–83).

Having reported on skeptical doubts concerning the possibility of future people having rights vis‑à‑vis currently living people, we now turn to the relevance of the contingency of future people — the issue that, under the label of the “non‑identity problem,” has shaped much of the philosophical inquiry into intergenerational justice (§§3–4.4; see also entry nonidentity problem). One important illustration of the challenge for person‑affecting views concerns the widely held belief that prospective parents should refrain from bringing a child into existence if they know that the child’s life would fall below a sufficiently good (or decent) level of well‑being (§2.2).

2.2 A Right to Non-Existence?

Can prospective children be said to have an interest that their parents not act in a way likely to lead to their birth when the parents are in a position to know that the life of the child, should it be born, would fall below some relevant threshold of well-being? (On the significance of the notion of a threshold level of well-being, see below, §3 and §4). John Stuart Mill endorses the idea of a procreational duty of omission, namely, not to bring a person into existence unless the person will have “at least the ordinary chances of a desirable existence” (see Mill 1859 [1977: 301–304]). It is a widely held belief that, under certain circumstances, prospective parents should refrain from procreating because of the predicted plight of the would-be child. Antinatalists hold that these conditions hold generally (see, e.g., Schopenhauer 1851: vol. 2, ch. xii, §149; Cioran 1978: 117; Horstmann 1983: 99–101). More recently, for example, Seana Shiffrin (1999) and David Benatar (2006: esp. ch. 2) have argued that causing someone to exist always entails the frustration of some of that person’s interests and inflicts non-trivial harm, and therefore we ought to refrain from procreating.

Since the publication of Narveson’s seminal paper “Utilitarianism and New Generations” (Narveson 1967; see also Narveson 1973), many have contributed to the debate on whether a person-affecting approach can account for the asymmetry of our procreational duties (Parfit 1976; Feinberg 1984: 101, and 1986; Mulgan 2006: ch. 6; Rivera-López 2009). The claimed asymmetry is this: while prospective parents have no obligation to procreate out of regard for the interests of possible future children, they do have an obligation not to beget children whose lives would be miserable.

Some have argued that belief in such an asymmetry is incompatible with a person-affecting view and, more particularly, with the claim that possible people cannot be said to have, against us, a right to existence.[2] It is helpful at this point to make a distinction between the reasoning of potential parents that involves a possible future child and reasoning that involves their future child (see Govier 1979: 111). For instance, in deciding not to procreate at all, people do not thereby harm the children they could have brought into existence (see §2.1) since these are merely possible individuals. Thus, much reasoning about whether or not to have a child should concern the interests of those already alive; it is actual people’s lives that would be affected by whether or not the child comes into existence (see Heyd 1992: 96–97; Roberts 2009: sec. 2). Nonetheless, people might make choices about procreation based on the welfare of their future child; that is, the welfare of that as yet non-existent individual would feature in their reasoning. When prospective parents decide in favor of having a child and now learn that this child, if born, would have a life that falls below a certain threshold of well-being (see §4), they ought to consider the effects of their actions on their child and might well decide not to have a child after all.

Objections to the asymmetry view presented above concern, in particular, the claim that, after making a decision to have children, prospective parents should revise that decision out of regard for their would-be child(ren) when they learn that the prospective child(ren) would have a life that falls below the relevant threshold. Why, under these circumstances, should parents revise their decision to have children out of regard for the children? Some argue that they would harm the would-be child, and, thus, arguably, would act wrongly toward it. Here, harming their child-to-be would inflict a wrong on it. When prospective parents learn that their child would have a life that falls below the relevant threshold, they should refrain from having it, for by bringing the child into existence, they would harm that very child. In bringing a child into existence, they can harm the child whose life would fall below the threshold.

This claim has been said to be incompatible with a person-affecting view (see Heyd 1992: 102, 105–106, 241–242). In §3, two notions of harm will be distinguished. The first relies on comparing a person’s actual state to a counterfactual (or historical) state of the same person. The second relies on no such comparison. Both notions of harm require us to ask: for whom is the action worse? Yet while both can be understood to reflect the person-affecting view as outlined above (§1), only the first satisfies Parfit’s “two-state requirement” or “better-or-worse-for-the-same-person” condition:

we benefit or harm someone only if we cause him to be better or worse off than he would otherwise at that time have been. (Parfit 1984: 487)

This requirement characterizes the strong person-affecting view (as introduced in §1). The contingency of future people will often mean that the same person could not or is not likely to have come into existence as a result of two alternative acts or actions (see below §3.1). As will be shown in §3.2 below, in applying the second notion of harm, we do not have to compare the value of life below some threshold with nonexistence (or with how well off another person or other people would have been) in order to claim that we can cause harm to a person by bringing that person into existence. This second notion fulfills the conditions of the weak person-affecting view (as introduced in §1) (cf. Caney 2010: 73–76, who interprets human rights as threshold-based protections that do not require counterfactual comparisons).

If, on the basis of this reflection, we assume that the person can be considered harmed, why was the person wronged by having been brought into existence if the person has a life worth living? If we specify the threshold in terms of rights, we might think that the person would waive whatever right was violated by having been brought into existence, since the person can be assumed to strongly prefer living to never existing. We might then conclude that bringing into existence a person whose life is worth living still falls below the threshold is a case of wrongless harm-doing when the issue is considered in person-affecting terms (see J. Harris 1992: 94–96; Williams & Harris 2014, 347–348).

The assumed fact that the person would waive her right clearly does not settle the matter of whether she was wronged by being brought into existence (Harman 2004: 89–101; Liberto 2014: 79–80). A person can have a legitimate complaint about having been brought into existence even though she does not wish that the action had not occurred, although she (the same person) could not be in the state of not having been wronged (but see Heyd 2014: 4–5), and even though she enjoys a life worth living.

The claim that bringing into existence a person in a harmed state according to a certain threshold is wrongful implies that this person is worse off than she ought to be (compare Caney 2010: 74–76, who argues that persons are wronged when they are foreseeably placed below a morally required minimum). That the person will have a life worth living is not a sufficient reason to render permissible bringing the person into existence and in a harmed sub-threshold state. The ground for this reason does not rely on a comparison with how well off the person or other people would be if we refrain from bringing the person into existence or acted differently (but see Harman 2004: 101–102; McBrayer 2008: 304; Woollard 2012). The reason, understood in person-affecting terms, does not reflect the view that the person would be better off never coming into existence, nor the view that we should bring into existence another person whose life is above the threshold, nor the view that we should maximize the number of people with lives above the threshold. Rather, if we have a choice between bringing into existence a person with a life worth living, but below the threshold, and bringing into existence a person with a life worth living at or above the threshold, therelevant reason—namely, that persons can be worse off than they ought to be—speaks against doing the former but not in favor of doing the latter. This is how the argument proceeds on the basis of a weak person-affecting view (see §1) and a threshold conception of harm (see §3).

Let us note that one can also defend the asymmetry of our procreational duties from an impersonal view, according to which the value of states of affairs is not reducible to how these states affect the interests of people. From an impersonal view, one does not have to claim that prospective parents should refrain from procreation out of regard for the children they would have. Based on this view, two alternative interpretations of the asymmetry of our procreational duties have been discussed in the literature. One could adopt a version of negative consequentialism and argue that the universe would be better if present generations were guided by a criterion of right action that requires them to give priority to the prevention of suffering over the creation of good and happiness (see Heyd 1992: 59–60, for problems with this account). Alternatively, an impersonal approach could hold that we have a prima facie duty to promote overall happiness by creating new people whose lives go well—a duty that may, however, be more easily overridden than duties not to cause harm. The paradoxical implications of the latter view have been prominently explored by Derek Parfit.[3]

3. No Rights Due to Contingency of Future People Upon Our Decisions?

The main source of skepticism concerning the possibility of future people having welfare rights vis‑à‑vis those currently living rests on the contingency of future persons upon present decisions and actions. This contingency has been interpreted by some philosophers as raising a distinctive challenge for person‑affecting approaches to intergenerational justice, most notably in the form of the non‑identity problem.

3.1 Responses to the Non-Identity Problem

Consider a policy of making intensive and extensive use of exhaustible resources for the aim of increasing the welfare of currently living people. If the policy is criticized for harming future people on the ground that this policy will predictably worsen their conditions of life and thus is likely to violate their welfare rights, a defender of the policy could reply by saying: many, if not all[4] of our actions have (indirect) effects not only on the conditions of life, but also on the number, existence, and identity of future persons. This is also true for actions that allegedly harm future persons. If the non-performance of the allegedly harmful action would have resulted in the allegedly harmed person not coming into existence, then that person cannot be said to have been harmed by this action—or, at any rate, according to the common understanding of harm (see Meyer 2003: 147–149, 155–158, for a detailed discussion).

The common understanding is informed by a diachronic notion of harm and a notion that requires a subjunctive comparison with a historical baseline (hereinafter subjunctive-historical notion of harm).[5] Both the diachronic and the subjunctive-historical notions of harm require that the existence of the harmed person or people qua individuals is independent of the harming act or policy. On the diachronic notion of harm, the following formula holds:

(I)
(diachronic) An action (or inaction)[6] at time \(t_1\) harms someone only if the agent causes (allows) this person to be worse off at some later time \(t_2\)[7] than the person was before \(t_1\).

On the subjunctive-historical notion of harm, the corresponding necessary condition for harming is:

(II)
(subjunctive-historical) An action (or inaction) at time \(t_1\) harms someone only if the agent causes (or allows) this person to be worse off at some later time \(t_2\) than the person would have been at \(t_2\) had the agent not interacted with (or acted with respect to) this person at all.[8]

When considering future individuals as possible individuals both the diachronic and the subjunctive-historical notions of harm will exclude the possibility of present people harming future people, for the (future) people whose interests and rights they are required to respect are not in a particular state of well-being at the time they take their decision—they do not, at that time, exist. But according to (I) unless we can claim that the person is in a particular state of well-being at the time of our decision, that is, at \(t_1\), we cannot say that the person is worse off at \(t_2\) owing to our decision at \(t_1\). And likewise with (II): unless we can claim that there is a specific person who would have been better off at \(t_2\) than this person actually is at \(t_2\) had we not acted with respect to this person at all, this notion of harm makes no sense.

Adopting either the diachronic or the subjunctive-historical notions of harm excludes the possibility of our harming future people when we choose among long-term policies with significantly differing consequences for the quality of life of future people. With respect to persons whose existence is dependent upon the allegedly harming action, they cannot be worse (or, indeed, better) off owing to this action than they would have been had this action not been carried out. For in that case, they would not have existed.

We can distinguish four main responses to the non-identity problem so understood (compare Boonin 2008: 134 ff; Page 2008; Heyd 2009b; Roberts 2013; Wrigley 2012: 178): First, some philosophers hold the view that future people whose existence depends upon currently living people’s actions cannot have rights vis-à-vis the latter people’s actions (see Schwartz 1978; cf. Adams 1979; Kavka 1982; Parfit 1984: part iv; Boonin 2008; Roberts 2009). Second, others argue that currently living people can violate the rights of future people even if the former cannot harm the latter (see Kumar 2003). If so, future people cannot have welfare rights vis-à-vis currently living people insofar as violating welfare rights implies setting back or harming the interests of the right holders. Third, we can attempt to limit the practical significance of the non-identity problem by limiting the relevant actions to those that are not only likely but indeed necessary conditions of the existence of the concerned person.[9]

Finally, some have sought to circumvent the non-identity problem by suggesting an alternative notion of harm that is unaffected by the non-identity problem, the so-called “Threshold Conception of Harm” (Hanser 1990, 2009; McMahan 1998; Shiffrin 1999; Meyer 2003, 2009a; Harman 2004, 2009; Rivera-López 2009). The response to the non-identity problem based on the threshold conception is relevantly different from other responses (such as those criticized by Heyd in 2009b). The threshold response can be understood to be person-affecting in the weak sense (see §1 above): While the person being harmed according to the threshold notion does not imply that the same person is worse off than she would have otherwise been at that time, it does imply that this person is worse off than she ought to be. We owe it to the person when she will have come to existence that she is not in a harmed state (see §2.2 above). Such an understanding is relevantly different from an impersonal understanding according to which the universe is a better place when it does not include people in a harmed state as judged by the threshold Notion (but see Wrigley 2012: 178).

The threshold notion substitutes the necessary condition:

(III)
(threshold) An action (or inaction) at time \(t_1\) harms a person only if the agent thereby causes (allows) either the coming into existence of this person in a sub-threshold state or the already existing person to be in a sub-threshold state; further, only if this person would not be in the harmed state had the agent not interacted with (or acted with respect to) this person at all; and furthermore, only if the agent, if he cannot avoid causing harm in this sense, does not minimize the harm.

According to such a threshold notion of harm an action harms a person only if, as a consequence of that action, the (then existing) person falls below a normatively defined threshold (see McMahan 1998: 223–229; Shiffrin 1999). This threshold notion is unaffected by the non-identity problem, for here the finding of harm does not require that the person who is in the sub-threshold state would be in a better state in the situation that would have obtained in the absence of the harming action. Thus, future people can be said to be harmed by currently living people’s actions even if these actions are among the necessary conditions of the existence, identity or number of future people (see also Caney 2010: 82-83). Such a notion of harm limits the practical significance of the non-identity problem to different degrees depending upon how the threshold is substantially defined (see §4 below).

Both of the claims discussed above (in §1 and §2, passim), namely,

first, that considerations reflecting the welfare rights of future people vis-à-vis present people can guide the latter in choosing among long-term policies, and

second, that considerations of the rights of people not to be brought into existence if they are likely not to realise a certain level of well-being can guide prospective parents in deciding not to conceive out of regard for the children they would otherwise have,

can be read as relying upon a threshold notion of harm (Meyer 2003).

Adopting either the diachronic or the subjunctive-historical notions of harm (I and II, above) or both excludes, firstly, the possibility of our harming future people when we choose among long-term policies with significantly differing consequences for the quality of life of future people, and, secondly, the possibility that we harm persons by bringing them into existence if they will have a life worth living. But if we adopt the threshold notion of harm at ((III) above), future people can still be said to be wronged by our choice of a policy that harms them, notwithstanding the fact that the very existence of those specific people who are said to be harmed is causally dependent on our decision to pursue that policy.[10] According to (III), parents could act in light of an interest on the part of their would-be child in never existing at all: if the child were to be born, it would have a life below the relevant threshold. The subject of harm is the person when she is brought into existence in a harmed state. That she would not be worse or better off than she otherwise would have been is irrelevant for determining that she is or will be in a harmed sub-threshold state (see §2.2).

3.2 Derek Parfit’s No-Difference View and the Disjunctive Notion of Harm

Derek Parfit has introduced the “No-Difference View”: It makes no (theoretical or practical) difference to how we should act, all things considered, whether the size and composition of future generations depend upon our present decision or not. The relevant reasons are the same or have the same strength.

To what extent we can defend that view will depend on how we understand the relation between the notions of harm as distinguished in §3.1. Here we will delineate two views of how to understand these notions of harm and investigate the question of the extent to which these two alternative views support Parfit’s no-difference view. According to our first view, one must choose between the “single threshold” and the “single subjunctive-historical” notion of harm: to claim that rights-considerations can guide us in choosing among long-term policies we will have to adopt one of these notions of harm as specifying necessary conditions of harm; in doing so, we have to deny that the other notion specifies necessary (or sufficient) conditions of harm. In other words, the first view considers the single threshold and the single subjunctive-historical notion of harm as exclusive notions. According to the second view, the threshold notion of harm and the subjunctive-historical notion can be combined.

According to this “disjunctive notion” the necessary condition for harming is the disjunction of the conditions for harming as set out by the notions of harm at (II) and (III). The proposal is this: instead of interpreting accounts of harm at (II) and (III) as providing alternative necessary conditions for harming, we can take these two notions to provide the disjuncts for a necessary condition for harming. This disjunctive notion of harm substitutes yet a fourth necessary condition of what it means to harm someone:

(IV)
(disjunctive) An action (or inaction) at time \(t_1\) harms someone only if either the conditions of harming as in III or as in II are fulfilled.

We clearly ought to prefer the disjunctive notion to the single subjunctive-historical view according to which the subjunctive-historical notion of harm specifies necessary conditions of harm (and the threshold notion at (III) specifies neither necessary nor sufficient conditions). The disjunctive notion is compatible with the thesis of this entry that relies upon our employing a threshold notion of harm where the subjunctive-historical and the diachronic notions do not apply.[11] Some authors also argue that being worse off than the same person was or would have been is not a necessary condition for harm where the identity of the person is independent of the harming action (Hanser 1990; Shiffrin 1999; Harman 2004: 98–101; Woollard 2012: 681–683; but see Roberts 2009: 19–20). Ought we to prefer the disjunctive notion to the single threshold notion according to which the threshold condition is a necessary condition of harm? The advantage of the disjunctive notion is that this view of harm allows us to rely on the subjunctive-historical notion of harm whenever it is applicable, that is, when we will harm an existing person. In these cases, the notion of harm at (II) provides us with what most consider a straightforward account of the harm caused (see also §5).

Consider the type of case where we can act in a way that diminishes the well-being of a person who lives above any plausibly construed threshold. However, we will diminish the person’s well-being to a level still clearly above the threshold. For example, someone breaks into the garage of a mansion and steals the new convertible while the wealthy owner is at his penthouse in the city. This theft is not likely to cause the wealthy person’s well-being to fall below any plausibly construed threshold of harm, and thus according to (III) does not harm him. This seems implausible. Such a case is normally understood as a case in which the affected person is clearly harmed. More generally, the objection is that the threshold conception is under-inclusive in interpreting which acts we consider harmful.

The single threshold view by itself does not provide us with a response to this objection. For a plausible substantive specification of a threshold notion (see §4.3 below) will not include a concern for the well-being of those above the threshold. Thus, in responding to the objection we would have to add an additional obligation. For example, we could appeal to the additional obligation of minimizing harm to other persons: The obligation requires that we not cause another person to fall to a lower level of well-being quite independently of the level of well-being the person already realizes. What counts as a lower level of well-being can be measured by the specified threshold.

On the other hand, the disjunctive notion allows us to rely on the notion of harm at (II). This provides us with a straightforward account of the harm caused. Thus, the disjunctive notion is not open to the objection as stated. However, while the single threshold view can be shown to be fully compatible with Parfit’s no-difference view, the disjunctive notion of harm raises difficult questions of interpretation of its own.

Parfit illustrates the no-difference view by considering two medical programs (1984: 367). In both programs, a rare condition can be passed from mother to child. One involves pregnancy testing: if the test is positive, fetuses are treated for the rare condition. The other involves preconception testing: women who test positive as carriers of the rare condition are advised to postpone conception for at least two months and to undergo a harmless treatment, after which the condition will have disappeared. Because available funds can support only one of the programs, the other must be cancelled. Assuming that both programs have equivalent effects on parents, that the condition leads to the same specific handicap in children, and that both programs will achieve similar success rates, the only difference between them is that one affects actual people (pregnancy testing) while the other affects possible people (preconception testing). The (practical) no-difference view holds that our reason to prevent harm to possible future people (those who might be conceived) is just as strong as our reason to prevent harm to actual people (those already conceived who will develop from the already existing fetuses in due course). On this view, the two medical programs in Parfit’s example are equally worthy, and it makes no moral difference which one is cancelled.

Is the disjunctive notion of harm compatible with the no-difference view, thus understood? Here we cannot discuss the implications of the disjunctive notion in any detail. We might first observe that both the subjunctive-historical and threshold notions of harm can be employed to interpret many core cases of harm. That is to say, both sets of conditions as specified by the two notions of harm will arguably be satisfied in many cases where most people agree that harm was caused—at least under plausible construals of both notions of harm. Second, in the cases in which not both sets of conditions obtain, we still find that harm was caused, namely, as long as at least one set of conditions obtains. If the threshold notion of harm applies, we find that harm was caused. The disjunctive notion entails that canceling either test causes harm.

However, the disjunctive notion does not entail that it makes no practical difference which test we cancel. A plausible interpretation of the disjunctive notion might be the following: satisfying either set of the conditions provides a reason for objecting to the proposed action; if both sets of conditions obtain, the objection is presumably stronger than when only one set of conditions obtains. According to this understanding of the disjunctive notion and assuming that in Parfit’s example of the two medical programs the children, if either they or their mothers are not treated, will suffer a severe handicap, the objection to canceling pregnancy testing is stronger than the objection to canceling the preconception testing program. Because the handicap is severe, the children will fall below the threshold and the threshold notion of harm provides the same reason for objecting to canceling either program. But if pregnancy testing is cancelled this will be worse for the children who are not treated—the subjunctive-historical notion of harm applies. The subjunctive-historical notion of harm does not, however, provide a reason for objecting to cancellation of preconception testing. The children who will be born handicapped would never have existed if there had been testing prior to conception.[12] This understanding of the disjunctive notion may not, then, be compatible with the no-difference view. An alternative understanding would deny that where both notions of harm are applicable this strengthens the objection to the harmful act. Whether this strengthens the objection and, if so, how much more is a matter of future research (see Woollard 2012: 684–689).

The single threshold interpretation of harm is also compatible with a second and stronger understanding of the no-difference view (Woodward 1986: sects. II and III; Parfit 1986: 856–859): there is no theoretical difference in harming possible future people and harming actual people since the very same reasons hold against harming either group. The disjunctive notion is clearly incompatible with the theoretical understanding of the no-difference view. According to the disjunctive notion it would often not be true that the same reasons hold against harming either such group. When we object to the harming of actual people we will often have additional reasons that reflect the fact that the subjunctive-historical notion of harm applies.

4. How to Specify the Threshold

In §2.2 and §3 we introduced (the weak person-affecting interpretation of) the threshold conception of harm as a response to the logical-conceptual non-identity problem. By itself, this does not answer the question of how this conception is to be understood as an element of a substantive understanding of distributive justice of intergenerational relations. Two debates are particularly relevant: first, the debate on how to understand the principle of distributive justice; and, second, the debate on the currency—that is, how to measure the relevant differences in well-being.

An interpretation of the threshold as an element of a sufficiency conception of intergenerational justice is not mandatory, but seems plausible (as discussed in §4.4): the threshold can be interpreted as a sufficiency standard that is defined in terms of absolute, non-comparative conditions (defined by a certain level of well-being and not comparing the well-being levels of people) and which all people have a priority claim to achieve (Shiffrin 1999: 123–124; McMahan 1998: 223–229; Page 2006: esp. 90–95, 170–173; Casal 2007: 298–299; Meyer & Roser 2009: 226–243; Huseby 2012; Shields 2016: 34–35; Meyer & Pölzler 2025). Whether one and the same threshold is applicable to all decisions is a matter of controversy. Whether we wrongfully inflict non-comparative harms on a person by causing this person’s existence is often considered a special case for which a particularly low threshold is relevant: we cause such harm by bringing a person to existence only if this person’s postnatal potential of development and his life span are drastically reduced (Kavka 1982: 105–106) and especially so if the person experiences pain (C. E. Harris 1991: 65–66; Schöne-Seifert & Krüger 1993: 257–258; Merkel 2001).

4.1 Specifying the Threshold by Egalitarian Considerations

We might want to understand the threshold as an element of an egalitarian understanding of intergenerational justice. Egalitarian reasons allow us to object to inequalities, for egalitarian reasons make it possible for us to understand relative differences between the states of persons as something “which is itself to be eliminated or reduced” (Scanlon 2005: 6). We might hold that the standing of people relative to their contemporaries is (extrinsically or intrinsically) important (see the entry on equality) and that the threshold notion of harm ought to reflect, say, the average level of well-being that people realize—or that future people will realize: the higher the average level of well-being, the higher the threshold level of harm should be set. A similar point is made by Gosseries, who argues that intergenerational comparisons may play a role in specifying what future people are owed, even though equality across non-overlapping generations cannot be treated as intrinsically required (Gosseries 2023, ch. 2)

Egalitarian considerations that address relative differences between people can help specify the standard in at least two ways. First, presently existing people may be thought to harm future people by causing them to realize a (much) lower level of well-being than their own contemporaries (Sher 1979: 389). This resonates with accounts that treat intergenerational inequality as a morally relevant dimension of harm (see, e.g., Caney 2025). In addition or alternatively, we might hold that the threshold level ought to reflect, say, the average level of well-being of the present generations upon whose decisions the well-being of future people depends. According to such an interpretation, presently existing people harm future people by causing them to realize a (much) lower level of well-being than they enjoy themselves (see, for example, Barry 1999).

Still, even if egalitarian considerations that reflect a concern with the relative differences between people can help specify the threshold, a plausible threshold is unlikely to be based on that concern alone. Otherwise—this is an implication of the first interpretation—any level of well-being would count as justified as long as all future people fare equally badly (see, e.g., Caney 2025, 149). This presupposes attributing intrinsic value exclusively to equality—an implausible view (see the entry on equality and §4.2 below and §4.5 below). Moreover, to define the threshold standard of well-being of future people as the level of well-being achieved by currently living people (whatever it may be) is less than plausible, unless we were to attribute intrinsic value exclusively to intergenerational equality, so understood (see Marmor 2003, Steiner 2003, Raz 2003, Gosepath 2004: 454–63; Holtug & Lippert-Rasmussen 2007; Caney 2025, 149-53). This understanding not only implies that it is worse for future generations to be worse off than the present generation; it also implies that, in one respect, it is worse for future generations to be better off. In the intragenerational context, some philosophers have argued that this implication (the recommendation to “level down” persons’ well-being) is implausible (see Parfit 1997; Raz 1986: 230–235). An analogous objection applies to intergenerational relations as well. It is doubtful that a more equal distribution across generations is better if it came at the cost of some generations being worse off, and none being better off. Under certain circumstances this view would deny that currently living people may stand under a duty of justice positively to save for future people so that they will achieve a sufficientarian level of well-being (see §4.5 on Rawls’ “savings principle”).

4.2 Specifying the Threshold by Prioritarian Reasoning

According to the priority view (Parfit 1997: 213; Holtug 2007; Attas 2009: 207–211), equality as such does not matter. It is therefore not open to objections against holding equality to be of intrinsic value. A plausible version of the priority view reads as follows:

Priority view: Benefiting persons matters more the worse off the person is to whom the benefits accrue, the more people are being benefited and the greater the benefits in question.

The priority view has a built-in tendency toward equality, for it accepts the following egalitarian condition: If X is worse off than Y, we have at least a prima facie reason for promoting the well-being of X rather than Y (unless conditions obtain under which the only or best way of raising the X's well-being is by raising Y's, or conditions under which promoting the X's well-being brings about an increase of Y's well-being as a side-effect). Even if prioritarians do not see anything intrinsically bad in social, economic, or other differences, their view is a derivatively egalitarian. To this extent, it is correctly described as non-relational egalitarianism.

We might want to rely on the priority view to specify the threshold of harm. On this interpretation, future people are in a harmed state unless they are as well off as such a prioritarian view requires. There are at least two problems in understanding the threshold as an element of a prioritarian understanding of intergenerational justice. First, the priority view is likely to entail excessive intergenerational demands. Present actions or inactions can improve the well-being of many future generations to at least some extent. Moreover, the number of future people will likely be very large and depends in part on the decisions and actions of currently living people. Hence, according to prioritarianism, we ought to sacrifice more of our present well-being for the sake of future generations than seems plausible. It might even be the case that we are required to incur significant costs for the sake of only minuscule future benefits, insofar as doing so as maximizes the weighted sum of benefits for future persons (see Rawls 1999: 287; Wolf 2009: 373; Meyer & Roser 2009: 233–235). How likely it is that the priority view has this implication will also depend upon the strength the view gives to the priority of the worse off who are (very) badly off. Of course, the priority view will not have this implication if (whatever currently living people do) all future people were to enjoy levels of well-being that are higher than those of all or most currently living people.

Second, the priority view does not entail a plausible population cap. Under some circumstances, having large but badly off future generations might be consistent with prioritizing the number of beneficiaries, the size of benefits and those who are worse off (see entry on repugnant conclusion; Meyer 1997: 139–140).

4.3 Specifying the Threshold as a Sufficientarian Standard

Interpreting the threshold concept as an element of a sufficiency conception of intergenerational justice can take a number of different forms (see Benbaji 2005: 316–321 and 2006; Casal 2007: 312–326; Huseby 2010a). A plausible version is characterized by two theses, namely by what scholars have called the “Positive Thesis” (see especially Casal 2007: 298–299) and the “Shift Thesis” (Shields 2016: 34–35). The positive thesis states that we have weighty non-instrumental reasons to secure at least enough of some benefit(s). According to the shift thesis,

once people have secured enough there is a discontinuity in the rate of change of the marginal weight of our reasons to benefit individuals further. (Shields 2018: 211)

The shift thesis is compatible with several understandings of the relevance of justice-based reasons above the threshold, among them: First, once a person is above the threshold of sufficiency there is no justice-based reason to benefit this person. This claim is often referred to as the “Negative Thesis” of sufficientarianism and has been much criticized (Casal 2007: 299–304). Second, other justice-based reasons apply above the threshold that are less weighty. This would mean that additional justice claims reflecting, for example, prioritarian or egalitarian reasoning (see §4.1 and §4.2) can be valid. Third, the same justice-based reasons that apply below the threshold undergo a relative change of weight at the sufficiency threshold.

The third understanding of the shift thesis concerns a further distinction in how the sufficiency conception itself is understood. Versions of sufficientarianism vary in how they take into account ethical or justice-based reasons to benefit persons who are above the threshold of sufficiency. Strong sufficientarianism assigns absolute priority to those who are below the threshold, whereas weak sufficientarianism grants them priority but not an absolute. In the intergenerational context, weak sufficientiarianism seems more plausible than strong sufficientarianism (Meyer & Stelzer 2018).

Suppose not all presently living and future persons’ claims to sufficiency well-being can be met (but see Wolf 2009: 362). Then we would need to weigh all people’s claims. Proponents of sufficientarianism have proposed different principles of distribution below the threshold of sufficiency. Most prominently, they have argued that we ought to maximize the well-being of present and future individuals below the threshold (so-called “min-deprivation”; Wolf 2009: 356–357); or that we ought to maximize the number of individuals who are sufficiently well-off (so-called “headcount”; Page 2007a: 85–95). Both of these below-threshold principles seem problematic. They will often imply that we ought to sacrifice the worst-off present or future persons for the sake of better-off, but still badly-off persons. According to a third understanding, we should rely on a priority view for unavoidable sub-threshold distributions: benefitting persons below the sufficiency threshold matters more the more claimants are benefitted and the greater the benefits they receive (Meyer 2009a, 2009b, 2015; Meyer & Roser 2009). This understanding entails sacrificing the worst-off individuals for the sake of better-off but still badly off individuals only under circumstances where the former's higher weighted claims are outweighed by the sum of the less weighty claims of a larger number of better-off people.

Richard Arneson and others (Arneson 1999, 2000; Roemer 2004; and see Casal 2007: esp. 312–314, 315–318) have objected to thresholds, and especially those that designate an absolute priority—as is characteristic of the position of strong sufficientarianism—on the grounds that we cannot avoid an arbitrary specification of such priority thresholds and, further, that such thresholds are incompatible with our distributive convictions’ being continuous (that is, that they all can be accounted for by means of one principle of distribution). Others have defended a priority threshold against both objections (Crisp 2003: 753–757; Benbaji 2006: 332–344; Page 2007a: 16–18; Dorsey 2008; Huseby 2010b: 180–182; Freiman 2012: 30–33; Shields 2012: 111–115; Sher 2014: chs. 8 and 9; Meyer & Pölzler 2025). In specifying a priority threshold, one important issue is which currency we should rely on (see §4.4).

Defining a threshold of well-being according to which both currently and future living people are able to reach a sufficientarian threshold arguably avoids the implausible implications of the egalitarian and prioritarian alternatives when these are understood as defining thresholds of harm (see §4.1 and §4.2): First, avoiding or reducing differences must not lead to a state of affairs in which people are worse off than they ought to be. Secondly, claims against currently living people are unreasonable when fulfilling them would bring about only minimal or trivial improvements in the well-being of future people while imposing losses on the currently living that push them below a plausible threshold level of well-being. Third, the number of people brought into existence ought to be compatible with all people having sufficiently good lives or lives worth living (see Meyer 1997: 139–140).

To be sure, according to the shift thesis, justice-based reasons may also apply above the threshold, and these can include egalitarian or prioritarian considerations. It is also important to note that the reasons supporting a sufficientarian understanding of intergenerational justice are, at least in part, domain-specific reasons and need not be relevant for understanding either global justice or the notion of justice that holds among contemporary members of well-ordered societies.

4.4 On the Currency of Intergenerational Justice

If we interpret the threshold as an element of a sufficiency conception of intergenerational justice, it identifies a sufficiency standard that all people have a priority claim to achieve. Such an interpretation is supported by a view of the currency of well-being that helps explain why failing to meet the threshold significantly harms people. A basic-needs account provides such a view. When people cannot satisfy their basic needs, they are necessarily and severely damaged: necessarily, because the harm does not arise from unusual environmental conditions or from idiosyncratic characteristics of the person concerned. Rather, it results from conditions or from characteristics that currently apply and can be expected to remain largely unchanged (Wiggins 1998: 15). The damage is significant because it undermines the conditions for the possibility of a minimally good life (Wiggins 1998: 14). For example, if a person has no access to food, this leads to apathy, organ damage or even death of the person. Such damage is physiologically necessary, regardless of, for example, the nationality, social status, or religion of the person concerned. Being able to satisfy basic needs when understood in this way can be protected for reasons of justice by ascribing the corresponding moral rights. The same list of such rights is attributed to all people (wherever and whenever they live), which does not exclude the possibility that changing social, economic and cultural conditions also change the means of satisfying basic needs (the so-called satisfiers of basic needs) (see, e.g., Braybrooke 1987; Sen 1984; Nussbaum 2000: 132–133; Page 2006: 71–75).

The currency of central capabilities (see Nussbaum 2006; Petz 2018; Caney 2025) is highly similar to the currency of basic needs. Other currencies differ in important respects (see Gosseries 2023, ch.3; Meyer & Pölzler 2025). For example, the currency of preference-satisfaction (whatever these preferences happen to be) (see, e.g., Arrow 1963; Goodin 1995; Singer 1979) measures well-being in subjective rather than objective subjective terms: what a person prefers is contingent on mental states, namely on the preferences of this person, and these preferences may change in ways that are difficult to predict. It is both possible and plausible that future persons will have (fundamentally) different preferences from those of people living today. The currency of impersonal resources (i.e., goods that can be used to produce many kinds of benefits, such as income and wealth) (see, e.g., Barry 1989a; Rawls 2001) faces a different problem. Levels of impersonal resources do not necessarily correlate with the levels of well-being people actually realize. For this reason, impersonal resources are unreliable indicators of well-being (see Page 2007b: 457–458; Sen 1982: 19–21, 26–30).

4.5 Rawls’s Just Savings Principle

John Rawls was the first to develop a systematic account of obligations to future people as a central element of a theory of justice (Rawls 1971, 1999, especially section 44; Rawls 1993: 274; Rawls 2001: especially sections 49.2 and 3). He introduces the “just savings principle,” which specifies what each generation owes to its successors. Long before Rawls, Frank Ramsey developed a model for determining the optimal savings within a utilitarian framework (Ramsey 1928; see entry on Ramsey and intergenerational welfare economics"). a model that disregards distributional concerns. Following Sidgwick (1907 [1981: 414]), Ramsey (1928: 261), Rawls (1971: 263) and Parfit (1984: appendix F) all reject what is called “pure time discounting”, the view that the well-being or legitimate claims of future people should count for less merely because they occur in the future. A long-standing issue in economics concerns how loans and taxes used to finance public policies compare in terms of the burdens they impose on future generations (see e.g., Pigou 1920: ch. ix; Viner 1920; Mishan 1963). Moreover, provisions aimed at protecting the welfare interests of future generations have existed since antiquity (Auerbach 1995: 27–35; Wissowa et al. 1937: vol. xi, 2011, 2014, 2021).

In proposing a principle of “just savings” Rawls never discusses the non-identity problem and for most of his discussions (but see Rawls rev. edition 1999: 141) he assumes that the number of future people is constant (for criticism see Heyd 1992: 47; Dasgupta 1994; Casal & Williams 1995; Barry 1999: 107–111; Gosseries 2001: 330–333). However, his principle of just savings can be understood to provide us with a substantive understanding of intergenerational sufficientarianism. It can be understood as an interpretation of a threshold notion of harm in different number choices (see Reiman 2007; Attas 2009).

Rawls specifies the sufficientarian threshold relevant for defining currently living people’s obligations of justice vis-à-vis future people: “the conditions needed to establish and to preserve a just basic structure over time” (Rawls 2001: 159; on the basic structure as the subject of the application of a sufficientarian principle see also Freiman 2012: 33–37; Meyer 2015). Rawls distinguishes two stages of societal development for the application of his principle of just savings. Currently living people have a justice-based reason to save for future people only if such saving is necessary for allowing future people to reach the sufficientarian threshold as specified. This is known as the accumulation stage. Once just institutions are securely established—this is known as the steady-state stage—justice no longer requires additional saving for future people. Instead, they should do what is necessary to allow future people to continue living under and maintaining just institutions. Rawls also holds that, in that second stage, people ought to leave their descendants at least the equivalent of what they received from the previous generation (see Gosseries 2001 for a comparative assessment of Rawls’s substantive principle). This additional claim can be supported by egalitarian considerations (see §4.1), the idea of a presumption in favor of equality (see Sidgwick 1907 [1981: 379–380], and the entry on equality), and by the considerations delineated in the next section (§4.6).

As is characteristic of Rawls’s work, he presents the just savings principle as the outcome of a decision reached in the contractualist (hypothetical and non-historical) decision-situation of the original position. Who are the persons in the original position? Rawls considers an original position in which every generation is represented. However, as the relations between the contractors so conceived are not characterized by the “circumstances of justice” (Rawls 1971: paragraph 22), the question of justice as Rawls understands it does not arise: We cannot cooperate with previous generations and, although previous generations can benefit or harm us, we cannot benefit or harm them (see §1).[13] Instead, Rawls therefore adjusts the (present-time of entry) interpretation of the original position for the intergenerational context (Rawls 1993: 274; Rawls 2001: paragraph 25.2). The contractors know that they belong to one generation, but the veil of ignorance blinds them to which particular generation they belong (see Gardiner 2009: esp. 97–116, and Heyd 2009a: esp. 170–176, for a comparative analysis of how contract theories can be extended to the subject matter of intergenerational relations). From the standpoint of the original position, the contractors determine what counts as a just savings rate.

While the circumstances of justice clearly hold among contemporaries, the contractors cannot know whether previous generations have saved for them. Why then should they agree to save for future generations? In A Theory of Justice (1971: 284–293), Rawls stipulates “a motivational assumption” according to which the contractors care for their descendants so that they will want to agree to save for their successors—irrespective of whether previous generations saved for them (for criticism see, e.g., Hubin 1976/77: 70–83; English 1977: 91–104; Heyd 1992: 41–51). In Political Liberalism, Rawls withdraws this motivational assumption. He now understands previous generations’ non-compliance with a just savings principle as a problem of non-ideal theory (Rawls 1993: 274, fn. 12; for criticism see, e.g., Dasgupta 1994: 107–108). The original position, however, belongs to ideal theory where strict compliance with whatever principles are chosen is assumed (Rawls 1971: 144–145). Rawls introduces questions of partial and non-compliance only at the level of non-ideal theory (Rawls 1971: ch. iv). Consistent with this framework, he assumes that the generations are mutually disinterested. He takes the parties in the original position to agree on a savings principle

subject to the further condition that they must want all previous generations to have followed it.

Rawls continues:

Thus the correct principle is that which the members of any generation (and so all generations) would adopt as the one their generation is to follow and as the principle they would want preceding generations to have followed (and later generations to follow), no matter how far back (or forward) in time. (Rawls 1993: 274; Rawls 2001: 160)

The principle of just savings thus agreed on is thought to be binding for all previous and future generations.

4.6 Limits of a Rights-Based Account: Duties Towards the Future

A sufficientarian interpretation of the threshold notion of harm (together with an appropriate conception of wrongdoing) seems to offer a plausible understanding of what is owed to future people. On this view, the fact that the very existence of future persons depends on our present decisions does not matter where what is in question is our ability to harm future people’s interests and to violate their rights. By employing a non-comparative notion of harm, we can justify the present generation’s duties not to violate the rights of future generations against being harmed. Accordingly, rights-based considerations are not limited to what Parfit calls “same people choices.” They also bear upon both types of “different people choices” he distinguishes: same number choices, in which the same number of future people remains constant regardless of our present choices, and different number choices, in which our present choices result in different numbers of future people (Parfit 1984: 355–356). Intergenerational sufficientarianism therefore allows us to specify the considerations of justice relevant for decisions concerning population policies. On this account, future people have rights vis-à-vis us that reflect considerations of justice as specified by intergenerational sufficientarianism. Our correlative duties set a normative framework for most of our decisions concerning future people, including those that have an impact on their number and identity.

However, such a framework does not provide a complete moral theory of intergenerational relations and this is especially true in the context of decisions concerning the existence, number, and identity of future people. There are concerns for future people that cannot be accounted for by rights-based considerations (Jonas 1979; Heyd 1992 and 2009a; De-Shalit 1995: ch. 1; Meyer 1997; Thompson 2009; Scheffler 2013: 60–63, 72–73, 80–81; Sanklecha 2017a, 2017b). First, consider the notion that it matters that there be future people at all. However, a person-affecting intergenerational sufficientarianism will account for the asymmetry of our procreational duties (see §2.2): On the one hand, prospective parents should refrain from procreation out of regard for the child(ren) they would have if the life of their child(ren) would fall below the relevant sufficientarian threshold. On the other hand, people have no obligation to procreate out of regard for the interests of possible future children. Possible people have no right to be brought into existence (and we do not have the correlative obligation to procreate).

Second, consider the claim that future people should have a life that is well above the level of well-being specified by a threshold notion of harm. As Jamieson (2024, ch. 8) emphasizes, many of our concerns for future generations relate not only to avoiding deprivation but also to preserving environmental conditions, cultural goods, and ways of life that enable flourishing well above any sufficiency threshold. According to the shift thesis (introduced in §4.3), intergenerational sufficientarianism is compatible with denying that people have above-threshold justice claims and with understanding these claims as less weighty justice claims.[14] The second concern partly reflects a third concern, namely the notion that future people should be able to share (at least in certain respects) the particular way of life of those currently living. But, presumably, currently living people do not violate the rights of future people by failing to sustain particularly valuable aspects of their way of life for them. Thus, if we take into account all three of the above restrictions, intergenerational sufficientarianism may specify no reason for preferring a future with people all of whom have lives far above the level of a sufficiency threshold to a future with no people.[15]

Clearly, considerations based on the rights of future people cannot or cannot fully account for all the concerns we might have for future people. As several authors have emphasized (Jonas 1979; Heyd 1992; De-Shalit 1995; Meyer 1997; Thompson 2009; Scheffler 2013, 2025), such concerns reflect ethically significant aspects of our relations to future generations that are not captured by rights-based accounts. Recent work has also clarified why attempts to ground our concern for the future solely in the value of individual lives face serious difficulties. McKinnon (2025, 688-691), for example, distinguishes between extinction-dependent and extinction-independent explanations of the badness of extinction risk. Extinction-dependent accounts explain the badness of the risk by appeal to the badness of extinction itself. Standard versions that focus on the loss of present and future lives are vulnerable to the repugnant conclusion (Parfit 1984). By contrast, Scheffler’s “afterlife conjecture” (Scheffler 2013; Scheffler 2025, 432-438) offers a different extinction-dependent explanation: the prospect of extinction undermines the conditions under which we value, because many of our projects, evaluative commitments, and affective attachments presuppose the continued existence of future people. McKinnon also develops an extinction-independent account, according to which the creation or acceleration of extinction mechanisms undermines human security—a temporally extended good—by threatening the goods necessary for people to live lives of value, even if extinction never occurs. On these views, our relation to future generations involves not only their dependence on us but also our evaluative, emotional, and practical dependence on them. These forms of concern, which reflect our participation in an ongoing chain of generations, cannot be reduced to the rights of future people and point toward a broader normative framework for intergenerational ethics (see also Corvino 2022; Andina and Corvino 2023).

What considerations besides rights-based considerations can guide us in our relations to future people? It has been suggested that the widely shared concerns about the continuation of human life on earth at a high level of well-being can, at least in part, be accounted for by an obligation toward future people that have no correlatives in future people’s rights vis-à-vis current people. This obligation reflects those widely shared concerns about future people which cannot be accounted for by rights-based considerations. The obligation can be described along the following lines (Baier 1981; Meyer 2005: chs. 4 and 5; Thompson 2009): those currently alive owe respect to highly valuable goods that their predecessors bequeathed to them as well as to more remote future people, and they also owe respect to the highly valuable future-oriented projects of their contemporaries. Owing such respect gives rise to a general obligation, namely that current people should not willfully destroy the inherited goods and the conditions that are constitutive of persons’ pursuit of future-oriented projects. In other words, such respect gives rise to a general obligation that one not willfully destroy the social practices on which the possibility of people pursuing future-oriented projects depends. While future people belong to the beneficiaries, the obligation is owed to both present and past people.

Comparable ideas have been developed in a range of recent accounts that emphasize relational, diachronic, and non-correlative obligations across generations. Kallhoff (2025) interprets practices of declaring and preserving natural heritage as performative acts that express respect for inherited goods and a commitment to pass them on as a gift to future generations. By contrast, Nolt (2025) develops a long-term non-anthropocentric ethic that grounds intergenerational obligations in the protection of living systems and their objective goods, rather than in relational or heritage-based considerations. Environmental conceptions of buen vivir ground intergenerational responsibilities in relations of reciprocity, complementarity, and interdependence between humans, nonhuman nature, and future generations (Vidiella & García Valverde 2025). Māori philosophy, through the concept of kaitiakitanga, frames intergenerational obligations in terms of whakapapa—a genealogical network connecting past, present, and future beings—and emphasizes responsibilities to sustain socioenvironmental relationships and the conditions for collective flourishing (Watene 2025). Ecocentric approaches likewise locate intergenerational responsibilities in the protection of valued forms of ecological organization and in ethical frameworks inherited from ancestral generations (Whyte 2025). Recent work on biodiversity justice adds a further dimension: Armstrong (2024; see also Armstrong 2025) argues that duties to conserve biodiversity cannot be grounded solely in the rights of future individuals, since biodiversity loss threatens ecological systems, option-sets, and forms of value that are not substitutable and not reducible to person-affecting harm. These perspectives reinforce the idea that present people may have obligations to preserve inherited goods, practices, and ecological relationships independently of any correlative rights held by future individuals. A related development within sufficientarian approaches also seeks to incorporate these broader environmental concerns. Casal’s “Conservationist Sufficiency” (2024) interprets the sufficientarian threshold not as the point at which distributive principles lose their force, but as the point beyond which further environmental degradation—including harm to nonhuman nature—is no longer justified by the aim of securing additional human benefits beyond meeting basic needs; on this view, sufficientarianism itself can ground obligations to limit ecological damage once all individuals have enough, thereby addressing some of the concerns that a weak sufficientarian rights-based account leaves unexplained.

5. Historical Injustice and Intergenerational Claims

Questions of historical injustice often raise intergenerational issues: present individuals and communities may have claims of justice grounded in harms, structural disadvantages, or unjust relations originating in earlier periods. These issues concern state responsibility, inherited disadvantage, unjust enrichment, and the transmission of social, economic, and political inequalities across generations. As Waligore emphasizes, backward looking, forward looking, and structural approaches illuminate different temporal orientations through which such claims can be understood, and each provides distinct justificatory grounds for redress.

A central difficulty concerns how to understand harm when the individuals now affected would not have existed had the past been different. In this entry’s earlier discussion (§§3–4), two responses were developed: the threshold conception of harm and the disjunctive notion of harm. Both reject the idea that counterfactual identity must be preserved for harm to occur. The threshold conception allows present individuals to be wronged when they are brought into or maintained in conditions falling below a normatively specified standard, even when no same‑person comparison is available. The disjunctive notion combines the threshold and subjunctive‑historical conditions of harm, permitting the latter to apply whenever identity is independent of the harming action while relying on the threshold condition in cases where identity is dependent.

Waligore’s treatment of the Existence Problem in the context of reparations illustrates how these two notions of harm can be extended to historical injustice (see also Meyer 2003, part IV). He argues that inheritance‑based approaches avoid the non‑identity difficulty by locating entitlements in heirs rather than in particular individuals, a line of argument also discussed in Section 8 of the entry black reparations. For harm-based accounts, Waligore shows that the relevant standards of well‑being can themselves be historically specified: past injustice may determine what counts as falling below an adequate threshold for present individuals, even if those individuals would not have existed in a counterfactual world without the injustice. This aligns with the threshold conception developed earlier in §§3–4 and in Meyer (2003, 149–152), which treats the specification of the threshold as a normative matter allows ist content to be shaped by context, including historically structured conditions under which future or present persons come into existence.

Other accounts illuminate different ways in which past wrongdoing can generate present claims. Sher’s subsequent‑wrong account explains how failures to repair earlier harms can themselves wrong present individuals, even when those individuals would not have existed absent the original injustice. Section 7 of the entry black reparations develops a structurally similar argument: later wrongs committed after the conception of the individuals now affected can wrong and harm them independently of the counterfactual identity problem. The example of Tom, Beulah, and their daughter Eulah shows how governmental failures to protect civil rights and to compensate for earlier harms can shape the conditions under which a child is raised, thereby wronging her without requiring any comparison to a counterfactual in which she would not have existed. This structure parallels Sher’s account of subsequent wrongs and illustrates how historically structured conditions can generate present claims even when identity is dependent on earlier wrongdoing (Sher 2005; and see Butt 2006, Cohen 2009, and Herstein 2008). De‑Shalit’s conception of transgenerational communities adds a further dimension by showing how harms can be transmitted through communal life and historically shaped vulnerabilities (De-Shalit 1995; Thompson 2009; see also §4.6) above). Ochi (2025) interprets recent ICC reparations practice in a similar vein: independent future victims can be understood through identity‑independent harm and threshold‑based accounts; dependent future victims through Sher’s subsequent‑wrong framework; and community‑level future victims through De‑Shalit’s conception of transgenerational communities. In this way, international criminal law can be read as reflecting the same conceptual distinctions that structure philosophical debates on intergenerational justice.

Rather than reproducing the discussions in the entry on black reparations, the present entry notes that questions of historical injustice often involve intergenerational dimensions and that different conceptions of harm — threshold‑based, identity‑independent, community‑based, or structurally reproduced — yield different ways of understanding how past wrongdoing can ground present claims. These justifications are not mutually exclusive: past injustice can reshape the standards of justice themselves and can determine what we should publicly count as harm, entitlement, or adequate redress.

Taken together, these approaches show how the responses to the non‑identity problem developed in §§3–4 provide some of the conceptual resources needed to understand intergenerational claims arising from historical injustice. They explain how harm can be understood without requiring counterfactual identity, how standards of well‑being can be specified in historically sensitive ways, and how different forms of connection — inheritance, subsequent wrongs, community‑level transmission, and historically shaped thresholds — can jointly ground present claims.

6. Concluding Remarks

Arguments developed in the ongoing debates on the foundations of intergenerational justice can help justify several obligations of currently living people vis‑à‑vis future people and towards past people. Currently living people are obliged (i) not to violate the rights of future generations (§2), and (ii) to respond to historically structured disadvantages and harms that continue to affect present individuals and communities (§5).

By employing a threshold notion of harm which may be understood as a central element of a sufficientarian conception of intergenerational justice (§4.3), but could also be an element of other substantive understandings of intergenerational justice (§4.1 and §4.2), we can justify conclusions about both types of present generations’ duties. Basic needs or central capabilities are plausible currencies of a sufficientarian interpretation of intergenerational justice that relies on the threshold notion of harm (§4). The threshold notion of harm can be understood as a constitutive element of a complex understanding of harm (disjunctive notion) (§3, and, in particular, §3.2).

The special features of our relations to (remote) future people—especially the lack of particular knowledge, the impossibility of cooperation, and the permanent asymmetry of influence (§1)—do not stand in the way of attributing rights to them that ground corresponding duties owed by us (§2 and §3). The fact that many present individuals would not have existed had past injustices not occurred does not undermine the possibility of present claims grounded in historically structured harms, disadvantages, or unjust relations (§5). Threshold‑based and disjunctive conceptions of harm allow us to understand how past wrongdoing can generate present claims without requiring counterfactual identity. Inheritance‑based approaches, subsequent‑wrong accounts, and community‑level conceptions of harm illuminate different ways in which historically shaped conditions can ground present entitlements (§5).

Rights-based considerations of intergenerational justice bear not only upon “same people choices” but also upon both types of “different people choices” that Parfit distinguishes, including what he calls “different number choices” (§2 and §3). However, widely shared concerns for the continuation of human life and at a high level of well-being cannot be accounted for solely by rights-based considerations (§4.6). If intergenerational relations are not exclusively governed by duties with correlative rights, then obligations that do not correspond to rights—such as obligations not to destroy willfully the goods inherited from our predecessors or the conditions constitutive of future‑oriented projects (§4.6)—are compatible with the view that we do stand under some obligations of intergenerational justice to which the rights of future people correspond.

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Acknowledgment

For detailed comments and criticisms on a number of drafts of the first version I would like to thank Thomas Pogge. For discussion of early drafts of most sections I am grateful to Brian Barry and David Heyd. Rachel Brown edited my English of the first version of the entry and improved the presentation of the arguments in numerous ways. I would also like to thank Brian Bix, Tony Daniel and Barbara Reiter.

For detailed and extremely helpful comments on the 2008 version of the entry I would like to thank Thomas Pogge. I would also like to thank James Nickel as well as Michael Edward Ravvin and Dominic Roser.

Pranay Sanklecha made very helpful suggestions on the 2015 version of the entry. I would also like to thank Tim Waligore, Naemi Dubbels, and especially Kiley Kost. An anonymous reviewer is thanked for comments and suggestions that helped improve and clarify the article.

Discussions with Thomas Pölzler and Tim Waligore helped me in revising the 2015 version of the entry. I would also like to thank an anonymous reader and the editors for suggestions of revisions of the 2015 version of the entry.

I would also like to thank an anonymous reader and the editors for suggestions of revisions of the 2021 version of the entry.

Copyright © 2026 by
Lukas Meyer <lukas.meyer@uni-graz.at>

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