Experimental Philosophy

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Justin Sytsma, Kevin Reuter, and Pascale Willemsen replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Experimental philosophy (or “x-phi”) is a methodological naturalist approach to philosophy that is distinguished by practitioners employing empirical methods for philosophical purposes. Both the methods employed and the purposes they are put to are diverse. As such, the practice cannot be adequately equated with any single approach, philosophical target, or argumentative gambit. With this diversity in mind, this entry will detail the broad practice of experimental philosophy.

While experimental philosophy is highly diverse, there are nonetheless prominent themes. Most notably, this includes that experimentalists have often aimed to study “intuitions” concerning concepts of philosophical interest, usually by investigating the judgments of laypeople (or “the folk”). In line with this target, there is also a correspondingly prominent method in x-phi—the use of questionnaires soliciting judgments about short stories (or “vignettes”) based on philosophical thought experiments. After introducing and motivating the practice of experimental philosophy (§1), this entry will discuss the most common methods employed by experimental philosophers (§2) and illustrate how they have been applied to some particularly fruitful topics in contemporary philosophy (§3).

In addition to the direct contributions that experimentalists have made to a variety of first-order philosophical debates, experimental philosophy has also had a notable impact on metaphilosophical debates concerning the boundaries of philosophy and the methods that philosophers should employ. Most directly, the practice challenges the presumption of a clean methodological divide between the sciences and philosophy. More critically, some advocates of experimental philosophy have challenged aspects of non-empirical philosophical methodology, prominently including the use of intuitions as evidence for or against philosophical accounts. As such, this entry will conclude with a discussion of the primary ways in which experimental philosophy has featured in the metaphilosophical discussions, while contextualizing this portrayal with regard to the broader practice (§4).

• 1. Motivating and Characterizing Experimental Philosophy
  • 1.1 Empirical Claims in Philosophy
    • 1.1.1 Example: The Behavior of Ethicists
    • 1.1.2 Broad versus Narrow Conceptions
  • 1.2 Systematic Empirical Observation
• 2. Methods in Experimental Philosophy
  • 2.1 Basics of Experimental-Philosophical Research
    • 2.1.1 Dependent and Independent Variables
    • 2.1.2 True Experiments, Quasi-Experiments, and Descriptive Studies
  • 2.2 Questionnaires Involving Vignettes
    • 2.2.1 Descriptive Vignette Studies
    • 2.2.2 Quasi-Experimental Vignette Studies
    • 2.2.3 Experimental Vignette Studies
  • 2.3 Corpus Studies
    • 2.3.1 Basics of Corpus Analysis
    • 2.3.2 Frequency Analysis
    • 2.3.3 Co-occurrences and Distributional Semantics
  • 2.4 Other Methods
• 3. First-Order Research in Experimental Philosophy
  • 3.1 Experimental Philosophy of Action
  • 3.2 The Pervasive Impact of Norms
  • 3.3 Causation
  • 3.4 Happiness
• 4. Experimental Philosophy and Metaphilosophy
  • 4.1 Broad Objections to Experimental Philosophy
    • 4.1.1 Excluding Empirical Methods
    • 4.1.2 Excluding Empirical Content
    • 4.1.3 Amateur Psychology?
  • 4.2 Divisions within Experimental Philosophy
  • 4.3 The Restrictionist Challenge
  • 4.4 Responses to the Restrictionist Challenge
    • 4.4.1 Intuition Detraction
    • 4.4.2 Intuition Apologetics
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Motivating and Characterizing Experimental Philosophy

Philosophers necessarily call on various assumptions in their philosophical theorizing. Sometimes, these assumptions are explicitly flagged as such, but often they are simply taken for granted, perhaps being treated as basic starting points. Some of the assumptions philosophers call on are evidentially robust, including many informed by systematic investigation, such as in empirical philosophy, where philosophers appeal to findings from the scientific literature (Prinz 2008). Other times the evidential credentials of these assumptions are less clear, being based on received wisdom, folk theory, background knowledge, common sense, intuition, or the like.

Unfortunately, many seemingly plausible common sense assumptions turn out to be mistaken. Advocates of experimental philosophy believe that the same is likely to hold for some philosophical assumptions. As such, they contend that when we are able to check our assumptions against the world, it behooves us to do so. Put another way, proponents of x-phi push for greater empirical vigilance in philosophy.

One common way for philosophers to practice empirical vigilance is to be consumers of science, paying attention to the findings of others and calling on such evidence to revise philosophical assumptions. At the same time, research interests vary, and the scientific literature is hardly exhaustive, such that many philosophical concerns are not directly addressed by existing findings. Fortunately, there is a second, complimentary way to exercise empirical vigilance—philosophers can also be producers of science. This is what x-phi does: the practice of experimental philosophy centers on the use of systematic empirical observation to test empirical claims that arise in the course of philosophical theorizing.

This brief description of experimental philosophy requires a bit of elaboration. This section will focus on two aspects, discussing how empirical claims arise in philosophy (§1.1) and what is meant by systematic empirical observation (§1.2). The following two sections then offer further illustrations in detailing common methods (§2) and spotlighting one extended set of findings (§3).

1.1 Empirical Claims in Philosophy

A prominent part of experimental philosophy involves drawing out and testing assumptions made in philosophical theorizing. Sometimes, the assumptions philosophers call on are rather explicit. To offer an illustration, in philosophical discussions of free will it has often been asserted that “most ordinary people start out as natural incompatibilists” (Kane 1999: 218; see entry on free will for discussion of compatibilism and incompatibilism). This is clearly an empirical assumption, as it concerns how people actually conceptualize free will. One of the first pieces of work in contemporary experimental philosophy sought to test exactly this. Nahmias et al. (2006) presented empirical findings suggesting that people are not natural incompatibilists but are instead compatibilists (although this conclusion has been the subject of debate in the subsequent empirical literature; see Nadelhoffer 2023 for a recent survey). Nahmias et al.’s results suggest that laypeople tend to believe that even in a deterministic universe, an individual performing a specified behavior—such as stealing a necklace—acts of their own free will (see §2.2.1 for details).

Other times, the assumptions philosophers call on are rather more implicit, such that exegetical work is needed to draw them out (see, for instance, the discussion of Aristotle on ethical training below). In such cases, the assumptions might be more naturally thought of as implications—as consequences that follow from a particular philosophical assertion or account.

While experimental philosophers often aim to test such assumptions, whether explicit or implicit, this is seldom (if ever) done directly. This is because the assumptions at issue are typically rather general and are therefore open to being tested in many different ways. As such, the experimentalist will need to generate operationalized predictions (testable hypotheses using measurable variables) that lend themselves more directly to empirical testing. Importantly, this process will itself involve making assumptions that link the specific predictions tested to the broader philosophical point at issue (see Sytsma & Livengood 2016: Chapter 6, for discussion; for illustrations see Kornmesser et al. 2024). Of course, such assumptions are also legitimate targets for testing, opening the door for still further empirical work.

Indeed, experimental philosophers do not simply check assumptions found in non-experimental philosophy; they often test assumptions made in the prior experimental literature (including their own work). Notably, this frequently involves “turning the dials”, with experimentalists exploring the conditions under which prior findings hold. Often this involves varying the materials used, the methods employed, or the populations tested. This is well illustrated by the subsequent empirical literature on judgments about free will following Nahmias et al.’s groundbreaking work. For instance, Nichols and Knobe (2007) complicate the picture Nahmias and colleagues presented by reporting new results that suggest people’s judgments about moral responsibility—which are typically taken to track with free will judgments (although see Figdor & Phelan 2015)—are susceptible to a framing effect: Nichols and Knobe found that while participants tend to offer compatibilist judgments when presented with scenarios involving concrete descriptions of a person’s behavior, they instead tend to offer incompatibilist judgments when presented with a more abstract and theoretical description (see §2.2.3 for details).

Such critical responses to prior work are one way in which experimental philosophy is generative, with empirical work often leading to new hypotheses to test. But, of course, work in x-phi is not solely critical, and experimentalists also put forward positive accounts of their own. Indeed, their empirical work often spurs such theorizing—a process that is familiar from the sciences more generally (see entry on scientific discovery)—which in turn can motivate further empirical investigation. In this way, practitioners of experimental philosophy standardly move back and forth between the armchair and the lab stool.

1.1.1 Example: The Behavior of Ethicists

While a number of examples of the process of deriving and testing empirical claims will be seen below, an initial illustration is likely to be instructive. In a study from the early days of experimental philosophy, Eric Schwitzgebel (2009) explored the behavior of ethicists. He motivated this work by noting that many important philosophers have asserted that ethical inquiry has salutary effects. For instance, Aristotle writes that “we are not conducting this inquiry in order to know what virtue is, but in order to become good” (Nicomachean Ethics II.2, 1103b [1962]). Most directly, this statement makes a claim about the motives of those studying ethics at the time (although one might also read this as a normative claim about why one should study ethics). Beyond this, however, there is also a more implicit assumption: Aristotle’s statement would only motivate the study of ethics if doing so is an effective means of becoming more ethical. But is this true?

Here, we see an empirical assumption seemingly being made in philosophical theorizing. But it is not obvious how to test this claim about our world: doing so requires coming up with ways of measuring how ethical people are for purposes of conducting the relevant comparisons. What is needed is to turn this general assumption into predictions that can be checked. Schwitzgebel’s ingenious approach was to measure the rates at which academic texts went missing from university libraries. On the assumptions that (a) ethical status is revealed through ethical behavior and (b) that stealing books from libraries is unethical, Schwitzgebel derived the prediction (from the Aristotelian assumption) that volumes that are primarily of interest to ethicists would be less likely to be missing than comparable volumes in other areas of philosophy. Schwitzgebel then tested this prediction. In his first study, he looked at the status of two carefully curated sets of relatively obscure volumes from 32 academic libraries. Against the prediction, Schwitzgebel found that the ethics books were actually more likely to be missing than the non-ethics books, providing initial evidence against the assumption that the study of ethics tends to make people more ethical.

Of course, as with any piece of research, doubts might be raised about Schwitzgebel’s study. For instance, one might question the relation between ethical status and ethical behavior. Alternatively, one might wonder whether volumes going missing from academic libraries is an adequate measure of ethical behavior. This worry invites further empirical work. Schwitzgebel and collaborators have responded with an array of studies employing different measures, from disposing of one’s trash after academic talks (Schwitzgebel, Rust, et al. 2012) to responding to student emails in a timely fashion (Rust & Schwitzgebel 2013), among many others (see Schwitzgebel & Rust 2016 for a survey and Schönegger & Wagner 2019 for a replication). These studies show largely similar results, although not invariably. For instance, recent work from Schwitzgebel, Cokelet, and Singer (2020, 2023) presents evidence that studying the ethics of eating meat decreases students’ meat consumption.

1.1.2 Broad versus Narrow Conceptions

Schwitzgebel’s work on the behavior of ethicists also serves to draw out an important metaphilosophical point. Discussions of experimental philosophy have often treated it as if it were solely focused on a particular type of empirical claim, tying x-phi to the traditional practice of conceptual analysis (see §5 in concepts) and a primary approach to it, the method of cases (Nagel 2012; Baz 2017; Horvath & Koch 2021).

The method of cases involves testing accounts of concepts of philosophical interest against our judgments (or “intuitions” ) about carefully crafted scenarios, often referred to as thought experiments or simply “cases”. By constructing cases and evaluating their implications, philosophers in this tradition aim to isolate key concepts, uncover hidden assumptions, and refine definitions. For example, Gettier cases in epistemology challenge the purportedly traditional account of knowledge (Turri 2016), while trolley cases in moral philosophy have been used to examine utilitarian and deontological frameworks. At the same time, philosophers disagree about the utility of the method of cases and the types of phenomena this method can illuminate. Thus, while some would limit conclusions to linguistic or conceptual claims (e.g., targeting the ordinary use of the term “knowledge” or the dominant concept of knowledge), others aim to draw conclusions about what those terms refer to (e.g., targeting what knowledge itself is).

Some have treated experimental philosophy as being intimately linked to these traditional methods, seeing x-phi as the practice of empirically investigating philosophical intuitions or case judgments. Such narrow definitions have the benefit of associating experimental philosophy with an arguably distinctive methodological approach and domain of inquiry. Not surprisingly, narrow characterizations were initially quite common in the metaphilosophical writings of both advocates and critics (e.g., Nadelhoffer & Nahmias 2007; Alexander 2012; Nanay 2015). For instance, in their influential early piece, Alexander and Weinberg (2007: 56) write that the “movement is unified behind both a common methodology and a common aim: the application of methods of experimental psychology to the study of the nature of intuitions”. And, to be sure, case judgments have been a common target of investigation among experimental philosophers, as discussed in §2.2.

Nonetheless, the tendency to describe experimental philosophy in narrow terms has dropped off in recent years as advocates have increasingly endorsed a broad conception of the practice (e.g., Rose & Danks 2013; Sytsma & Machery 2013; Stich & Tobia 2016; Fischer & Curtis 2019; Kornmesser et al. 2024). On a broad characterization, experimental philosophy is neither restricted to the study of intuitions nor does it have an intrinsic connection to conceptual analysis or the method of cases. Rather, in line with the methodological naturalist motivation noted above, x-phi investigates empirical claims that arise in philosophy whether or not doing so involves probing intuitions. Schwitzgebel’s work on the behavior of ethicists nicely illustrates this point. This work has generally been considered part of the x-phi corpus (for evidence see Sytsma & Livengood 2016: 18). At the same time, however, in this empirical work Schwitzgebel does not target intuitions nor does he employ an empirical analog of conceptual analysis or the method of cases.

Further, Schwitzgebel (2009) is far from unique in this regard, as many examples of non-intuitional empirical work can be found in the literature, including in the early years of the practice. An incomplete list from roughly the first decade of x-phi includes Nichols’s (2002) work on the genealogy of norms, Byron’s (2007) work using bibliometric data to show that early twentieth century philosophy of science did not neglect biology, Livengood, Sytsma, et al.’s (2010) work on philosophical training and cognitive reflectivity, Angner et al.’s (2011) research into John Henryism and happiness, Bartels and Urminsky’s (2011) work connecting beliefs about the stability of personal identity to consumer habits, Machery and Cohen’s (2012) citation analysis testing a disparaging characterization of the evolutionary behavioral sciences, and Paxton et al.’s (2012) investigation of the underrepresentation of women in philosophy. Further, as discussed in §2.3, there has been a bit of a “linguistic shift” in x-phi in recent years, with practitioners increasingly drawing on empirical methods from linguistics, and especially corpus linguistics.

1.2 Systematic Empirical Observation

Experimental philosophy involves “systematic empirical observation”. But what does this mean? Empirical observation involves using the senses, often aided by instruments, to check how the world is. While this can take many forms, practitioners of experimental philosophy have generally been concerned with claims about populations that cannot be exhaustively observed in practice. As such, experimentalists typically employ sampling methods and statistical inference, observing just a portion of the population of interest (a sample) and then using those observations to infer something about the whole. This process can be illustrated by returning to the study on the behavior of ethicists discussed above. Schwitzgebel didn’t check the status of volumes across every library in existence, of course. Instead, he looked at just a sample of libraries and, hence, just a sample of book-borrowing behaviors. Despite this, he drew a more general conclusion about the rates at which books went missing from academic libraries. To do this, Schwitzgebel inferred that the wider population was probably and approximately like the sample, employing statistical methods to put bounds on the inference.

While sampling methods and statistical inference are characteristic of x-phi, this should not be taken to preclude the use of alternative methods. For instance, ethnography—a qualitative research method involving in-depth observation and interaction to understand cultural practices and beliefs—can be fruitfully employed in philosophy; indeed, the anthropological work of philosophers like Brandt (1954) has been noted as a touchstone for the development of contemporary experimental philosophy (e.g., Stich 2015). A similar story can be told concerning case study methods. That said, it is important to distinguish between (a) instances where the observations are being used to show possibility, and (b) instances where the observations are being used to draw a generalization. The latter use of case studies in philosophy raises concerns about representativeness. For instance, Machery (2016) voices this concern with regard to philosophy of science, suggesting that we turn instead to the more systematic empirical investigations associated with experimental philosophy, as exemplified in this area by Stotz, Griffiths, and Knight’s (2004) work on the concept of the gene or Faust and Meehl’s (2002) use of cliometrics to investigate scientific virtues.

When does empirical observation count as being systematic, such that it can serve to distinguish work in experimental philosophy from other philosophical investigations involving appeal to the senses? This is an instance of the notoriously difficult problem of demarcating between science and non-science. While a solution to this problem will not be proposed in this entry, for present purposes “systematic” can be taken to reflect that practitioners of experimental philosophy aim (not always successfully) to follow best practices for the sciences they draw on, such as attempting to control for biases and to avoid overgeneralizing from small or otherwise unrepresentative samples.

This means that the practice of experimental philosophy should shift over time as best practices develop. Indeed, such evolution has been apparent across the history of x-phi. For instance, typical sample sizes have increased and statistical reporting has improved as experimental philosophy has developed, with some early studies falling short of contemporary standards in these regards. Related to this, in recent years there has been an increasing trend toward open science. Open science came about in part in response to the replication crisis in psychology (Open Science Collaboration 2015) and involves preregistering study designs, hypotheses, and predictions, as well as making raw data and code for statistical analyses available online.

To help illustrate the idea of systematic empirical observation, consider Frank Jackson’s (1998) discussion of the analysis of folk concepts, which he considers a central part of contemporary philosophy. Advocating for the method of cases, Jackson holds that folk concepts can be revealed by probing ordinary intuitions about philosophical cases. And he believes that what our intuitions are is an empirical question. At the same time, Jackson suggests that it will generally suffice for philosophers to use relatively informal methods to investigate ordinary intuitions, including simply consulting their own intuitions or perhaps “doing their own bit of fieldwork” by presenting cases to students (1998: 37). While such approaches are empirical (although the fittingness of the label is less clear when just consulting one’s own intuitions), they should be distinguished from the more systematic inquiry characteristic of experimental philosophy.

Systematic inquiry into folk concepts might partially overlap with the fieldwork Jackson suggests, perhaps employing questionnaire methods involving philosophical cases (as discussed in §2.2) and potentially using samples drawn from university courses, although they might employ other methods. Even when administering questionnaires in the classroom, however, the experimentalist would standardly take steps to control for well-known biases to which informal polling of one’s students is likely susceptible. This might include taking steps to help ensure that students are answering independently from one another, such as by using individual questionnaires rather than a show of hands; to help curtail the tendency for the researcher’s expectations to bias their perception of the results, such as by using careful tallies of responses and applying statistical inference; and, to help avoid the likelihood that the researcher being in a position of authority might influence responses, such as by drawing samples from other courses or having a neutral party administer the questionnaires.

The key point is that in comparison to the types of informal observation Jackson suggests, the methods that practitioners of experimental philosophy adopt are designed to minimize the risk of drawing conclusions based on idiosyncratic or biased responses. Coupled with this, experimentalists aim to carefully detail the procedures they employ so as to facilitate replicability, help isolate key factors contributing to observed effects, and promote ongoing research.

2. Methods in Experimental Philosophy

The most distinctive feature of experimental philosophy is its use of a diverse range of methods more commonly associated with the sciences than with philosophy. The present section first introduces some basics of experimental-philosophical research (§2.1), providing a background for discussing key methods in x-phi. This will focus on the two approaches most common in the sub-discipline—questionnaire methods (§2.2) and corpus-linguistic methods (§2.3)—before concluding with a brief survey of the broader range found in the literature (§2.4).

2.1 Basics of Experimental-Philosophical Research

While systematic empirical inquiry is the distinguishing feature of experimental-philosophical research, x-phi is fundamentally a way of doing philosophy. As such, it (ideally) begins with formulating arguments that engage with the surrounding philosophical literature. Empirical premises in those arguments—premises involving claims about how our world is—then form the entry point to standard descriptions of the quantitative empirical research process, such as one would find in discussions of methods in experimental psychology.

The standard process begins with problem identification and hypothesis formulation, with experimentalists defining research questions and (where appropriate) proposing testable hypotheses. The process then proceeds to planning the study, including identifying key variables (§2.1.1) and the type of study to be conducted (§2.1.2), considering how to control for potential confounds, designing materials, and determining important features of implementation, such as desired sample sizes and randomization procedures (where relevant). The study is then carried out and data is collected. Finally, the data is analyzed, interpreted, and reported (hopefully in ways that allow for replication and facilitate further empirical work). Typically, in experimental-philosophical research, analysis involves statistical inference, with the researchers carrying out statistical analyses to test the identified hypotheses.

Just as experimental-philosophical research begins prior to the empirical research process, it also extends beyond it. Typically, the interpretation step will involve connecting the empirical results back to the philosophical arguments generating the research questions. And this will require that researchers consider the limitations of their studies in the context of the broader arguments they make.

Given the label, one might expect that experimental-philosophical research is invariably experimental. Although this is often true, it is far from universal—at least if we use the term in the technical sense employed in the social sciences (Vazire 2015: 45, fn1). Thus, while experimental philosophers sometimes conduct true experiments, they also sometimes carry out quasi-experiments and descriptive studies. To distinguish these types of studies, it is important to introduce the concept of a variable and a key distinction between two central types—dependent variables and independent variables.

2.1.1 Dependent and Independent Variables

There are two types of variables that play a central role in designing empirical studies—dependent variables (DVs) and independent variables (IVs)—although not all empirical studies have both types. When both are present, the aim is typically to observe how the values of the DVs change as the values of the IVs change. Thus, the IVs represent those factors that the researchers want to observe the effects of, while the DVs are the outcomes that are measured to assess those effects. For example, in a standard placebo-controlled drug trial, the IV would be the type of treatment and its values would be determined by whether the participant receives the treatment or a placebo. In such a study, the DVs would then typically be measures of health outcomes, such as changes in blood pressure.

2.1.2 True Experiments, Quasi-Experiments, and Descriptive Studies

True experiments, quasi-experiments, and descriptive studies all have at least one DV: there is always something that the researcher is seeking to observe. It is instead the presence and type of IVs involved that distinguishes between these classifications.

First, if a study has no IVs—if there is nothing being varied in the study that the researcher wants to observe the impact of—then it is a descriptive study. Second, we can demarcate IVs based on how their values are assigned, distinguishing between those whose values are assigned by the researcher and those whose values are determined by nature. The former are said to be artificially controlled and are distinctive of true experiments. For instance, in a placebo-controlled drug trial, the researcher assigns participants to either the treatment or the control condition. In contrast, the latter are said to be naturally controlled and are distinctive of quasi-experiments. Naturally controlled IVs typically arise due to practical constraints. For instance, researchers might be interested in how cultural differences affect judgments about a particular case, but they are obviously unable to assign individuals to those cultural groups. Of course, studies can have multiple IVs, and these might include both artificially controlled and naturally controlled variables.

Beyond the manipulation of one or more IVs, in true experiments researchers standardly employ random assignment to place participants into groups (assuming that the sample is comprised of people), which helps control for the impact of unmeasured extraneous factors. Such control makes true experiments the “gold standard” for establishing causal relationships. While quasi-experiments also involve one or more IVs, since these variables are not under the researchers’ control, their values are not assigned. Such a lack of control can introduce confounding factors and make it more challenging to establish causal relationships. Each type of study has its uses, and which one should be employed in a given situation will depend on the research question and practical constraints.

2.2 Questionnaires Involving Vignettes

While experimental philosophers have employed a wide range of methods, a few prominent approaches stand out. Experimental-philosophical research has most commonly employed questionnaires. And within questionnaire-based research, vignette-based studies have been particularly prevalent.

In vignette studies participants are given a short story presenting a scenario followed by one or more questions soliciting judgments about it. The prevalence of vignette studies in experimental philosophy, especially in its early years, helps explain the tendency to offer narrow characterizations of x-phi. Equally, the metaphilosophical motivations for experimental philosophy on a narrow conception provide good reason for the frequent use of vignette studies. Thus, the method of cases is often treated as a central component of analytic philosophy. Vignette studies can be seen as the experimentalists’ analog of this method, allowing researchers to investigate case judgments in a systematic way—whether with the aim of extending the armchair method or undermining it (see §4.2).

As illustrated in §1.2, a prominent view of the method of cases contends that ordinary concepts are of central importance in philosophy and holds that such concepts can be elucidated through our judgments about carefully constructed scenarios. While advocates of this view typically maintain that it is generally sufficient to consult one’s own judgments, advocates of experimental philosophy push for more systematic empirical observation, aiming to use samples that are more representative of the relevant population and to employ a variety of procedures to help minimize the risk of bias. As such, experimentalists look to follow current scientific standards, approaching the method of cases in a way that aligns with the use of vignettes in psychology and sociology.

Below, several examples of vignette studies are offered to highlight key aspects of the practice. This includes that experimentalists generally aim to do more than just check philosophical judgments about prominent cases with broader participant pools; they also attempt to refine the scenarios, expand upon them, and investigate underlying factors contributing to judgments about them, moving beyond simply cataloging their occurrence and toward an understanding of how and why certain intuitions arise. In parallel with highlighting the varied use of vignette studies in x-phi, these examples will be used to illustrate the three types of empirical studies noted in §2.1.2.

2.2.1 Descriptive Vignette Studies

Descriptive studies differ from quasi-experiments and true experiments most notably in that they have no independent variables. Focusing on vignette studies in experimental philosophy, a principal use of such studies is to catalog judgments about philosophical cases, often for purposes of testing assumptions concerning folk concepts (although see, e.g., Bourget & Chalmers 2014, 2023 for two well-known descriptive studies surveying the views of philosophers). For a tutorial on the development of a descriptive vignette study in philosophy, see Sytsma (2024a).

As a preliminary illustration, recall the work of Nahmias et al. (2006) discussed in §1.1. They conducted a sequence of vignette studies testing the common assumption that lay people tend to be natural incompatibilists. Their second study was a descriptive study, as marked by there being just one condition: the 86 participants surveyed weren’t split into multiple groups for comparison and each of these participants read the same vignette and was asked the same questions. For this study, Nahmias and colleagues used the following vignette describing a deterministic universe:

Imagine there is a universe that is re-created over and over again, starting from the exact same initial conditions and with all the same laws of nature. In this universe the same conditions and the same laws of nature produce the exact same outcomes, so that every single time the universe is re-created, everything must happen the exact same way. For instance, in this universe a person named Jill decides to steal a necklace at a particular time, and every time the universe is re-created, Jill decides to steal the necklace at that time. (2006: 38)

Participants were then asked a series of questions about this scenario, including whether Jill decided to steal the necklace of her own free will. Nahmias et al. report that 66% gave an affirmative response (although this number was notably lower in the replications by Cova, Strickland, et al. 2021).

A second example comes from the work of Reuter and Sytsma (2020) on pain judgments. One component of the standard view of pain in philosophy is that they cannot exist unfelt. Some philosophers have asserted that this reflects the ordinary concept of pain, appealing to thought experiments for support. For instance, Hill (2009: 171) writes that

if we were fully committed to the picture [that pains can exist unfelt], we would be prepared to consider it epistemically possible that an injured soldier actually has a severe pain, despite his professions to the contrary;

he then continues,

when I have asked informants to assess the likelihood of this scenario, however, they have all been inclined to dismiss it as absurd.

Reuter and Sytsma test judgments about the possibility of unfelt pains across a large number of descriptive vignette studies, including four based on Hill’s thought experiment. For instance, in one of these studies, 57 participants were given the following short vignette:

Soldiers often sustain serious injuries but show no sign of feeling any pain, continuing to display normal behavior. They also deny that they feel any pain. Only after the end of the battle, do soldiers proclaim they feel severe pain and show clear pain behavior. (2020: 1793)

Reuter and Sytsma then asked participants which of two descriptions sounded most appropriate:

(A)

During the battle, the injured soldier has a pain but doesn’t feel it.

(B)

During the battle, the injured soldier has no pain.

They report that contrary to the common assumption, a significant majority of participants (70.2%) gave the (A) response, suggesting that they take this to be a case of unfelt pain. (For critical discussion and related studies, see Borg et al. 2020; Salomons et al. 2022.)

This study highlights several interrelated points. To start with, it is good methodological advice to avoid adding unnecessary complications to studies, including the inclusion of independent variables that do not directly pertain to the hypotheses being tested. Thus, while the empirical studies reported by Reuter and Sytsma are straightforward in design, their results nonetheless serve to raise doubts about the target assumption. This illustrates that even relatively simple empirical designs are often suited to testing assumptions that arise in philosophical theorizing. Further, it is (arguably) illustrative of a broader point relevant to a common target for vignette studies in x-phi: philosophers’ intuitive judgments may not be, and sometimes aren’t, representative of the broader population. While Hill is commendable for seeking input from other informants about the case he presents, the value of doing so is undercut by the lack of systematic empirical observation and reporting, or so contend advocates of experimental philosophy.

While there is often reason to employ descriptive vignette studies in philosophy, we should be careful about overgeneralizing. As noted above, the suitability of this type of study depends on the research question being investigated. This includes that descriptive vignette studies are ill-suited for testing more complex hypotheses, such as whether case judgments are being influenced by linguistic factors, show cultural variation, or are shaped by cognitive biases. And they shed little light on the underlying processes generating people’s philosophical intuitions. Investigating such questions empirically requires other types of studies.

2.2.2 Quasi-Experimental Vignette Studies

Unlike descriptive studies, quasi-experiments investigate the effect(s) of variation of at least one independent variable on one or more dependent variables. As such, quasi-experiments generally facilitate the investigation of more complex hypotheses than descriptive studies. Unlike with true experiments, however, in quasi-experiments the participants (or other entities under study) are not assigned to conditions but are instead compared based on pre-existing characteristics. Thus, while quasi-experimental vignette studies are limited with regard to the causal inferences they warrant, they are well-suited to investigating questions such as how case judgments vary along demographic lines.

As an initial illustration, consider Feltz and Cokely’s (2009) early work on another set of questions concerning judgments about free will. They solicited free will judgments about a vignette describing a deterministic scenario from 58 participants. In addition, they administered a standard personality measure and used the responses to divide participants into groups based on the trait of extroversion (being socially minded, outgoing, enthusiastic). Comparing responses between these groups, Feltz and Cokely found that the more extraverted participants were significantly more likely to give compatibilist responses.

Quasi-experimental vignette studies have most commonly been used by experimental philosophers to investigate cultural variation in intuitions (see §2.5 in experimental moral philosophy for further examples). For instance, Machery, Mallon, et al.’s (2004) seminal cross-cultural work on the reference of proper names examined whether people from different cultural backgrounds make judgments that align more closely with either causal-historical or descriptivist theories of reference . To do this, they gave participants in two different locations (Rutgers, University of Hong Kong) variations on a pair of classic thought experiments from Kripke (1980) concerning the reference of proper names, including the “Gödel case”:

Suppose that John has learned in college that Gödel is the man who proved an important mathematical theorem, called the incompleteness of arithmetic. John is quite good at mathematics and he can give an accurate statement of the incompleteness theorem, which he attributes to Gödel as the discoverer. But this is the only thing that he has heard about Gödel. Now suppose that Gödel was not the author of this theorem. A man called “Schmidt” whose body was found in Vienna under mysterious circumstances many years ago, actually did the work in question. His friend Gödel somehow got hold of the manuscript and claimed credit for the work, which was thereafter attributed to Gödel. Thus he has been known as the man who proved the incompleteness of arithmetic. Most people who have heard the name “Gödel” are like John; the claim that Gödel discovered the incompleteness theorem is the only thing they have ever heard about Gödel. (2004: 17)

After reading this vignette, participants were asked:

When John uses the name “Gödel”, is he talking about:

(A)

the person who really discovered the incompleteness of arithmetic?

or

(B)

the person who got hold of the manuscript and claimed credit for the work?

The (A) response was intended to correspond with a descriptivist view and the (B) response with a causal-historical view.

Machery and colleagues also gave participants a standard demographic instrument to confirm ethnicity. This was used to assess the values of the independent variable, dividing participants into two groups based on culture (31 Westerners, 41 East Asians). As predicted, Machery et al. found that Westerners were more likely to give the causal-historical response (56.5%) compared to East Asian participants (31.5%).

This research spurred a large literature (see Machery 2023 for a survey). This includes a growing body of empirical results that has extended to related issues in experimental semantics, such as questions about the extension of natural kind terms (e.g., Haukioja et al. 2021). These results include several replications of Machery, Mallon, et al.’s (2004) study, and although direct replications have shown mixed results (e.g., Cova, Strickland, et al. 2021), the effect found for the Gödel probe successfully replicates using a clarified version of the question (Sytsma, Livengood, et al. 2015).

Again, we find that experimental-philosophical studies can impact traditional debates. They can also generate novel directions for research and raise new questions. For instance, while the research just discussed illustrates that quasi-experimental vignette studies can help detail how philosophical judgments vary across populations, there is much left to be done—both with regard to testing additional cultural groups and exploring other demographic factors. Further, work in this area raises questions about the factors generating differences in judgments. Such causal questions recommend the third type of study to be discussed, true experiments.

2.2.3 Experimental Vignette Studies

Like quasi-experiments, true experiments have at least one independent variable. Unlike in quasi-experiments, the researcher controls the IVs, assigning entities to conditions. This control facilitates the use of experiments to draw causal inferences about the relationship between the variables. For a tutorial on the development of an experimental vignette study in philosophy, see Cova and Allard (2024).

To illustrate, consider the studies by Nichols and Knobe (2007) noted in §1.1. In this work they use experimental designs to provide evidence that how a deterministic scenario is framed affects whether people express compatibilist or incompatibilist judgments, complicating both the common philosophical assumption of natural incompatibilism and the findings of Nahmias et al. (2006).

In their first study, Nichols and Knobe randomly assigned 41 participants to one of two groups (or conditions), corresponding with the two values of their IV—concrete or abstract. In each condition participants read a vignette describing a determinist universe (Universe A) and an indeterminist universe (Universe B). Participants in the concrete condition read the following description of a person performing a specific behavior in the determinist universe:

In Universe A, a man named Bill has become attracted to his secretary, and he decides that the only way to be with her is to kill his wife and 3 children. He knows that it is impossible to escape from his house in the event of a fire. Before he leaves on a business trip, he sets up a device in his basement that burns down the house and kills his family. (2007: 670)

Participants in this condition were then asked: Is Bill fully morally responsible for killing his wife and children?

Participants in the abstract condition, by contrast, did not receive a description of a behavior, but were instead simply asked a more general question: In Universe A, is it possible for a person to be fully morally responsible for their actions? Nichols and Knobe found that a large majority of participants in this condition gave the incompatibilist response (86% answering “No”). By contrast, in the concrete condition a large majority instead gave the compatibilist response (just 28% answering “No”).

The basic idea here is that by randomly assigning participants to the two groups, Nichols and Knobe took steps to prevent there from being systematic differences between the conditions that might impact the DV (compatibilist/incompatibilist judgments). And these steps then provide warrant, with strength relative to sample sizes, for the inference that the difference observed in the DV must be due to the difference that was introduced in the IV. Thus, Nichols and Knobe infer that whether participants received the concrete or abstract framing caused the striking difference in judgments that they observed.

It is this ability to illuminate factors underlying case judgments that makes experimental vignette studies a central method in x-phi (against the occasional stereotype of experimental philosophy as simply conducting opinion polls). At the same time, the sub-discipline is not restricted to vignette studies: increasingly practitioners have been employing other methods, such as those drawn from corpus linguistics.

2.3 Corpus Studies

It will come as no surprise that conceptual analysis via the method of cases is standardly articulated as a means of elucidating and clarifying concepts. And discussions of the empirical analog of this practice—vignette studies—generally echo this focus. For instance, Nahmias et al. (2006: 30) frame the work discussed in §2.2.1 in this way: “it is important that a philosophical theory of free will accounts for and accords with ordinary people’s understanding of the concept and their judgments about relevant cases”. At the same time, vignette studies typically directly solicit linguistic judgments, with participants being asked about the application of a term or phrase in a specific context. Thus, Nahmias and colleagues asked participants whether the protagonist in a deterministic scenario acted “of her own free will”. And moving from such linguistic judgments to a conceptual conclusion would seem to involve a further inference (see entry on concepts for discussion of the relationship between these).

Beyond the linguistic component of the method of cases, philosophers also often make direct claims about (typically English) language use. For instance, see the numerous examples that Hansen, Porter, and Francis (2021) provide of philosophical assertions about what we ordinarily, typically, or most commonly mean by various terms and phrases in English. Given such appeals to linguistic assumptions in philosophy, it is perhaps unsurprising that practitioners of experimental philosophy have increasingly turned to explicitly linguistic investigations. This includes conducting investigations across languages (cross-linguistic experimental philosophy: see, e.g., Mizumoto, Stich, & McCready 2018; Mizumoto, Ganeri, & Goddard 2020; Mizumoto 2022; Wyatt & Ulatowski 2024). For instance, several groups have recently conducted cross-linguistic studies on free will, with results showing notable variation (Hannikainen et al. 2019; Berniūnas et al. 2021).

Further, experimentalists have adopted a variety of empirical approaches from linguistics that are designed to investigate language use. This section introduces a subset of these methods, focusing on those most commonly employed—the methods of corpus analysis. (For further discussion see Bluhm 2016, Caton 2020, Chartrand 2022; for tutorials see Reuter & Baumgartner 2024, Alfano 2024.)

2.3.1 Basics of Corpus Analysis

The general idea behind corpus analysis is to systematically investigate a collection of texts (a corpus) to help answer a research question related to the use of language. Technically, any collection of texts can be used as a corpus, depending on one’s research interests. This includes that corpora can be in any language (e.g., Nie 2023 uses the Mandarin language BCC Corpus to examine claims about pain language), even if philosophers to date have most often used English-language corpora. And they can be constructed by the researcher for a particular purpose, or one can use pre-built corpora. Indeed, the internet as a whole can be treated as a corpus (e.g., Knobe & Prinz 2008; Reuter 2011). More often, though, the internet is used as a source for building corpora or as a means of delivering them.

Focusing on building corpora, one might compile texts from websites centered on extremist political movements (e.g., Alfano, Byrne, & Roose 2023), large social media sites (e.g., Baumgartner & Kneer 2025), philosophical resources such as the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (e.g., Sytsma, Bluhm, et al. 2019), journals (e.g., Malaterre, Chartier, & Pulizzotto 2019; Mizrahi 2021), and so on. There also exist many corpora available for use on the web, such as the Corpus of Contemporary American English (COCA), News on the Web (NOW), and the British National Corpus (BNC). In addition, there are pre-built specialty corpora. This includes the Child Language Data Exchange System (CHILDES), which provides examples of speech by or in the presence of children and has been used by experimental philosophers to test developmental claims (e.g., Wright & Bartsch 2008; Bartsch, Wright, & Estes 2010; Nichols & Pinillos 2018).

As this brief survey suggests, philosophers have employed a variety of corpora for a range of philosophical purposes. There are two broad categories of methods that especially stand out in experimental-philosophical work, however: those focused on looking at frequencies (§2.3.2) and those based around co-occurrences (§2.3.3).

2.3.2 Frequency Analysis

Frequency analysis is a method for quantifying how often words or other linguistic entities—such as phrases or even emojis and hashtags (e.g., Alfano, Reimann, et al. 2023)—occur within a corpus. Although the frequencies at which common terms like “intuition” or lemmas like [know] occur in a corpus might not appear remarkable on their own, such numbers can provide interesting clues to underlying linguistic patterns relevant to philosophical debates.

Consider the frequency analyses of intuition talk (e.g., “intuit”, “intuition”, “intuitive”) presented by Andow (2015). He begins by noting that it is a bit of received wisdom that such talk has dramatically increased in philosophy in recent decades. Further, the main explanations on offer for this presumed phenomenon treat it as being specific to philosophy. Andow tests these assumptions by looking at the frequency of intuition talk across all English-language research articles in the JSTOR database, finding initial evidence that while the received wisdom is accurate (the frequency of philosophy articles using intuition talk rose from 21.7% in 1900–1909 to 53.6% in 2000–2009), the presumed explanatory context is not (the frequencies across all disciplines rose from 2.6% to 18.3% for the same periods).

Hansen, Porter, and Francis (2021) provide a similar motivation for analysis of the lemma [know], where this includes all forms of the common base for the verb “know” (i.e., “know”, “knew”, “known”, “knows”, “knowing”, “knowed”). As noted above, philosophers have often made frequency claims about the ordinary use of [know]. These generally focus on a few specific types of constructions—propositional knowledge (e.g., “I know that it’s sunny”), knowledge-wh (e.g., “I know who killed Kennedy”), and objectual knowledge (e.g., “I know her”). To test these frequency claims, as well as to reveal new facts about how [know] is used, Hansen and colleagues hand-coded a random sample of 500 occurrences drawn from COCA. They found that while propositional knowledge (22.6%), knowledge-wh (20.2%), and objectual knowledge (7.4%) were well-represented, the most common usage was as a discourse marker (ummm, you know, like this; 32.8%). And, interestingly, another generally unremarked upon usage—knowledge-pp (e.g., “at a site now known as Blackbeard’s point”)—occurred more often than objectual knowledge (10.4%).

Nichols and Pinillos (2018) also conduct a frequency analysis to cast light on a topic in epistemology. Specifically, they ask why does skepticism seem so naturally compelling? They suggest a novel answer based on learning theory, arguing that given the linguistic evidence learners receive, it is rational for them to develop an infallibilist understanding of knowledge. This argument hinges on an empirical claim about the evidence received. To test this, Nichols and Pinillos used CHILDES to investigate uses of “know” and “knows” by or otherwise in the presence of children. Across 802 positive knowledge attributions, they found no instances of fallibilist uses (such as “I know but I could be wrong”), although they found many for the comparison term “think”.

These studies illustrate how frequency analyses can be of value in philosophy, as well as the versatility of this tool. This approach can serve an exploratory role by uncovering patterns and trends that might otherwise remain hidden. And it can be used in a justificatory role by testing assumptions from the literature or that arise in new accounts being proposed. Further, frequency analysis can be expanded in various ways, such as by constructing dictionaries to count a range of related terms together, as with the Linguistic Inquiry and Word Count (LIWC) approach (e.g., Alfano, Cheong, and Curry 2024).

2.3.3 Co-occurrences and Distributional Semantics

A second basic approach to using corpora in experimental-philosophical research examines how linguistic entities occur together across a corpus. Such co-occurrence analyses enable researchers to investigate more complex relationships than simple frequency counts. For instance, the researcher can specify the relative position of terms they are interested in, such as looking for terms that occur within three words after a target term, or in the position just before that term, and so on. As a toy example, one might expect that talk of “fake news” has greatly increased in recent years. This could be tested by looking at the frequency that “fake” occurs in the position just before “news” across each of the three decades covered by COCA. And, indeed, it turns out that “fake news” is over 180 times more common between 2010–2019 than between 1990–1999. Further, the increase remains dramatic when taken relative to occurrences of “news” (“fake news” making up just 0.0057% of occurrences in the first decade compared to 0.89% in the last).

To illustrate how this method can help illuminate philosophical issues, consider Alfano’s (2018) analysis of a specialized corpus built from Nietzsche’s published works, private publications, and authorized manuscripts. He begins by noting that while Nietzsche scholars have been interested in his conception of moral psychological phenomena, such as virtue, this question hasn’t been engaged with in a truly systematic way. To aid in this, Alfano supplements traditional close reading with methods from the digital humanities, including a co-occurrence analysis. He motivates this by noting that if an author tends to use two words near each other across their writings, they likely take the concepts expressed by them to be associated. For his analysis, Alfano first operationalized key concepts; for instance, mapping the concept of virtue for Nietzsche onto words beginning with “Tugend” or “keusch”. He then looked at the co-occurrence of these concepts across the corpus, finding that virtue, instinct, and drive occurred together far more often than would be expected by chance. Alfano calls on such findings to argue that for Nietzsche, “instincts and virtues are (partially overlapping) subsets of drives” (2018: 86).

A second broad type of approach goes a step further still, taking advantage of modern computing power to uncover distributional similarities between linguistic entities. Distributional semantic models (DSMs) are built by using mathematical and machine learning techniques to map linguistic entities onto a semantic space based on similarities in the contexts in which they occur (for applications in philosophy see Fischer, Engelhardt, & Herbelot 2015, 2022; Sytsma, Bluhm, et al. 2019).

To help illustrate the basic idea, we would expect the terms “doctor” and “physician” to be used in similar contexts—to have similar distributional profiles—even if they rarely occur together in the same context window. DSMs aim to uncover such similarities. Using the semantic space built by Sytsma, Bluhm, et al. (2019) with the (then) state-of-the-art word2vec algorithm running on COCA, these terms do indeed occur in similar contexts, with the vectors representing them having a high cosine value of 0.83 (a standard measure of closeness with meaningful values ranging from 0 to 1). Indeed, “doctor” was the nearest neighbor to “physician” in the semantic space. The methods of distributional semantics have been advancing rapidly in recent years, with the development of sophisticated approaches such as contextual embedding algorithms, as exemplified by BERT (Devlin et al. 2019) and GPT (Radford et al. 2018 [Other Internet Resources]), extending the state of the art.

Co-occurrence analysis and distributional semantics, together with frequency analysis and other tools for investigating corpora—such as topic modeling (e.g., Malaterre, Lareau, et al. 2021; Bystranowski, Dranseika, & Żuradzki 2022; C. Allen & Murdock 2022) or sentiment analysis (e.g., Willemsen, Baumgartner, et al. 2023; Baumgartner & Kneer 2025)—offer an important new approach to experimental-philosophical research. These methods enable researchers to systematically probe language, uncovering patterns and associations between linguistic entities. Further, different corpus methods can complement each other, as well as other common empirical methods in experimental philosophy, such as vignette studies, providing additional channels of evidence to corroborate findings.

2.4 Other Methods

Although this section has focused on just two broad types of studies commonly found in experimental philosophy, practitioners have employed a wide range of methods. Some further examples include the use of questionnaires that do not center on vignettes, such as studies supplementing vignettes with behavioral manipulations (Phillips, Luguri, & Knobe 2015), or validating responses via a think-out-loud protocol (Byrd et al. 2023), or using semantic integration tasks (Henne, Pinillos, & De Brigard 2017). Other questionnaire studies do not include vignettes, such as those presenting videos (Henne, O’Neill, et al. 2021) or other visuals (Dranseika, Nichols, & Shoemaker 2024), using or developing validated psychological measures (Nadelhoffer, Shepard, et al. 2014), or employing linguistic methods such as the conjunction reduction test (Liu 2021, 2023), semantic feature production tasks (Reuter 2024), or the cancellability paradigm (Willemsen & Reuter 2021). Similarly, Berniūnas et al. (2021) used a free-listing task from cognitive anthropology. Others have conducted developmental studies (Nichols 2004; Kushnir et al. 2015). There are also a variety of implicit measures (see Strohminger et al. 2014 for a survey) and measures from psycholinguistics (see Fischer & Engelhardt 2024 for a tutorial) that have been used, such as pupillometry (Fischer & Engelhardt 2017), eye-tracking (Fischer, Engelhardt, & Sytsma 2021), and reaction-time measurements (Arico et al. 2011). Some use brain scanning technologies, such as fMRI (Greene et al. 2001, Young & Saxe 2009) or EEG (Cosentino et al. 2017). And some experimental philosophers use behavioral methods, such as those from behavioral economics (see Brunner 2023 for a survey). These include the use of simple economic games (Nadelhoffer, Heshmati, et al. 2013) and social dilemmas (Wyszynski & Bauer 2023; see Wyszynski 2024 for a tutorial).

In addition to such studies directly involving human participants, there have been a host of studies with less direct measures, such as the corpus studies discussed above. This includes Schwitzgebel’s (2009) investigation of library books and related studies. A number of studies employ citation analysis (e.g., Byron 2007) or other forms of bibliometrics (e.g., Knobe 2016).

Finally, while practitioners of experimental philosophy most often employ quantitative methods, there are also a number of studies using qualitative methods (see Andow 2016 for discussion). These include the use of experience sampling (Hurlburt & Schwitzgebel 2007), case studies (K. Allen et al. 2022), and structured interviews (Lim & Chen 2018; Thompson 2023; see Thompson 2024 for a tutorial).

3. First-Order Research in Experimental Philosophy

While empirical research has a long history in philosophy, contemporary experimental philosophy is a relatively recent sub-discipline (Sytsma, Ulatowski, & Gonnerman 2023; for discussion of one prominent precursor, Arne Næss, see Ulatowski 2016, Barnard & Ulatowski 2016). The exact beginning of x-phi is unclear, but it is often suggested that it started in the early 2000s, perhaps with the work of Weinberg, Nichols, and Stich (2001), which offers an articulation of what came to be known as the negative program alongside reporting empirical findings to substantiate their critique (see §4.3). Since then, work in experimental philosophy has seen rapid growth. To illustrate, the number of papers listed under “experimental philosophy” on PhilPapers has grown from less than 100 in 2007 to more than 3,400 as of January 2025. (See Li & Zhu 2023 for an extended bibliometric study looking at research in experimental philosophy.)

Experimental-philosophical research has been conducted in a large swath of philosophical areas. PhilPapers distinguishes 12 sub-categories for experimental philosophy, as shown in Figure 1. These range from Aesthetics (see entry on experimental philosophy of art and aesthetics; Cova & Réhault 2019) to experimental philosophy of law (see entry on experimental jurisprudence; Prochownik & Magen 2023) to experimental philosophy of religion (Church 2023; De Cruz & Nichols 2016) to experimental philosophy of science (Waskan 2023; Wilkenfeld & Samuels 2019), with much in between. This includes prominent representation of philosophy of action (see §3.1), philosophy of language (Machery 2023; Haukioja 2015), epistemology (see section on experimental epistemology in metaepistemology; Beebe 2014, 2023), philosophy of mind (Phelan 2023; Sytsma 2014), and metaphysics (Henne 2023; Rose 2017). Not surprisingly, the largest of these sub-categories is ethics, with more than 800 works listed (see entries on experimental moral philosophy and distributive justice and empirical moral psychology, as well as the entries on empirical approaches to moral psychology, altruism, moral character, moral responsibility; Sarkissian & Wright 2014).

Given the extent of research in experimental philosophy and breadth of areas explored, it is well beyond the scope of this entry to provide a comprehensive treatment (but see Sytsma & Buckwalter 2016; Bauer & Kornmesser 2023). Instead, this section aims to further illustrate first-order research in x-phi, complimenting the examples provided in the previous sections by spotlighting one related set of results and noting the broader body of empirical work surrounding them.

After ethics, which is covered in the entry on experimental moral philosophy, experimentalists have arguably focused most heavily on action theory (§3.1). Most prominently, this includes Knobe’s (2003) discovery of the side-effect effect and the extensive literature investigating this effect. Extending these findings, experimental philosophers have generated a large body of findings demonstrating the impact of normative considerations on a range of concepts of philosophical interest, including many that have been assumed to be purely descriptive (§3.2), such as causation (§3.3) and happiness (§3.4).

3.1 Experimental Philosophy of Action

Henne and Murray (2023: 2) note that “the story of action theory today is, to a considerable degree, the story of intentions”. And this holds for experimental philosophy of action as well, even as experimentalists have explored a variety of surrounding topics (e.g., Murray et al. 2019, 2023 on responsible agency; Gomez-Lavin & Rachar 2019 on joint action; Zahorec et al. 2023 on “voluntarily” and “involuntarily”). Focusing on intentionality, practitioners of experimental philosophy have investigated the concept in relation to beliefs about the possibility of the intended outcome (Buckwalter, Rose, & Turri 2021), control (Nadelhoffer 2005), skill (Mylopoulos 2023), causal dependence (Quillien & German 2021), probability raising (Ericson et al. 2023), and beliefs and desires (Korman 2023), among other factors (see Nadelhoffer 2011, Henne & Murray 2023). The most prominent focus for work on intentionality, however, is the side-effect effect (often acronymized as SEE; also known as the Knobe effect).

In his seminal article demonstrating the side-effect effect, Knobe (2003) complicates a traditional philosophical debate concerning the ordinary concept of intentional action. This debate centers on a disagreement about whether a foreseen side-effect of an action can properly be said to be brought about intentionally (e.g., Harman 1976; Mele 2001). The wrinkle Knobe adds is to present empirical evidence suggesting that the answer depends on the context of the action, and specifically on its normative context (see entry on the psychology of normative cognition).

Knobe’s main study used an experimental design with two conditions. Participants read a short vignette describing the chairman of a company taking an action to increase profits, where this action would also have the foreseen side-effect of either helping or harming the environment. The manipulation of this normative factor had a massive impact: while a mere 23% affirmed that the chairman intentionally helped the environment, 82% affirmed that he intentionally harmed the environment. This finding has proven robust, replicating across a host of studies utilizing diverse methods, stimuli, languages, and participant pools (for a survey, see Cova 2016).

Knobe’s work has spawned an extensive literature, prominently including ongoing debate about how best to explain this norm effect. To set up the debate, note that the asymmetry Knobe demonstrates seems to cast doubt on a common philosophical assumption in philosophy of action—that the dominant ordinary concept of intentional action is purely descriptive. Thus, one straightforward interpretation of Knobe’s finding is that the concept is not just descriptive but also has an evaluative component, being impacted by the moral valence of the action and/or outcome. Such a conclusion has been heavily challenged, however, with philosophers offering a variety of explanations of the SEE that maintain that the concept of intentional action is purely descriptive despite the norm effect.

We can distinguish between three basic types of explanation here. (See §2.3 of experimental moral philosophy for specific explanations.) First, as just suggested, one might take the SEE at face value, rejecting the common philosophical assumption about the concept of intentional action and taking it to have a normative component (e.g., Hindriks 2008). Alternatively, one might seek to preserve the assumption, explaining the effect in another way. Thus, the second type of explanation seeks to explain away Knobe’s finding, suggesting that the SEE reflects an error in the application of a purely descriptive concept (e.g., Alicke 2008), perhaps due to issues with the materials or experimental set-up (e.g., Lindauer & Southwood 2021). The third type of explanation aims to accept both the SEE and the common assumption, with advocates arguing that the effect reflects pertinent differences in context between the scenarios that (in one way or another) serve to mediate the non-mistaken application of the descriptive concept (e.g., Phillips, Luguri, & Knobe 2015). Adapting the labels used by Phillips, De Freitas, et al. (2017), call these evaluative concept explanations, distortion explanations, and mediation explanations respectively.

3.2 The Pervasive Impact of Norms

On its own, the side-effect effect is an important illustration of how experimental-philosophical research can contribute to and expand upon traditional philosophical debates. Perhaps the greater impact of this work, however, is seen in the wide range of related effects reported in its wake, with several leading to extensive literatures of their own—including debates over how best to explain the effects, with the same three broad types of explanation recurring (evaluative concept, distortion, and mediation).

Results reported in the literature reveal norm effects for many concepts of philosophical interest. This includes extensions of the SEE, with similar effects being shown for the related terms “intention” (Knobe 2004) and “intended” (Cushman 2008), as well as “desired” (Tannenbaum, Ditto, & Pizarro 2007 [Other Internet Resources]), “decided”, “advocated”, “in favor of” (Pettit & Knobe 2009), and even for belief (Beebe 2013) and knowledge ascriptions (see Beebe 2016 for survey; Beebe & Buckwalter 2010; Buckwalter 2014; Turri 2014). Extending this further, the impact of normative factors on judgments is not restricted to cases involving side-effects. This includes additional studies on intentional action (Nadelhoffer 2004), as well as doing vs. allowing (Cushman, Knobe, & Sinnott-Armstrong 2008), causation (Knobe & Fraser 2008), freedom (Phillips & Knobe 2009), happiness (Phillips, Misenheimer, & Knobe 2011), act individuation (Ulatowski 2012), weakness of will (May & Holton 2012), and even the quantifier “many” (Egré & Cova 2015), among others.

This spate of norm effects leads to a key question: Where should we fall along the spectrum from offering the same type of explanation for all of the effects to treating them each as being sui generis? This second-order question has also been a heated topic of debate, with answers here sometimes being called on to support particular first-order explanations. Thus, while some have argued that a unified explanation covering at least some of the most prominent norm effects is implausible, others have pushed a generally unificatory agenda.

To illustrate, Hindriks (2010) supports an evaluative concept explanation of the SEE, relating this to how intent is interpreted in the law, and suggesting that judging that the chairman intentionally harmed the environment is appropriate because his foresight leaves him with a guilty mind. Knobe (2010: 355) responds, in part to Hindriks, by noting that this would “leave us with a mystery as to why the impact of moral judgment is so pervasive”. Hindriks (2014) in turn challenges the contention that the observed norm effects should be so broadly lumped together, arguing that we have reason to treat at least some of them as owing to a different source, such as for judgments about freedom and causation. He holds that these are not folk psychological concepts—that they don’t involve assessing an agent’s state of mind—and, hence, that we should not expect normative factors to impact judgments about them via the same mechanism as for judgments about intentional action.

The unificatory argument then depends in part on there being a sufficiently compelling account on offer that explains a diverse range of norm effects. Knobe holds that such an account exists, advocating for a mediation explanation that centers on the role that alternative possibilities play in our cognition. The basic idea is that normative factors influence the degree to which people treat different alternative possibilities as being relevant, which in turn impacts a range of judgments of philosophical interest. For instance, Phillips, Luguri, and Knobe (2015) provide evidence supporting such an explanation for norm effects observed for intentional action, doing vs. allowing, freedom, and causation. That this is the best explanation for the observed effects in each of these areas has been challenged, however, including prominently in the causation literature.

3.3 Causation

After work on intentional action, the experimental literature on the impact of norms on causal judgments is the most extensive (see Henne 2023; Willemsen & Wiegmann 2022). There has been a host of findings exploring factors influencing the occurrence of norm effects for ordinary causal attributions, including looking at different types of norms (e.g., Kominsky & Phillips 2019; Grinfeld et al. 2020; Güver & Kneer 2023) and different causal structures (e.g., Kominsky et al. 2015, Livengood & Sytsma 2020), among others.

To illustrate, Hitchcock and Knobe (2009) demonstrate that normative considerations can even impact judgments about non-agents, such as wires in a simple machine. They gave participants the following vignette:

A machine is set up in such a way that it will short circuit if both the black wire and the red wire touch the battery at the same time. The machine will not short circuit if just one of these wires touches the battery. The black wire is designated as the one that is supposed to touch the battery, while the red wire is supposed to remain in some other part of the machine. One day, the black wire and the red wire both end up touching the battery at the same time. There is a short circuit. (2009: 604)

Participants were then asked to rate their agreement/disagreement with one of the following two statements on a scale from 1 (“disagree”) to 7 (“agree”):

• The fact that the red wire touched the battery caused the machine to short circuit.
• The fact that the black wire touched the battery caused the machine to short circuit. (2009: 605)

Hitchcock and Knobe found a sizable difference in ratings, with the mean for the statement about the norm-violating red wire (M=4.9) being significantly higher than for the norm-conforming black wire (M=2.7).

As with the SEE, the literature on norm effects for causation has centered on how to explain the findings in light of the common assumption in the literature that the ordinary concept of causation is purely descriptive (e.g., Lewis 1973; Bernstein 2017). Here we find the same three main types of explanations noted above for the SEE—evaluative concept explanations, distortion explanations, and mediation explanations.

The unificatory mediation explanation supported by Phillips, Luguri, and Knobe (2015) derives from the counterfactual account of causal attributions posited by Hitchcock and Knobe (2009). This account contends that norm violations render counterfactuals in which the norm-violator behaves more normally especially salient to participants. Because of this, participants are then more likely to consider such a counterfactual. And when they recognize that the outcome doesn’t occur in that counterfactual situation, they then tend to judge that the norm-violator caused the outcome. By contrast, distortion explanations have focused either on the claim that normative factors bias causal judgments (Alicke 1992; Alicke, Rose, & Bloom 2011) or that the seeming impact of norms reflects pragmatic factors introduced by the experimental materials or setting (Samland & Waldmann 2016). Finally, the evaluative concept explanation put forward by Sytsma, Livengood, and Rose (2012), contends that the dominant ordinary concept of causation has an evaluative component, bearing a family resemblance to the concept of responsibility. Interestingly, this account is complimentary to that offered by Hindriks for the SEE, treating the ordinary concept of causation as a folk psychological concept. Thus, while Hindriks holds that intentionality judgments facilitate attributions of responsibility, Sytsma and colleagues argue that causal attributions tend to be tightly aligned with responsibility attributions, with both being responsive to normative information (see, e.g., Sytsma 2024b responding to Phillips, Luguri, & Knobe 2015). If this is correct, then Hindriks’s account would lend itself to a more unificatory explanation of norm effects than he suggests.

Beyond work on norm effects, experimentalists have investigated a range of topics related to philosophy of causation. This includes work on how people make causal predications (see Park & Sloman 2016 for a survey), with researchers exploring factors such as temporal information (e.g., Bramley et al. 2018) and deterministic expectations (e.g., Dinh & Danks 2022). Other research explores causation by absence (e.g., Livengood & Machery 2007), action versus inaction (e.g., Henne, Niemi, et al. 2019), and a variety of cases from the literature, such as late preemption (e.g., Lombrozo 2010) and double-prevention (e.g., Henne & O’Neill 2022). While much of the research on causal judgements has focused on the verb “cause”, recent work has explored causal language more broadly (e.g., Rose, Sievers, & Nichols 2021; Schwenkler & Sievers 2022). And some experimental research explores the overlap between causal judgments and other topics in metaphysics and philosophy of mind, such as looking at beliefs in agent causation (Huber, Reuter, & Cacchione 2022) and the causal status of higher-level properties (Blanchard, Murray, & Lombrozo 2022).

3.4 Happiness

Work on the impact of normative information on attributions of happiness flips the typical script that we saw above for intentional action and causation. Here, while researchers working on this topic in psychology tend to treat the concept of happiness as being purely descriptive, philosophers have instead tended to treat it as partly evaluative. This type of view has a long history, with Aristotle suggesting that happiness is fundamentally tied to living a virtuous life, being “a certain kind of activity of the soul in accordance with virtue” (Nicomachean Ethics I.9, 1099b [2000]).

As with the concepts of intentional action and causation, experimental-philosophical research suggests that happiness attributions are impacted by normative information (Phillips, Misenheimer, & Knobe 2011; Newman, De Freitas, & Knobe 2015), with valenced descriptions of an agent’s life notably impacting whether participants judge them to be happy, even when the agent’s psychological states are held constant. For instance, Phillips, Misenheimer, and Knobe’s (2011) first study included a pair of vignettes describing an agent, Maria, who shows the features emphasized by purely descriptive accounts of happiness in psychology (high positive and low negative feelings, high life satisfaction). The vignettes then varied whether Maria was described as living a (normatively) good life characterized by a dedication to her children and friends or a bad life characterized by the shallow pursuit of a celebrity lifestyle. Participants read one of the vignettes and then were asked to rate their agreement/disagreement with the statement that Maria is happy. Phillips and colleagues found a striking difference, with participants in the good life condition tending to strongly agree with the statement, while participants in the bad life condition tended to disagree.

Expanding on such findings, Phillips, De Freitas, et al. (2017) detail the same three types of explanations that were noted above for the impact of norms on intentional action and causation. Across their studies, Phillips et al. found that the evidence favors an evaluative concept explanation. They conclude that contra the standard assumption in psychology, the ordinary concept of happiness is not purely descriptive. This conclusion is further supported by Yang, Knobe and Dunham (2021), who extend findings of a norm effect for happiness attributions developmentally (with children as young as four) and cross-linguistically (in Mandarin). They interpret these findings as suggesting that the effect reflects a fundamental cognitive feature of the mind, which they take to support the evaluative concept explanation. This type of explanation has been challenged by Prinzing and Fredrickson (2023), however, who present the results of two studies supporting a mediation explanation. They argue that normative information affects judgments about positive psychological states, which in turn impact happiness attributions. In a similar vein, Díaz and Reuter (2021) present studies suggesting that emotion attributions, more generally, depend in part on the appropriateness of those states given the agent’s situation.

As with intentionality and causation, experimentalists have tackled a range of questions about happiness (and related concepts like well-being ) beyond norm effects. This includes work looking at associations between level of aspiration and happiness (Angner, Hullett, & Allison 2011), judgments of the good life and evaluations of happiness (Kneer & Haybron 2024), and external factors and well-being judgments (Kneer & Haybron 2025). Other work suggests that people predominantly judge someone to be happy when they experience pleasure most of the time, which in turn influences their life satisfaction ratings (Reuter, Messerli, & Barlassina 2022). In a related vein, studies have questioned presumed case judgments about Nozick’s (1974) experience machine thought experiment, which has been taken to cast doubt on hedonic theories of well-being (De Brigard 2010; Weijers 2014; Hindriks & Douven 2018).

4. Experimental Philosophy and Metaphilosophy

Beyond the impact that experimental-philosophical research has had on a range of first-order topics in philosophy, it has also heavily influenced metaphilosophical debates, most notably concerning philosophical methodology. Indeed, the rise of x-phi has helped spur a renewed interest in these debates.

The most prominent of these discussions centers on the role of intuitions in philosophy and the use of the method of cases, with a comparatively small but widely discussed body of work in experimental philosophy calling into question the evidential value of judgments about philosophical cases. This research, in conjunction with critical responses to it, has played a major role in shaping perceptions of x-phi. The bulk of the concerns raised against the practice by the critics in these discussions, however, do not directly bear on the broader practice that is the focus of this entry. This arguably reflects that the diversity of experimental philosophy goes some way toward insulating it from comprehensive criticism.

Nonetheless, a pair of concerns have been voiced that, if accurate, would undermine experimental philosophy broadly construed. The first is that x-phi is not philosophy; the second that it is amateur psychology. These broad objections are discussed in §4.1. By contrast, the most prominent criticisms of experimental philosophy in the literature target just parts of the sub-discipline. To set up these criticisms, §4.2 demarcates programs in experimental philosophy, including the divide between the negative program and the positive program. §4.3 then details the provocative critique of traditional methodology put forward by proponents of the negative program—the restrictionist challenge. With this setup in place, §4.4 discusses the primary narrow objections that have been raised against x-phi, noting that these are sufficiently focused that they are better seen as responses to the restrictionist challenge rather than as general objections to experimental philosophy.

4.1 Broad Objections to Experimental Philosophy

The first objection against the broad practice of experimental philosophy contends that x-phi is not actually philosophy but instead belongs to the sciences. This objection hinges on advancing a demarcation criterion for philosophy and arguing that x-phi falls on the wrong side of it. There are two main routes that this might take, each based on a different demarcation criterion. The first excludes experimental philosophy from philosophy on the basis of its use of empirical methods (§4.1.1); the second on the basis of its inclusion of empirical content (§4.1.2).

While the first objection challenges the categorization of experimental philosophy, the second targets the practice itself. This objection contends that practitioners are just not very good at conducting empirical research (§4.1.3). The accuracy of this charge has been contested, however, with both theoretical and empirical responses being offered.

4.1.1 Excluding Empirical Methods

The methodological version of the charge that experimental philosophy is not philosophy is the more moderate of the two. According to this version of the objection, philosophy is distinguished from the sciences, at least in part, by the methods employed. And since practitioners of experimental philosophy employ scientific methods, the practice is better thought of as being part of the sciences. Here is how Sorell (2018: 829) expresses the concern:

Is experimental philosophy a kind of philosophy? Since it involves techniques that experimental philosophers themselves admit are not typical of current academic philosophy, and since some of these techniques are borrowed from psychology and other social sciences, it is at least arguable that, despite calling itself “philosophy”, experimental philosophy is better classified as psychology or some other social science.

There are two basic types of responses to this objection. The first is to simply deny that anything of theoretical importance follows from the argument. The second is to deny the demarcation criterion assumed by the objection.

Starting with the first type of response, the defender of experimental philosophy might argue that disciplinary boundaries are in part a matter of convention, noting that they can be, and have been, drawn in different ways. They might then assert that what should really matter here is not how work is categorized but the virtues it possesses. And if the work is interesting and contributes to philosophical debates, so the defender asks, why should we care about where it falls relative to some proposed delineation of disciplinary boundaries? Indeed, the defender of experimental philosophy might just happily accept the conclusion that Sorell treats as problematic:

with experimental philosophy, what we might have … is something irreducibly interdisciplinary, classifiable either as philosophically informed psychology or as psychologically informed philosophy. (2018: 838)

Advocates might also go a step further, offering a more strident version of this response. Thus, they might reject the starting assumption that practitioners need to justify their existence within the discipline, refusing to play along with such a “culture of justification”, as Dotson (2012) puts it. As part of this, the defender of experimental philosophy might note the harms that such a culture perpetrates against diverse philosophers.

The second type of response engages more directly with the objection than the first, rejecting the demarcation criterion it is based on. This might be done on a variety of grounds. One version is suggested by Sytsma and Livengood (2019) in response to Sorell. They question the assumption that fields like philosophy should be distinguished on the basis of their methods, instead noting that disciplines are more typically characterized by the targets of their investigations. Thus, what unites biologists is their shared concern with questions about life and living organisms, despite the wide diversity of methods they employ. Similarly, Sytsma and Livengood argue, it is their shared targets of investigation that unite experimental and non-experimental philosophers.

A related version of this type of response is given by Knobe and Nichols (2008b), who offer what they call “the quizzical stare”. Thus, they write that

the questions addressed in this research program strike us as so obviously philosophical that we find it a little bit difficult to know how to respond. (2008b: 13)

Expanding on this, experimentalists have engaged with an array of topics and debates that, absent concerns with the use of empirical methods in addressing them, would seem to be rather non-controversially a part of contemporary philosophy. Accepting this, the upshot of the quizzical stare is to put the onus back on the critic to justify why the methods used in addressing an otherwise seemingly philosophical question should disqualify work from being part of the discipline. Expanding on this, a final version of this response suggests that absent a reasonable case to the contrary, we should fall back on the adage that the proof of the pudding is in the eating. Thus, Weinberg asserts that

it is no longer really controversial as to whether x-phi can be philosophy: simply put, too many good papers have been published in too many good places (even Mind!) under the x-phi aegis, for that question to be usefully debated. (2016: 71)

4.1.2 Excluding Empirical Content

The second version of the charge that experimental philosophy is not philosophy is more radical, excluding x-phi not on the basis of practitioners conducting empirical investigations, per se, but because they call on the results of those investigations to inform their philosophy. This is a radical charge, most notably because it excludes not just experimental philosophy from the discipline but also its superordinate category of empirical philosophy. As noted in §1, this practice involves calling on empirical findings where relevant in philosophizing, whether those findings were produced by philosophers or non-philosophers.

Many are likely to find the conception of philosophy that this version of the first objection rests on to be overly restrictive. In fact, Bourget and Chalmers (2023: 9) report that a solid majority of philosophers surveyed (1040/1733, 60.0%) accept or lean toward the view that empirical philosophy is the most useful/important philosophical method. Nonetheless, this restrictive view has had its advocates, with some philosophers taking the discipline to consist in a priori conceptual analysis. To illustrate, consider the fascinating forum that opens the inaugural issue of Mind & Language. Here, Davies and Guttenplan (1986: 3) welcome engagement with a sentiment that they suggest is common in the profession—that “philosophical papers simply are not to be dealt with by citing empirical findings”.

The primary response to this version of the first broad objection to x-phi is to reject the characterization of philosophy it is based on. Thus, the advocate of experimental (or empirical) philosophy might reject the descriptive adequacy of this view. As several contributors to the Mind & Language forum quickly point out, such an “insular conception of philosophy” (Churchland 1986: 5) reflects neither the current practice nor its history. Going further, advocates might, once again, argue that the proof is in the pudding and note that the practice of calling on scientific findings in philosophy has shown striking results. Recognizing the fruitfulness of empirical philosophy, one might then reject the normative appeal of the insular conception.

Ironically, both the prevalence and prominence of empirical philosophy are rather plausibly empirical questions. Some work has been done on this topic, including the bibliometric study reported by Knobe (2015). He looked at highly cited articles in contemporary philosophy of mind, finding that a mere 11.5% were fully confined to the armchair, completely eschewing scientific findings. Thus, at least in this area of philosophy, empirical philosophy now appears to be the norm.

4.1.3 Amateur psychology?

A second broad objection to x-phi challenges its quality rather than its categorization. Following Machery (2017: §5.1), this can be referred to as the amateur psychology objection, echoing Williamson (2010) who disparagingly refers to practitioners as “amateur experimentalists” and experimental philosophy as “imitation psychology”. The basic idea he expresses is that while empirical results can be of philosophical relevance, such relevance is undermined by the “crude work” that is supposedly characteristic of x-phi.

Not surprisingly, an initial response to the amateur psychology objection is to simply deny that the critics have made a reasonable case concerning the general practice of x-phi today. First, the defender might note that critics have tended to focus on just a few early examples (e.g., Jackson 2011; Woolfolk 2011, 2013), responding that even if we were to accept the characterization of this work, cherry-picked examples do not constitute an adequate basis for generalization and we should be cautious of judging emerging practices based on their earliest entries. Second, the defender might point out that this objection neglects the comparison class, failing to adequately establish that the practice of experimental philosophy is lacking relative to contemporaneous work in experimental psychology.

A second response to the amateur psychology objection echoes the proof is in the pudding response given to the previous objection. The basic idea is to argue that the success of experimental philosophy suggests against blithe dismissals of it as crude work. As Machery (2017: 153) expresses the point:

As shown by the numbers of articles they have published in psychology journals, experimental philosophers tend to be much more methodologically savvy than what their critics suggest, particularly those critics with no training or experience in experimental design whatsoever.

Here it might be further emphasized that contrary to what the label “amateur psychology” suggests, work in experimental philosophy often involves researchers employed in the sciences—both as collaborators and as lead investigators—including those in psychology departments.

A final response to the amateur psychology objection essentially flips the critique on its head, contending that the concerns being voiced illustrate the need for x-phi. Thus, the advocate of experimental philosophy might note that the objection rests on empirical claims about research practices in the sub-discipline that can (and should) be investigated in a more systematic manner than critics have done. Indeed, in recent years, experimental philosophers have called on empirical tools to investigate key methodological concerns for the practice, such as the adequacy of statistical reporting (Colombo et al. 2018), the occurrence of p-hacking (Stuart et al. 2019), and the replicability of findings (Cova, Strickland, et al. 2021). On each of these metrics, experimental philosophy fares rather better than the critical remarks would suggest.

4.2 Divisions within Experimental Philosophy

The previous section examined variations on a pair of objections that can be applied to the practice of experimental philosophy broadly construed. But even for such objections there is a tendency to treat x-phi more narrowly. In light of this, it is perhaps not surprising that practitioners have spent a good bit of space demarcating programs in experimental philosophy. While such divisions are best treated instrumentally, rather than taking them to cut x-phi at some imagined joints, they are useful both for distinguishing driving motivations behind the practice and framing the narrower objections discussed in §4.4.

A first distinction is between intuitional and non-intuitional experimental philosophy. As discussed in §1.1.2, while some have described the practice narrowly, tying x-phi to the study of philosophical intuitions, experimental philosophy is broader than this and the literature includes many studies that do not target intuitions or employ an empirical analog of the method of cases. Such work can be designated non-intuitional. At the same time, experimental-philosophical research often does target intuitions, most prominently including work employing vignette studies (§2.2). This research can be described as intuitional. Within intuitional experimental philosophy, we can then further distinguish between work that focuses on the evidential value of intuitions (evidential experimental philosophy) and work that is instead focused on understanding our intuitions and explaining various effects that practitioners have uncovered (explanatory experimental philosophy).

Explanatory experimental philosophy plausibly covers a notable majority of the work that has been done in the field (Knobe 2016). Nonetheless, metaphilosophical discussions have tended to center on evidential experimental philosophy. This corresponds with the tendency to divide x-phi into just two primary camps—the so-called positive program and the negative program (e.g., Alexander & Weinberg 2007; Kauppinen 2007; Alexander 2012). These two approaches to evidential experimental philosophy can most readily be distinguished by the motives of the researchers in investigating intuitions. Thus, research in the positive program aims to bolster the practice of calling on intuitions as evidence in philosophy, most often by putting the surveying of intuitions on a firmer empirical footing.

By contrast, research in the negative program aims to undermine the standard practice, often by targeting underlying assumptions for the method of cases. Importantly, this includes an assumption that has come up previously: advocates of traditional conceptual analysis typically assume that the method of cases can reliably be applied from the armchair, generalizing on one’s own intuitions to offer accounts of ordinary concepts of philosophical interest. Call this the generalization assumption. Few advocates of experimental philosophy are likely to look favorably on this assumption, even if they identify with the positive program. Nonetheless, work in the negative program can be distinguished by its actively targeting the generalization assumption, with researchers conducting empirical work to assess the extent to which different case judgments are shared across theoretically interesting groups. Such work has been called on to support a methodological critique of the traditional approach to the method of cases, often termed the restrictionist challenge (Alexander & Weinberg 2007).

4.3 The Restrictionist Challenge

The restrictionist challenge is driven by a body of empirical results that indicate that some of the case judgments called on in the armchair literature vary along dimensions that are not philosophically relevant to those judgments. Such results have then been used to draw either relatively moderate (e.g., Weinberg & Alexander 2025) or relatively radical conclusions (e.g., Machery 2017). For brevity, the present discussion will detail just the shared methodological critique behind different versions of the challenge. Further, it will focus on the broad classes of empirical findings driving the critique rather than individual results. For a detailed survey of relevant findings see Machery (2017: Chapter 2).

The restrictionist challenge has primarily focused on findings for two main types of variation in judgments. Following Weinberg and Alexander’s (2025) terminology, the first set of results are those showing that judgments about philosophical cases show heterogeneity. Most directly this includes findings indicating that some case judgments vary across theoretically salient groups of people, such as between different cultures (e.g., the cross-cultural variation in judgments about reference reported by Machery, Mallon, et al. 2004 and discussed in §2.2.2). One can also include under this heading cases that Weinberg and Alexander term “inconclusive”, where this covers case judgments found to vary notably within groups or even individuals. The second set of results are those indicating that some case judgments show instability—that they vary depending on how the cases are presented (such as with the framing effect demonstrated for free will judgments by Nichols & Knobe 2007 and discussed in §2.2.3).

Findings indicating that case judgments are heterogeneous challenge the generalization assumption by raising the question of justification for privileging the judgments of one group over another in arriving at an account of an ordinary concept of interest. Similarly, results indicating that case judgments are unstable raise the question of whether the judgments being called on accurately reflect the intuiters’ concepts or are the result of error or bias (although see Demaree-Cotton 2016 for doubts that the effect sizes shown for studies on moral intuitions, at least, are sufficient to drive the challenge).

Knobe (2019, 2021) has questioned just how widespread relevant variation in philosophical intuitions is, with Stich and Machery (2023) responding that he undersells what is reported in the literature. Regardless of how this dispute is settled, the restrictionist challenge arguably just requires evidence of relevant variation for some case judgments. With such examples in hand, the proponent then contends that prior to empirical testing we cannot reliably determine whether a given case will show problematic variability or not, undermining the evidential credentials of analyses based on the traditional method of cases (although see Wright 2010, 2016). Of course, the degree to which they are undermined—our estimate of the likelihood that a given case judgment would show problematic variation if tested—will depend on the extent of the findings underwriting the challenge relative to findings of general homogeneity and stability.

4.4 Responses to the Restrictionist Challenge

The metaphilosophical literature often equates the practice of x-phi with just the subset of work falling under evidential experimental philosophy. Correspondingly, the most prominent “objections” to the practice in the literature do not actually target the bulk of the sub-discipline, broadly construed, but just that minority concerned with the evidential value of intuitions. Further, while this includes both the negative and the positive programs, the criticisms most clearly center on the methodological critique of traditional practice coming out of the negative program. As such, these objections are perhaps best seen as responses to the restrictionist challenge. Following Horvath (2023), these will be discussed under two headings, distinguishing between responses that challenge the characterization of traditional methodology that the restrictionist challenges (intuition detraction) and responses that defend traditional methodology, so characterized, against the challenge (intuition apologetics).

4.4.1 Intuition Detraction

Intuition detraction centers on the claim that, despite appearances and widespread metaphilosophical belief, “it is not true that philosophers rely extensively (or even a little bit) on intuitions as evidence” (Cappelen 2012: 1; see also Deutsch 2015). If this is correct, then the restrictionist challenge misses its mark: it criticizes traditional philosophical methodology for a practice it does not actually engage in. The principal objection to this response has been to reject the characterization of the traditional method of cases that it offers. Thus, a host of philosophers—both experimental and non-experimental—have challenged the claim that philosophers do not appeal to intuitions as evidence (e.g., Bengson 2014; Chalmers 2014; Weinberg 2014; Nado 2016; Brown 2017; Colaço & Machery 2017; Sękowski 2024).

Much of the back-and-forth here concerns how best to interpret prominent examples of the use of thought experiments in the literature, such as in the cases presented by Gettier (1963). In each of these examples, one side sees a description of a scenario in which, by coincidence, a justified belief turns out to be true for entirely different reasons than what underwrites the justification, followed by a statement of the expected intuitive response that this is not a case of knowledge. In contrast, the other side sees a “(brief) informal argument for his case verdict” (Horvath 2023: 89). On this latter interpretation, the coincidence noted is taken to be the “main reason” given for the conclusion that this is not a case of knowledge. The critic of this interpretation, however, is likely to question just how the scenario involving a coincidence, ex hypothesi, could serve as a reason for the conclusion without a further appeal to intuition. As Nado puts the more general point, here, “in many cases, there just aren’t any obvious extra-intuitive sources for our philosophical beliefs” (2016: 794).

4.4.2 Intuition Apologetics

The second set of responses to the restrictionist challenge comes at it from the opposite perspective: while intuition detractors deny the portrayal of traditional methodology assumed by this critique, intuition apologists aim to defend the traditional practice more-or-less as described. Thus, intuition apologists argue that the findings appealed to for the restrictionist challenge do not actually undermine the traditional practice of calling on intuitions as evidence for or against philosophical accounts.

This type of response has taken a number of different forms. A first version argues that the questionnaire responses typically collected by experimentalists do not actually reflect philosophical intuitions (e.g., Ludwig 2007, Bengson 2013). One reason offered for this is that the responses are too quick and not suitably reflective (e.g., Kauppinen 2007), another that they track different concepts than philosophers are interested in (e.g., Sosa 2009, 2010). A second version argues that the restrictionist challenge amounts to pushing a more general skepticism than proponents of the negative program intend (e.g., Brown 2013; Williamson 2004, 2016; see Horne & Livengood 2017 for a more limited version of this response). The most prominent version of the intuition apologetics response, however, is the so-called expertise defense (e.g., Ludwig 2007, Devitt 2011, Sosa 2011). Framed as a response to the restrictionist challenge, the expertise defense denies that findings of heterogeneity or instability in the case judgments of lay people undermine the traditional use of the method of cases, since the intuitions of the experts should be trusted over the intuitions of lay people anyway. This might be because philosophers have developed positive skills for generating philosophical intuitions or because non-philosophers have a deficiency in this regard, being prone to error in arriving at judgments about philosophical cases.

One line of objection to the expertise defense is to note that experimentalists have also solicited case judgments from philosophers, such as in Bourget and Chalmers (2014, 2023), and that these studies often show notable heterogeneity in responses, raising analogous concerns about whose intuitions should be preferred. Similarly, a growing array of experimental results testing philosophers suggests that they are also prone to having their judgments swayed by philosophically irrelevant factors (e.g., Machery 2012; Schwitzgebel and Cushman 2012, 2015; Tobia, Buckwalter, and Stich 2013; Löhr 2019; Wiegmann, Horvath, and Meyer 2020; Horvath and Wiegmann 2016, 2022; Schindler and Saint-Germier 2023). A final line of objection is to challenge the plausibility of philosophers having developed intuitive expertise (e.g., Weinberg, Gonnerman, et al. 2010; Nado 2015). The basic argument is that reliable feedback is needed for this, but that such independent feedback is lacking for philosophical cases.

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• Tannenbaum, David, Peter H. Ditto, and David A. Pizarro, 2007, “Different Moral Values Produce Different Judgments of Intentional Action”, Unpublished manuscript, University of California, Irvine.
• Radford, Alec, Karthik Narasimhan, Tim Salimans, and Ilya Sutskever, 2018, “Improving Language Understanding by Generative Pre-Training”, unpublished manuscript, OpenAI.
• Corpora mentioned:
  • BCC Corpus
  • Corpus of Contemporary American English (COCA)
  • News on the Web (NOW)
  • British National Corpus (BNC)
  • Child Language Data Exchange System (CHILDES)
  • JSTOR database
  • Linguistic Inquiry and Word Count (LIWC)
• Knobe, Joshua and Shaun Nichols, “Experimental Philosophy”, Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Spring 2026 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/spr2026/entries/experimental-philosophy/>. [This was the previous entry on this topic in the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy – see the version history.]

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