Afḍal al-Dīn al-Khūnajī

First published Thu Sep 10, 2026

Afḍal al-Dīn al-Khūnajī (1194–1248) was one of the most prominent logicians in the Islamic world, arguably second only to Ibn Sīnā (Avicenna, c. 970–1037). He became the central figure in revising Avicennian logic by introducing substantial modifications and raising numerous objections against earlier Arabic logicians. Khūnajī’s objections were directed above all at Avicenna, who has been the authority in Arabic logic, and Fakhr al-Dīn al-Rāzī (d. 1210), whose writings nevertheless provided an important basis for Khūnajī’s revisionary logic. Khūnajī’s revisions to Avicenna shaped subsequent developments in logic and philosophy in the Islamic world.

Khūnajī was not only a logician; he also wrote on theology, medicine, and pathology, and served as a judge for most of his life. Nevertheless, his significance lies primarily in his work on logic. Accordingly, this entry will focus on his logical writings, with one exception, where we will consider an application of his theory of intentionality in a theological context (see §2.1).

1. Life and Work

Khūnajī was born in the town of Khūnaj, in the northwest of present-day Iran, in 1194. Once a thriving town, Khūnaj was almost ruined by the Mongol invasion. Likely as a result of the invasions of the 1220s, Khūnajī left his hometown and settled in Cairo, where he spent most of his life working as a judge— eventually the chief judge of Cairo— and as a teacher at Ṣāliḥiyya’s college, one of the most prestigious madrasas in medieval Cairo (El-Rouayheb 2010, vii–xvi). The only other place where he lived was Seljuk Anatolia, where he was appointed as a judge, but he had to flee once again when the Mongols conquered the Seljuks, and he returned to Cairo.

Despite his extensive influence, Khūnajī was not a prolific author. He lived no more than fifty-four years, and as his student Ibn Wāṣil al-Ḥamawī reports, he became too busy with his judicial duties, which left him little time to write (El-Rouayheb 2022, 13).

Among Khūnajī’s works, two are on medicine: his commentary on the section of General Principles (Kulliyyāt) from Avicenna’s The Canon of Medicine (Qānūn fī al-Ṭibb), and The Cycles of Fevers (Adwār al-Ḥammiyāt). His work the Book of Etiology and Symptoms (Kitāb al-asbāb wa l-ʿalāmāt) in pathology is extant too. He also wrote a critical epitome of Rāzī’s The Elevated Topics from the Divine Science (al-Maṭālib al-ʿĀliyah min al-ʿIlm al-Ilāhī), under the title The Epitome of the Elevated Topics (Talkhīṣ al-Maṭālib al-ʿĀliyah) (a recent edition is available: see Khūnajī, Talkhīṣ). The Elevated Topics is one of Rāzī’s last works, or likely his last work, and thus includes his culminating philosophical ideas. This magnum opus, in nine parts, includes a broad list of theological topics. While summarizing Rāzī’s compendium, Khūnajī misses no opportunity to raise objections against Rāzī.

Khūnajī also wrote a treatise on definitions and descriptions (Ḥudūd wa Rusūm). Some have read the title as “On Inflammations and Tumors” (Fī al-Khudūr wa al-Wurūm), however, as El-Rouayheb argues, the former must be the correct title (El-Rouayheb 2010, xi, fn. 28).

Other works by Khūnajī include his three treatises on logic, two of which are orthodox Avicennian: The Sentences (al-Jumal) and The Summary (al-Mūjaz) (El-Rouayheb 2019, 44–45). The Sentences is a dense and brief handbook of logic. The number of commentaries on this short handbook underlines its popularity, especially in North Africa. Some of the important commentators on The Sentences are Kātibī al-Qazwīnī (d. 1276), Ibn Wāṣil al-Ḥamawī (d. 1298), Muḥammad al-Sharīf al-Tilimsānī (d. 771/1370), Saʿīd al-ʿUqbānī (d. 1408), Ibn Marzūq al-Ḥafīd (d. 1439), Ibrāhīm b. Fāʾid al-Zawāwī (d. 1453), and Ibn Yaʿqūb al-Wallālī (d. 1716), among which the editions of Ibn Wāṣil (Sharḥ) and Kātibī (Sharḥ Jumal) are available.

The Summary is not as short as The Sentences, yet it is a short handbook. Commentaries on The Summary were written by Sirāj al-Dīn al-ʾUrmawī (1198–1283), Fakhr al-Dīn al-Badīʿ al-Bandahī (d. 1258), and Sayf al-Dīn al-Baghdādī (d. 1305) (El-Rouayheb 2019, 45–46).

It was however Khūnajī’s incomplete magnum opus, Kashf al-Asrār ʿan Ghawāmiḍ al-Afkār (The Disclosure of Secrets as to the Obscurities of Thoughts), that turned out to be one of the most influential books in Arabic logic. Kashf al-Asrār changed the course of post-Avicennian Arabic logic and also had a far-reaching impact on later developments in metaphysics and jurisprudence. All of Khūnajī’s revisionist ideas can only be found in this book, and thus, in this entry, we will explore Khūnajī’s contributions as they appear throughout Kashf al-Asrār. Although highly influential, Kashf al-Asrār is unfinished. In particular, it lacks the topics discussed in Avicenna’s Kitāb al-Burhān, which corresponds to Aristotle’s Posterior Analytics. Nor did Khūnajī write on fallacies, dialectics, rhetoric, or poetics. Even within the subjects covered in the book, his views are not always fully developed. A notable case is his treatment of hypotheticals: Khūnajī refers the reader to a separate treatise he intended to write on the topic, but there is no evidence that such a work was ever written. As a result, his discussion of implications between hypotheticals is largely based on those of his predecessors rather than constituting a fully developed account of his own based on his rejection of the principles of connexivity.

2. Metaphysics and Semantics

Khūnajī’s significance as a logician and his impact on later thinkers lie primarily in his revisions of Avicenna’s logic, which had remained the dominant framework among Arabic logicians for more than two centuries. The cornerstone of Khūnajī’s revision of Avicenna’s logic is a semantic shift, or more precisely, a modification of the domain of objects. It is important to note that Khūnajī’s revisions of Avicenna’s logic should not be understood as a wholesale change of framework. He remains within the Avicennian system, and his ideas must therefore be discussed in comparison with those of Avicenna. From a general perspective, Khūnajī’s revisions of Avicenna’s logic consist of two main aspects:

  1. Extension of the domain of objects: For Avicenna, there are two modes of existence: external (khārijī) and mental (dhihnī). Objects exist either in the external world or in the mind. The domain of objects in Avicenna’s logic includes both externally existent objects (which also have a mental existence) and those that exist only in the mind, i.e. possible objects that do not exist in the external world, such as the number two. In contrast to Avicenna, Khūnajī extends the domain of objects in demonstrative syllogisms to include impossibilities, in addition to externally existent and possible non-existent objects. In his Kashf al-Asrār, Khūnajī never mentions mental existence. Thus, in the Kashf al-Asrār, we find only analyses involving external existence, and objects are only treated as existent or non-existent in this sense, and non-existent objects include possible and impossible ones.
  2. Multi-domain semantics: For Avicenna, there is only one domain of objects, consisting of quiddities that exist either in the mind or in the external world. In contrast, Khūnajī considers two domains of objects, (1) one made up of only externally existent objects, and (2) another of everything, including externally existent objects, possible and impossible non-existent objects.

Khūnajī’s applications of these two domains vary across logical topics. For instance, in his discussion of conversion (ʿaks), Khūnajī considers the two domains separately (for definitions of conversion and contraposition, see §3.4). A proposition is first considered with respect to one domain, then he discusses the implication of its converse in respect of that domain. In his treatment of contraposition (ʿaks al-naqīḍ), however, he also allows for propositions in which the subject belongs to one domain and the predicate to another domain. This is in contrast with his account of modal syllogisms (mukhtaliṭāt), where he presents his account only with respect to one of the two domains of objects, noting merely that the validity of his account in the other domain is uncertain.

These two aspects of his semantic shift are further explained in the following two sections.

2.1 Objecthood

The domain of objects, or the domain of discourse, here refers to the domain of things that are intelligible, and hence can be the subject of a true affirmative proposition.

The affirmation principle (qāʿida farʿiyya) plays a fundamental role in Avicenna’s semantics. According to this principle, the subject of an affirmative proposition must be existent, for “the reality of affirmation is the judgement of the existence of the predicate for the subject, and it is impossible to make a judgement of something non-existent that anything existent belongs to it” (al-ʿIbāra, 79). “The sky is blue” is true only if blueness exists for the sky. This cannot be true unless the sky is existent. Nevertheless, there are some affirmative propositions in which the privation of something is affirmed of a subject, e.g. “Zayd is non-just.” In these sentences too, according to Avicenna, the subject must be existent (Avicenna, al-ʿIbāra, 82; for details, see Hodges 2012).

However, not all subjects of true affirmative propositions exist in the extramental world, for example the number two in “two is greater than one.” Avicenna concludes that there must be another way of existence in addition to the external existence. Avicenna calls this second way of existence “mental existence” (wujūd dhihnī) (Mihirig 2024, ch.5; Zamboni 2024, ch. 3.1).

Since there are two ways of existence for Avicenna, the domain of objects, i.e. the objects that can be the subjects of true affirmative propositions, includes objects that are either existent in the mind or in the external world (The disjunction here is inclusive. What exists in the external world also exists in the mind but not vice versa. For mental existence, see Mihirig 2024, ch. 5–6; Zamboni 2024, ch. 3.1; Janos 2020, ch. II; Mousavian 2022). Everything that exists externally also exists in the mind. The contents of each judgement refer to mentally existent entities, and thus, any judgement about what exists externally is in fact about its counterpart which exists in the mind (Avicenna al-ʿIbāra, 80; Ilāhiyyat, 1.5).

The impossible cannot exist, and according to Avicenna, it is neither intelligible nor does it possess quiddities. An example is vacuum (khalaʾ), about which we are able to talk, however what we refer to is just a meaning (maʿnā) in the faculty of estimation (wahm). Vacuum is impossible, not intelligible, and has no quiddity. We perceive it through some resemblance to what is possible, i.e. that which is receptive of bodies (Burhān, 72; Taʿlīqāt, 211; for a comprehensive discussion, see Mousavian 2023). Consequently, the impossible exists neither in the external world nor in the mind. Therefore, there is no true affirmative proposition whose subject is impossible. Nevertheless, negative propositions with impossible subjects can be true, e.g. “Vacuum is not a substance.” Thus, the impossible falls outside the domain of objects. For Avicenna, the domain of objects is the combination of externally and mentally existent objects. Post-Avicennians refer to this domain as reality, or things in themselves (nafs al-amr).

This, however, is only the case in demonstrative syllogisms, namely where premises of productive syllogisms must be true in accordance with reality. Syllogisms that are used in rhetoric, sophistical refutations, and poetics can be formed without true premises, rather with premises that are only assumed to be true. Such syllogisms, for instance in refuting an opponent’s idea, may even be formed with impossible premises (Zolghadr 2021).

Khūnajī diverges from Avicenna in his definition of objecthood and, consequently, in the domain of objects. Khūnajī takes objecthood (shayʾiyya) in a much broader sense compared to his predecessors. In the beginning pages of Kashf al-Asrār, he explains what it is to have a judgement about an object (Kashf al-Asrār, 9):[1]

Making a judgment about an object (shayʾ) does not require conceptualizing its true nature but rather conceptualizing it under one or more of the considerations that are true of it. That is how someone who is ignorant about the Phoenix makes the judgment that it exists or does not exist, insofar as he conceptualizes it as something that is apt to be intellected (yuʿqal) or mentioned (tudhkar).

Thus, a judgement about an object, according to Khūnajī, does not require a conceptualization of its true nature (taṣawwuruhū bi-haqīqatihī). A conceptualization of only one or more of the considerations that are true of the object is sufficient to have a judgement about it. He gives two examples: Pegasus and the absolute unknown. Consider Pegasus first. According to Khūnajī, we can make a judgement about Pegasus insofar as we conceptualize it as something apt to be intellected (tuʿqal) or mentioned (tudhkar). Pegasus need not be existent, nor do we need access to its true nature in order to make a judgement about it. The example of the absolute unknown—that is, that which is defined as being unknown in every respect—clarifies the point better. It is impossible to have a judgement about the absolute unknown. Though this (the impossibility of making a judgement about the absolute unknown) is the only thing we know of the absolute unknown, it suffices to make a judgement about the absolute unknown.

Thus, in order to form a judgement about something, it should be intellected or mentioned under some consideration which is true of it. Khūnajī applies the same view to judgements about God. His true nature is not known to us, whereas we are able to make judgements about him (Khūnajī, Talkhiṣ, I, 213). Here Khūnajī also gives an argument for why making a judgment about something does not require conceptualizing its true nature:

Making a judgement about the Essence of the Creator with the attributes of majesty and nobility, and other such attributes, does not require conceptualizing that Essence in its true reality, but rather through some of its attributes that are peculiar to it. There is no doubt that we can conceptualize it under a specific consideration that belongs to it, such as its being necessary in existence, or its being an absolute first principle, and the like. The proof that making a judgment about a thing does not require conceptualizing its true reality is that we judge a body, whose quiddity is unknown but whose existence in a certain location is known, to be occupying that location to the exclusion of others.

This framework allows us to form judgements not only about externally existent and possible non-existent objects, but also about impossibilities, such as the odd two, the donkey-horse, something that is eclipsed (in the sense of a lunar eclipse) but is not the moon, etc. (all examples from Khūnajī, Kashf al-Asrār, 319, 320, 130). All these are considered objects and can be the subjects of true affirmative propositions.

Khūnajī does not elaborate on what he means by “intellected or mentioned” and “some considerations that are true of the object of judgement,” but throughout Kashf al-Asrār, he refers to what apparently satisfies these conditions as “mafhūm,” which is usually translated as concept or something understood. “Mafhūm” is a passive noun meaning what is understood or grasped. It comes from the root f-h-m signifying understanding, grasping, or comprehension.

According to Khūnajī, every mafhūm implies objecthood (shayʾiyya), meaning that if it were to exist in the external world it would be something, regardless of whether it exists externally or not (Kashf al-Asrār, 159–160). Khūnajī extends the domain of objects to include impossibilities. Thus, impossible objects can also be the subjects of true affirmative propositions (Kashf al-Asrār, 130; Street 2014).

This contrasts with Avicenna’s position according to which the subject of a true affirmative proposition must exist, either externally or mentally. For Avicenna, impossibilities cannot be the subject of a true affirmative proposition, since their existence is impossible, or in other words, they simply cannot exist.

Based on the essentialist–externalist distinction, and the inclusion of impossibilities, Khūnajī articulated a multi-domain semantics for his logic.

2.2 Multi-domain Semantics

For Avicenna, there is only one domain of objects, which includes whatever exists, whether externally or just mentally. In other words, it comprises externally existent and possible externally non-existent objects, while impossibilities are excluded from the domain of objects. By contrast, Khūnajī recognizes two domains of objects, (1) a domain including only externally existent objects, and (2) another domain including externally existent objects together with possible externally non-existent objects and impossible objects.

These two domains of objects are the result of the application of two ways of reading the subject term of a proposition. Khūnajī adopted this distinction from Fakhr al-Dīn al-Rāzī (henceforth, Rāzī).

Rāzī had raised several objections refuting Avicennian mental existence (for a brief survey see Mihirig 2024, ch. 9; Zamboni 2024, ch. 3.2). Likely as a result of these refutations, Rāzī introduced two readings of the subject term of a proposition, such as “every \(J\) is \(B\)”.

  1. The externalist reading (bi ḥasab al-khārij) where the subject term “\(J\)” refers only to \(J\)s that exist in the concrete external world. Thus “every \(J\) is \(B\)” is true if and only if all \(J\)s that exist in the external world are \(B\).
  2. The essentialist reading (bi ḥasab al-ḥaqīqa) where the subject term “\(J\)” refers to all \(J\)s, whether externally existent or not. Thus, “every \(J\) is \(B\)” is true if and only if, were \(J\)s to exist, they would be \(B\).

Yet, like Avicenna, Rāzī excludes impossibilities from the domain. In fact, Rāzī’s essentialist reading corresponds to Avicenna’s domain of objects, as it includes externally existent and possible non-existent objects.

The distinction between externalist and essentialist readings, however, does not play a crucial role in Rāzī’s logic. There are a few instances where Rāzī treats logical implications differently based on each of these readings of the subject term of a proposition, such as in his discussions of conversion. Thus, it was Rāzī who first applied a multi-domain semantics, however in a very restricted way. By contrast, Khūnajī adopted Rāzī’s externalist–essentialist distinction, modified it and applied it to almost all topics concerning the predicate logic that he discussed in his Kashf al-Asrār. Khūnajī modified Rāzī’s dual reading in four ways:

  1. Impossibilities are also included in the domain in the essentialist reading.
  2. Khūnajī explained the meaning of the essentialist reading of a proposition like “every \(J\) is \(B\)” as “whatever implies \(J\), it implies \(B\) as well” (Kashf al-Asrār, 148). This is in addition to Rāzī’s formulation that the essentialist reading of “every \(J\) is \(B\)” means “every \(J\), were it to exist, would be \(B\).”
  3. Khūnajī applied the essentialist–externalist reading not only to subject terms but also to predicate terms.
  4. Unlike Rāzī, who applied this distinction only to his account of conversion, Khūnajī applies it almost throughout his logical framework.

Before proceeding further, a few remarks are in order regarding how the essentialist reading should be understood. As mentioned above, Rāzī formulates the essentialist reading using a conditional: “Every \(J\) is \(B\)” is true in this reading if and only if, were \(J\) to exist, it would be \(B\). Based on this formulation, Fallahī (2013, 34–37) paraphrases the essentialist reading of “Every \(J\) is \(B\)” as follows:

\[\forall x((E!x \to Jx) \to (E!x \to Bx))\]

In this formula, \(E!\) is the existence predicate; thus \(E!x\) means that \(x\) exists in the external world. Fallahī interprets ‘\(\to\)’ once as material implication and once as relevance implication. As Fallahī himself shows, the above formulation, under either interpretation of \(\to\), cannot capture the implication relations between propositions that Khūnajī held to be valid. In either case, some implications that Khūnajī regarded as valid become invalid, and vice versa (these and several other formulations are discussed in Fallahī 2013, ch. 3–4).

Interpreting the essentialist reading as a conditional, however, does not seem to be completely compatible with Khūnajī’s position. Immediately after citing Rāzī’s definition, Khūnajī states that a predicative proposition in the essentialist reading should not be understood as a conditional. Moreover, impossibilities—which cannot exist—may nonetheless serve as subjects of propositions under the essentialist reading. In such cases, the above conditional becomes a counterpossible whose antecedent is never true in a normal model (setting aside the further complexities involved in the interpretation of counterpossibles). As Khūnajī explains (Kashf al-Asrār, 84):

Some may suppose that this is a conditional rather than a predicative proposition. But the falsity of this supposition is evident to anyone who understands the meaning of a predicative proposition and a connected conditional. For, upon analysis, each of the two parts is in the status of a single [item], and the second is predicated of the first, since what is asserted here is that that which has the first aspect has the second aspect.

Accordingly, Khūnajī explains the meaning of the essentialist reading of “Every \(J\) is \(B\)” as follows: whatever implies \(J\), implies \(B\) as well. This formulation reflects the truth condition for propositions in the essentialist reading. Thus, “Every human is an animal” is true because that whose essence implies humanity also implies animality. Animality belongs to the essence of the human; hence whatever is human is also an animal.

Why, then, did Rāzī formulate the essentialist reading using a conditional? One possible explanation lies in the affirmation principle. For the phoenix to be a bird in the same way that an actually existing bird is a bird, the predicate being a bird would have to exist in the phoenix, which in turn would require the existence of the phoenix itself. Yet it is nonetheless true of the nonexistent phoenix that it is a bird under the essentialist reading. In this respect, the predication involved in the essentialist reading differs from ordinary predication in the externalist reading. One way to clarify this difference is to draw inspiration from Zalta’s distinction between exemplifying and encoding properties (Zalta 1983, ch. 1; Berto 2012, ch. 6.2). While externally existing individuals exemplify their properties, merely intentional or impossible objects may instead be said to encode the properties that belong to their essence. Sherlock Holmes, for example, does not exist in the external world and therefore does not exemplify properties such as being a detective or living on Baker Street. Nevertheless, these properties belong to him as a fictional character. In this sense, Holmes may be said to encode such properties even though he does not exemplify them. If Holmes existed, he would exemplify the property of being a detective. As a merely fictional object, however, he only encodes that property.

Returning now to the externalist reading, Avicenna had explicitly rejected this reading, calling it ridiculous and flawed (Avicenna, Qiyās, 28–29). Avicenna’s main rationale was that this reading cannot lead to universal judgements, since the domain of objects existing in the external world changes, and not all instances of a predicate exist externally at all times. For Avicenna truth and falsity, as discussed previously, are properties of judgements whose components exist in the mind. There might be a time at which there are no animals but humans, and thus “Every animal is a human” is true. But this is not true in accordance with the reality in which some animals are horses, snakes, etc.

However, it is not surprising that for Khūnajī, who worked also as a judge, inferences about the external world are useful. At the end of Kashf al-Asrār, there are several examples of syllogisms concerning the laws of jurisprudence, in which syllogisms are made about externally existent objects (Kashf al-Asrār, 410–416).

Accordingly, Khūnajī applies this multi-domain semantics to all discussions of predicate logic, which is where the domain of objects has an important role. His different approaches to applying this multi-domain semantics are explained for some of the most important logical topics in the next section.

3. Logic

Khūnajī’s semantic shift provides the building blocks of the logical framework he spells out in his Kashf al-Asrār. Nevertheless, this should not undermine his importance as a pure logician. His logical system is marked by carefully crafted relations of implication between propositions and by several new logical laws that he develops and applies in his proofs.

Khūnajī’s method throughout Kashf al-Asrār reveals his distinctive logical temperament. He constantly seeks to reduce complex discussions to general and systematic principles, often concluding sections with concise summaries and abstract formulations of the rules he has established. This systematic approach shapes both the structure of his treatise and his treatment of individual logical topics.

Khūnajī’s divergence from Avicenna starts from the definition of the subject matter of the discipline of logic (for Avicenna, see Strobino 2018, §2). Logic is a discipline used as a tool in order to lead one from the known to the unknown (Avicenna, Isagoge, 29). This can be achieved in two different general ways:

  1. Conception (taṣawwur): this is attained by definition (ḥadd) and description (rasm) in which known conceptions yield unknown conceptions, for example, defining the human as the rational animal.
  2. Assertion (taṣdīq): this is attained by logical implication and truth conditions of propositions, such as cases in which an unknown true proposition is derived from previously known true propositions. These topics concern assertions (taṣdīqāt) and include discussions of contradiction, immediate implications such as conversion and contraposition, as well as absolute and modal predicative syllogisms and hypothetical syllogisms.

Avicenna distinguishes between two orders of intelligible meanings: First-order intelligibles (maʿqūlāt awwaliyya), which are roughly speaking the characteristics of objects, such as “rational,” “animal,” and the like, and second-order intelligibles (maʿqūlāt thāniya) that characterize first-order intelligibles themselves, such as “genus,” “accident,” “subject,” or “predicate.”

The second-order intelligibles involved in conceptions are the characteristics of what is used in definitions and descriptions, such as the differentia (“rational”) and the genus (“animal”) in defining a species (“human”). The second-order intelligibles in assertions are the characteristics of what is used in logical inference and truth conditions of propositions, such as “subject,” “predicate,” “premise,” and “conclusion.”

According to Avicenna, the subject matter of logic is these second-order intelligibles. In contrast to Avicenna, Khūnajī adopted a weaker definition of the subject matter of logic, according to which the subject matter of logic is conceptions and assertions. Thus, it includes other conceptions and assertions in addition to second-order intelligibles (El-Rouayheb 2012). As explained in §2.2, Khūnajī also adopted a weaker notion of a conception of which a judgement can be made. Accordingly, vacuum, which cannot be defined, since it does not have a genus, can be the subject of a true judgement. As he explained, in order to make a judgement about something one does not need to have a conception of its true nature, rather some true consideration suffices, as we saw in the example of the absolute unknown. Avicenna by contrast demands that the notion be intelligible. Recall that according to Avicenna, impossibilities such as vacuum are not intelligible and consequently are excluded from the domain of objects. Thus, this weaker, i.e. more general, notion of conception and judgement compared to those of Avicenna implies a weaker notion of assertion as well.

This shift in the scope of logic and in what may be taken as the subject of judgements forms the basis of Khūnajī’s logical contributions. What follows are his most important innovations and divergences from Avicenna (for a comprehensive overview, see Zolghadr forthcoming-a). The following list is based on the titles of the main chapters that are constantly found in the works of Arabic logicians.

3.1 Propositions

Besides his elaboration of the externalist–essentialist distinction explained in §2.2, Khūnajī’s definition of negated-predicate (sālibat al-maḥmūl) propositions constitutes his most important contribution under this heading, for these determine his approach to Avicenna’s principle of affirmation (see §2.1).

According to this principle, the subject of every true affirmative proposition must be existent. Khūnajī’s distinction between the essentialist and externalist readings of the subject term already yields two kinds of affirmative propositions whose subjects can be non-existent: “The round square is non-round” and “The round square is round.” Both propositions are true in the essentialist reading, according to which, if the round square existed, it would be both non-round and round. Thus, in the essentialist reading, the subject is assumed to exist, and consequently, the subject need not be actually existent for the affirmation to be true. It should be noted that this assumption of existence does not exclude impossibilities.

Furthermore, Khūnajī introduces a new kind of affirmative proposition, namely the negated-predicate proposition, in which the negation of the predicate is affirmed of the subject. His argument for the existence of such propositions is based on the productivity of the following syllogism (Kashf al-Asrār, 90):

(P1)
Vacuum is not existent.
(P2)
Everything that is not existent is not sensible.
(C)
Therefore, Vacuum is not sensible.

The premises (P1 and P2) and the conclusion (C) are all true, and the conclusion follows from the premises. Considering that the middle term is “not existent,” Khūnajī concludes that this is a productive syllogism in the first figure. One of the conditions for productivity in the first figure is that the minor premise must be affirmative. Therefore, P1 (“Vacuum is not existent”) is an affirmative premise.

P1 is about the external world and is true on the externalist reading; hence, it is not a deflected (maʿdūlah) proposition, that is, a proposition whose predicate is deflected so as to signify the privation of a property. Otherwise, it would be false, since the truth of an affirmative deflected proposition requires the existence of the subject. Accordingly, it is an affirmative proposition in which the negation of the predicate is affirmed of the subject. Khūnajī calls such propositions negated-predicate propositions (Daşdemir 2026).

As we saw in the example above, affirmative negated-predicate propositions can be true without the existence of their subjects. Thus, Avicenna’s affirmation principle does not apply to negated-predicate propositions, whether in the externalist or in the essentialist reading. According to Khūnajī, then, there are four kinds of affirmative propositions for which the affirmation principle does not hold: essentialist positive (muḥaṣṣal), deflected, and negated-predicate propositions, as well as externalist negated-predicate propositions.

3.2 De re and de dicto Modality

Avicenna had already distinguished between de re and de dicto modalities (al-ʿIbāra, 114–115). He calls the de re modality “the mode of predication” (jiha lil-ḥaml), and the de dicto modality “the mode of the quantifier” (jiha lil-sūr). His examples are as follows:

De re: Every human is possibly a writer.

De dicto: It is possible that every human is a writer.

The meaning of the first proposition is that each human, taken individually, could be a writer. By contrast, the second proposition means that all humans, taken collectively, could be writers. As Avicenna explains, the difference in meaning between the two is evident: no one doubts the former, whereas the latter seems impossible to some. Recognizing this distinction, Avicenna holds that the de re modality is the genuine one. He argues that modality is a quality of the predication relation and, therefore, modifies the predication rather than the quantification. Accordingly, the modal operator (or mode = jiha) must be placed adjacent to the copula, which Avicenna calls its “natural place.”

Avicenna does not appear to be particularly interested in the implication relations between the de re and de dicto modalities. Nevertheless, on Ṭūsī’s interpretation of a passage from Ishārāt (97), it is assumed that Avicenna would endorse the Barcan formula and its converse (Sharḥ, 170). However, Rāzī and Taḥtānī disagree with Ṭūsī’s interpretation (Rāzī, Sharḥ Ishārāt; Taḥtānī, Muḥākamāt, 170–171; for more discussions see Fallahi 2019; Hodges 2023; Zolghadr 2025).

Unlike Avicenna, Khūnajī explicitly discusses the implication relations between the de re and de dicto modalities, by considering the two readings of the subject term of a predicative proposition, namely the externalist and the essentialist (Kashf al-Asrār, 110–111). Accordingly, Khūnajī argues that in the essentialist reading, the following implications hold:

  1. \(\Diamond \forall x Fx \Rightarrow \forall x\Diamond Fx\)
  2. \(\exists x \Diamond Fx \Leftrightarrow \Diamond \exists x Fx\)
  3. \(\exists x\Diamond \neg Fx \Leftrightarrow \Diamond \exists x\neg Fx\)
  4. \(\exists x \Box \neg Fx \Rightarrow \Box \exists x\neg Fx\)
  5. \(\forall x\Box \neg Fx \Leftrightarrow \Box \forall x \neg Fx\)

(1) is known as the Buridan formula and is equivalent to (4). (5) is the Barcan formula and its converse and is equivalent to (2) (for a detailed discussion, see Zolghadr 2025).

The invalidity of the above implications in the externalist reading is due to the variable domain of the externally existent objects. Suppose there is a time at which no animal exists except humans. Under this assumption, it is true that “every animal is necessarily a human,” but it is not true that “necessarily, every animal is a human” (Kashf al-Asrār, 111).

3.3 Hypotheticals and the Principles of Connexivity

According to Avicenna, and other Arabic logicians following him, there are two kinds of hypotheticals (sharṭiyyāt):

(1)

Conditional (literally: connective hypothetical=sharṭiyya muttaṣila): in the form of “if \(p\), then \(q\)”. Conditionals are of two kinds themselves based on the relation between their antecedent and consequent:

(1.1)
Implicative (luzūmiyya) conditional: there is a relation between the antecedent and the consequent such that the truth of the antecedent necessitates the truth of the consequent. Thus, \(p\to q\) is true in this sense if and only if there is a special necessary relation between \(p\) and \(q\), and it is not the case that \(p\) is true and \(q\) is false. Arabic logicians give the following examples of such necessary relations (Avicenna, Qiyās, 233–234):
(i)
\(p\) is the cause for \(q\), e.g., “if the sun is shining, then day exists.”
(ii)
\(q\) is an inseparable effect (caused) of \(p\), e.g., “if day exists, then the sun is shining.”
(iii)
\(p\) and \(q\) are both caused by the same cause, e.g. “if there is thunder, then there is lightning” (both are caused by the movement of the wind through clouds).
(iv)
There is a correlation between the two, e.g. “if Zayd is the father of ʿAmr, then ʿAmr is the child of Zayd.”
(1.2)
Coincidental (ittifāqiyya) conditional: this is an extensional connective and has two interpretations:
(i)
“If \(p\) then \(q\)” is true if and only if the consequent is true. This is called the general or weak coincidental conditional.
(ii)
“If \(p\) then \(q\)” is true if and only if both \(p\) and \(q\) are true, merely coinciding with one another.

In neither case is there any implicative relation between the two sides.

Avicenna used both definitions of coincidental conditionals. According to Khūnajī, Avicenna confuses the two definitions and in various places, in particular in hypothetical syllogisms, tried to resolve the confusion by considering both definitions separately (Kashf al-Asrār, 323–327).

(2)
Disjunctive (literally: disjunctive hypothetical=sharṭiyya munfaṣila) which is roughly similar to what we know as a disjunctive proposition. There are three different kinds of disjunctives according to Arabic logicians based on their truth conditions:
(i)
Real (haqīqiyya) disjunction: the two propositions cannot be both true or both false. Consequently, if a real disjunction holds between two propositions, either they are contradictory, or one is equivalent to the contradictory of the other.
(ii)
Exclusive disjunction (māniʿ al-jamʿ): the two propositions cannot be true together. Consequently, if the exclusive disjunction holds between two propositions, one implies the contradictory of the other.
(iii)
Inclusive disjunction (māniʿ al-khuluww): the two propositions cannot be false together. Consequently, if the inclusive disjunction holds between two propositions, the contradictory of one implies the other.

In the above explanations of these kinds of disjunctions some notion of necessity is assumed (i.e. the propositions cannot be true or false together). In this case, the disjunction is called oppositional (ʿinādiyya). If no necessity is assumed the disjunction is coincidental.

Khūnajī’s most important contribution on this topic is his rejection of the principles of connexivity, which consist of the following principles that are nowadays known as Aristotle’s theses and Boethius’ theses (see Wansing 2023):

Aristotle’s theses: \(\neg (\neg A \to A)\) and \(\neg (A \to \neg A) \)

Boethius’ theses: \( (A \to B) \to \neg (A \to \neg B)\) and \( (A \to \neg B) \to \neg (A \to B) \)

In particular, Khūnajī rejects the following equivalence that Avicenna held to be valid. (Avicenna (Qiyās, 366–367) in fact considers the implication of (b) from (a), though Khūnajī ascribes the equivalence between (a) and (b) to Avicenna in Kashf al-Asrār, 208.)

  1. Never: if \(p\) then \(q\).
  2. Always: if \(p\) then not-\(q\)

The equivalence between the two indicates a different form of Boethius’ theses: roughly, that no contradictory pair follows from the same antecedent. Khūnajī’s main argument is that reductio arguments provide counterexamples to this equivalence (El-Rouayheb 2009; Zolghadr forthcoming-b). Roughly speaking, in reductio arguments, the contradictory of the conclusion is assumed together with one or more premises, and these yield the contradictory of a premise. For example, consider the proof of Cesare in the second figure (El-Rouayheb 2009, 211):

  1. Every \(J\) is \(B\).
  2. No \(A\) is \(B\).
  3. No \(J\) is \(A\).

The reductio argument that proves the productivity of this syllogism assumes the contradictory of the conclusion:

  1. Some \(J\) is \(A\).

The reductio argument consists of three premises: (i), (ii), and (iv). (ii) and (iv) imply “Some \(J\) is not \(B\),” and (i) implies itself, that is “Every \(J\) is \(B\).” Thus, (i), (ii), and (iv) imply a contradictory pair.

Nevertheless, this objection does not seem to work in the way Khūnajī intends. According to Avicenna, in syllogisms that yield contradictory conclusions—such as reductio arguments or those refuting an opponent’s position—the truth of the premises is assumed, even though the premises are not true in reality. The conclusion in such syllogisms is binding for whoever has assumed the premises to be true (Hodges 2017; Zolghadr 2021). In the above example, the implication of the contradictory pair is binding for one who assumes the truth of (iv). In the light of the notion of binding, the disagreement between Khūnajī and Avicenna on the implication of the contradictory pair largely disappears. For Avicenna as well, a contradictory pair is implied by a single set of premises. Nonetheless, these premises cannot be true in Avicenna’s logic—unlike in Khūnajī’s logic—but their truth can be assumed (Avicenna, Qiyās, 297).

Furthermore, Khūnajī argues that there is a particular implication between any two contradictory pairs, as a result of the productivity of Darapti in hypothetical syllogisms (Kashf al-Asrār, 319–320, 415). This can be interpreted as Khūnajī’s rejection of Aristotle’s theses (Street and Zolghadr forthcoming).

The rejection of the principles of connexivity results in different implications between hypotheticals. As mentioned above, each disjunctive hypothetical is equivalent to a conditional. Khūnajī deferred his discussion of implications between hypotheticals to a separate treatise on hypotheticals that he intended to write. It seems, however, that he never wrote this work. Thus, Khūnajī does not present a fully developed account of hypotheticals in Kashf al-Asrār, and we cannot know his view on implications between hypotheticals. Nevertheless, he discusses these implications based on his predecessors’ views, that is, on the assumption of the validity of the connexive principles (Zolghadr forthcoming-a, ch. 6). His rejection of these principles had a significant impact on later Arabic logic (El-Rouayheb 2009).

3.4 Conversion and Contraposition

Khūnajī’s account of the immediate implications between propositions is heavily based on his multi-domain semantics and is, consequently, very different from that of his predecessors, in particular Avicenna. He adopts two distinct approaches to conversion and contraposition. In conversion, each proposition is interpreted either entirely in the externalist reading or entirely in the essentialist reading. Thus, both the subject and the predicate of the original proposition, and of its converse, belong to a single domain. In contrast, in contraposition he also allows for propositions in which the subject belongs to one domain while the predicate belongs to the other.

Conversion is to exchange the positions of the subject and the predicate of a proposition. Khūnajī’s discussion of conversion is the first instance where he explicitly introduces the inclusion of impossible objects into the essentialist domain (Kashf al-Asrār, 129–130; for a translation and a commentary on the whole chapter, see Street 2014).

Arabic logicians before Khūnajī maintained that temporal-necessity universal negative propositions are not convertible. A standard counterexample is: “No moon is eclipsed by necessity at the time of quadrature” (“eclipse” here refers to “lunar-eclipse”). If this were convertible, its converse would be “Some lunar-eclipsed is not a moon,” which is impossible. By accepting the objecthood of the lunar-eclipsed-which-is-not-a-moon in the essentialist reading, Khūnajī argues for the validity of the conversion of such universal negative propositions (and similarly for their weaker counterparts, such as spread-necessity propositions, the two possibility propositions, the two existential propositions, and absolute propositions) (Kashf al-Asrār, 130; Street 2014, 469).

Khūnajī adopts a significantly more complex approach to contraposition. First, we will review his revision of the definition of contraposition, and then his approach will be illustrated with an example. Avicenna had defined contraposition as the replacement of the subject with the contradictory of the predicate and the predicate with the contradictory of the subject (Avicenna Qiyās, 93–94; for more details on Avicenna’s account of contraposition see Fallahi 2018). Following Rāzī (Mulakhkhaṣ, 200–201), Khūnajī rejects Avicenna’s definition by showing that it cannot be applied to his own account of contraposition. One of the arguments is simply that Avicenna is not consistent in applying his definition of contraposition. According to Avicenna, “No human is a stone” is contraposed as “Something that is not a stone is a human” (Avicenna, Qiyas, 94), where obviously the predicate itself and not its contradictory has been used. After rejecting the definitions proposed by Abū al-Barakāt al-Baghdādī and Afḍal al-Dīn al-Bāmyānī, Khūnajī offers his own definition of contraposition (Kashf al-Asrār, 147–148): “predicating the subject or its contradictory of the contradictory of the predicate,” while preserving the quality of the proposition.

The propositions whose contrapositions Khūnajī discusses are either absolutely externalist or absolutely essentialist, meaning that both the subject and the predicate belong to the same domain. However, the contrapositives he considers may have a subject belonging to one domain and a predicate belonging to another. Furthermore, he considers both the deflected and the negated subject or predicate when forming the contradictory of the subject or the predicate of the original proposition. In addition to all this, Khūnajī considers both negative and affirmative contrapositives, since the preservation of quality is not a condition in contraposition (their definitions and their implicative relations: Kashf al-Asrār, 149–158).

Khūnajī also introduces another distinction, likely for the first time in Arabic logic and philosophy: He understands “every \(J\) is \(B\)” as “everything that is \(J\) is \(B\),” a formulation that involves two predications: first, \(J\) is predicated of an object, and then \(B\) is predicated of the object that is \(J\). Khūnajī himself did not assign names to these two predications; however, later Arabic logicians called the former “stipulative bond” (ʿaqd al-waḍʿ) and the latter “predicative bond” (ʿaqd al-ḥaml).

A mode qualifies the predication relation. Thus, two modes can be considered here: one qualifies the predication of \(J\) and the other the predication of \(B\). In contraposition, it is important to consider both, since the stipulative bond becomes the predicative bond in the contrapositive. Khūnajī is the first to recognize this. Accordingly, he considers two cases in each contraposition: (i) the mode of the stipulative bond is the same as the modality of the proposition, and (ii) the mode of the stipulative bond is absoluteness (Kashf al-Asrār, 158, 162; for absoluteness, see Strobino 2018, §3.1.1).

Khūnajī’s account of the contraposition of an absolute proposition in the externalist reading, i.e. “Every \(J\) is \(B\),” will clarify these points. For simplicity, consider the proposition as “Every external \(J\) is an external \(B\).” The modality of the proposition is absoluteness, namely that every \(J\) is \(B\) at least once. Suppose that the mode of the stipulative bond is also absoluteness. The contradictory of absoluteness is perpetuity, and thus, the mode of perpetuity will be used in the contraposition.

Accordingly, the contrapositives of “every external \(J\) is an external \(B\)” are as follows (for simplicity, I only present the negative contrapositives, Kashf al-Asrār, 158–161):

  • Nothing that is always non-\(B\) in the external world is ever \(J\) in the external world.
  • Nothing that never implies \(B\) is perpetually \(J\) in the external world.
  • Nothing that is perpetually non-\(B\) in the external world is perpetually \(J\) in the external world.
  • Nothing that perpetually implies non-\(B\) is perpetually \(J\) in the external world.
  • Nothing that is perpetually non-\(B\) in the external world implies \(J\) perpetually.

These examples show the complexities that Khūnajī navigates in this discussion. He also examines the implication relations between all these complex propositions and attempts to formulate general rules based on them (for the details of the whole discussion, see Zolghadr forthcoming-a, ch. 5).

3.5 Predicative Syllogisms: Absolute and Modal

Predicative syllogisms are first discussed absolutely, that is, under the mode of absoluteness (iṭlāq) (Street 2013; Strobino, 2018, §3.1.1). An absolute proposition is true only if the predicate is true of the subject at least once. Khūnajī endorsed the more refined definition presented by Rāzī, according to which a syllogism (whether predicative or propositional) is a discourse composed of propositions that, when assumed, imply in themselves another proposition. (For more on Avicenna’s, Rāzī’s, and Khūnajī’s definitions of syllogism and the doubts they raised, see Adamson et al., 2025, ch. 9.; for Avicenna’s modal syllogistic see Thom 2008; Strobino and Thom 2016.) The discussion of syllogisms, taking their premises absolutely, lays the ground for the more complex discussion of predicative syllogisms where the modalities of premises, which may differ from one another, are taken into account. These modal syllogisms are called “mixed syllogisms” (mukhtaliṭāt).

Khūnajī’s main divergence from Avicenna in predicative syllogisms is in his account of modal syllogisms. What distinguishes Khūnajī’s account of mixed syllogisms from Avicenna’s is his application of the externalist reading. The external world is not a constant domain of objects, since the attributes of objects and what exists externally vary over time. This stands in contrast to the fixed domain of objects presupposed in Avicenna’s account of mixed syllogisms (for more details, see Zolghadr forthcoming-a, ch. 8; for a review of the most important aspects of it see El-Rouayheb 2010 and Zolghadr forthcoming-c; for Avicenna, see Chatti 2014 and 2016).

What best showcases Khūnajī’s distinctive account is the condition of the actuality of the minor premise in the first figure that he introduced, where actuality is in the external world. This became the main point of discussion in modal syllogisms between the revisionist and the orthodox Avicennian logicians (for details, see Street 2024, 238–244; Adamson et al. 2025, ch. 10).

According to Avicenna, the syllogism

Every \(J\) is possibly \(B\).
Every \(B\) is necessarily \(A\).
\(\vdash \) Every \(J\) is necessarily \(A\).

is productive (Qiyās, 202). Khūnajī rejects the productivity of this syllogism by presenting a counterexample. Suppose Zayd, for whatever reason, only rides donkeys. Although it is possible that he rides horses, there is in fact no horse among his mounts. Now consider a syllogism consisting of the following two premises, interpreted according to the externalist reading: “Every horse is possibly a mount for Zayd,” and “Every mount for Zayd is necessarily a donkey.” If Avicenna were right about the productivity of such a syllogism, the conclusion would be “Every horse is necessarily a donkey,” which is obviously false.

It is too hasty to take this example as an objection to Avicenna, since Avicenna and Khūnajī are considering two different domains of objects. Based on Khūnajī’s externalist reading, “every mount for Zayd” refers to the mounts for Zayd that exist externally, i.e. Zayd’s actual mounts, which are donkeys. However, for Avicenna, as we have seen before, subject terms refer to mental entities. These mental entities can be actual not in the external world, but rather in the mind. This is why Avicenna, in proving the productivity of this syllogism, assumes the actuality of what is possible, i.e. the actuality of a horse being a mount for Zayd (for details, see El-Rouayheb 2010, xi–xlv). Thus, once again, the difference in semantics results in a difference in the validity of the argument. Since Khūnajī’s entire account of modal syllogisms is based on the externalist reading, such differences appear in the productivity of other moods and figures as well. When it comes to the essentialist reading of modal syllogisms, however, Khūnajī pauses and explicitly expresses his uncertainty (Kashf al-Asrār, 275).

3.6 Hypothetical Syllogisms

Hypothetical syllogisms are Avicenna’s innovation, resulting from his combination of Stoic propositional logic with Aristotle’s syllogistic. The general definition of syllogisms that we discussed in the section on predicative syllogisms applies here as well. However, instead of predicative propositions alone, the premises may also be conditionals or disjunctives. Accordingly, instead of a middle term, there will, where appropriate, be a middle proposition. When quantifiers are applied to a hypothetical, they quantify over times, assumptions, or situations, for which Avicenna employed only temporal terms (Avicenna, Qiyās, VI, I–V).

This is a form of hypothetical syllogism in the first mood of the first figure composed only of conditionals:

Whenever: if \(p\) then \(q\),
Whenever: if \(q\) then \(r\),
Therefore: Whenever: if \(p\) then \(r\).

Among all the topics that Khūnajī discusses in his Kashf al-Asrār, his discussion of hypothetical syllogisms is the lengthiest. A rough summary of Khūnajī’s contribution to this topic is as follows (for details, see Zolghadr forthcoming-a, ch. 9).

Khūnajī critically revised Avicenna’s account of syllogisms involving conditionals, in which the premises are a mix of coincidental and implicative conditionals. As noted earlier, Khūnajī argues that Avicenna was inconsistent in his use of the coincidental conditional, sometimes applying the weaker definition and at other times the stronger version.

Avicenna addressed a doubt about hypothetical syllogisms by considering a counterpossible as one of the premises (Avicenna, Qiyās, 296–297; El-Rouayheb 2025a). The syllogism runs as follows:

Always: if two is odd, then two is a number,
Always: if two is a number, then it is even,
Therefore: Always: if two is odd, then it is even.

The conclusion is obviously false. Avicenna replied to this doubt as follows: Since the antecedent of the minor premise is impossible, it cannot be true, and thus, the minor premise is false and the syllogism is not productive. Therefore, no counterpossible is true.

Khūnajī replies to this doubt by considering a revised version of this syllogism, this time a Darapti in the third figure (Kashf al-Asrār, 319–320):

Always: if a donkey is a horse, then it is an animal,
Always: if a donkey is a horse, then it neighs,
Therefore: At least once: if a donkey is an animal, then it neighs.

The conclusion cannot be true in the external world, but the syllogism is productive in the essentialist reading. In this reading, the conclusion is true. The antecedent is true at some time in some impossible situation or assumption. Accordingly, Khūnajī introduces some impossible situations in which an impossibility holds.

The productivity of Darapti in hypothetical syllogisms and the inclusion of impossibilities entails a bi-implication between any two contradictories (for the reception of this implication by later Arabic logicians see Street & Zolghadr forthcoming).

Khūnajī elaborates on the difference between coincidental and implicative conditionals by making a distinction between situations and assumptions.

Khūnajī discusses a type of hypothetical syllogism that Avicenna never considered, namely syllogisms from conditionals in which the middle term is not a complete part of at least one premise. In this discussion, Khūnajī raises several objections to Zayn al-Dīn al-Kashshī (d. 1221), an influential post-Avicennian logician who was probably a student of Rāzī. This shows that this type of hypothetical syllogism had already been examined before him. (On Kashshī, see El-Rouayheb 2019, 41-42.) An example of such a syllogism is as follows:

Always: if every \(A\) is \(B\), then \(JD\),
Always: if every \(B\) is \(H\), then \(WZ\),
Therefore: At least once: if (at least once: every \(A\) is \(H\), then \(JD\)), then (at least once: if every \(A\) is \(H\), then \(WZ\)) (Kashf al-Asrār, 333).

Arguments for the productivity of such complex syllogisms perhaps best illustrate the distinctive technical sophistication that characterizes Khūnajī’s logic. His proofs are based on logical laws that he was likely the first to introduce among Arabic logicians. Two of these laws stand out for their extensive use in his proofs: the laws of conditional introduction and absorption, expressed in the form \(p \to q \Rightarrow p \to (p \amp q)\) (Zolghadr forthcoming-a, ch. 9).

At the end of his discussions of hypothetical syllogisms, Khūnajī presents nine doubts as to the validity of these syllogisms. Five of these nine doubts pertain to syllogisms involving jurisprudential laws. Leaving the doubts and his replies to them aside, here we find several examples of hypotheticals, interpreted according to the externalist reading, that involve jurisprudential laws. Recall that Khūnajī was a judge, and it is not a surprise that his account of the externalist reading finds its natural application in these contexts where the truth of propositions depends on external circumstances and temporal conditions.

This has not been a comprehensive account of Khūnajī’s logical contributions, but it highlights some of the most important aspects of his logic based on his revisionary semantics.

4. Khūnajī’s Legacy

Kashf al-Asrār is full of proofs and argumentations, many of which employ the essentialist reading. It did not take long for Arabic logicians to realize that Khūnajī’s logic, particularly where the essentialist reading is applied, collapses. It should be noted that Khūnajī himself had already anticipated something along these lines, though not in connection with predicative propositions but rather with conditionals (Kashf al-Asrār, 320).

It was Abharī who first argued that in Khūnajī’s essentialist reading all universal propositions are false and all particular propositions are true (Abharī, Khulāṣa, 177–178; Street 2014). Recall that Khūnajī allows us to combine any mafhūm with any other mafhūm and thereby form a legitimate subject for a true proposition in the essentialist reading. Accordingly, for any arbitrary \(J\) and \(B\), it is true that “Some \(J\) is \(B\),” and thus its contradictory, “No \(J\) is \(B\),” is false.

About the affirmative universal proposition, Abharī considers two cases (for details, see Zolghadr forthcoming-b):

  1. The predicate is not part of the essence of the subject. Consider the following syllogism in Darapti:

    Every \(J\) & non-\(B\) is \(J\),
    Every \(J\) & non-\(B\) is non-\(B\),
    Therefore: Some \(J\) is non-\(B\).

A \(J\) that is non-\(B\) may imply \(B\) or not imply \(B\), for impossibility implies impossibility. If it does not imply \(B\), then “Every \(J\) is \(B\)” is false. In this case, the truth of the universal proposition cannot be acquired with certainty.

  1. The predicate is part of the essence of the subject:

    Animality is part of the essence of human. In this case, the proposition “Every human is an animal” is true. Now, imagine a human that is not an animal. Thus, it will be true that “Some human is not an animal,” which must imply the falsity of its contradictory, namely “every human is an animal.”

Later Arabic logicians, such as Kātibī and Taḥtānī, employed a simplified version of the above objection: For any arbitrary \(J\) and \(B\), it is true that “some \(J\) is not \(B\),” and thus its contradictory, namely “Every \(J\) is \(B\),” is false (Kātibī, Sharḥ, fol. 77b; Taḥtānī, Taḥrīr, 193; for Ṭūsī’s elaboration on Abharī’s argument see Ṭūsī, Taʿdīl, 162–163).

The falsity of all universal propositions is not a welcome consequence. For one thing, no universal proposition in the essentialist reading can be used as an affirmative premise in a syllogism. Recall that in all four figures, at least one premise must be universal for the syllogisms to be productive. Thus, all demonstrative reasoning fails.

Consequently, Abharī restricted the essentialist domain to possibilities. At the same time, however, he introduced a new reading of the subject term of a proposition, namely the mental proposition (qaḍiyya dhihniyya), in which the subject exists in the mind (Abharī, Khulāṣa, 178). Accordingly, the meaning of “Every \(J\) is \(B\)” in this reading is that what is \(J\) in the mind is \(B\) in the mind. In contrast to Avicenna, Abharī accepts the existence of impossibilities in the mind. Many later Arabic logicians, among whom the most notable are Kātibī and Samarqandī, followed Abharī in adopting this three-domain framework (Kātibī, Jāmiʿ, 152; Samarqandī, Qisṭās, 253). This allowed them to construct syllogisms within a domain that includes externally non-existent objects in addition to externally existent ones, though only possible ones. Whenever a syllogism was needed to address impossibilities, the mental reading could be applied.

These developments nevertheless did not diminish Khūnajī’s influence on the subsequent logical tradition. Many of the innovations first articulated in Kashf al-Asrār were taken up by later logicians and incorporated into influential textbooks, most notably Najm al-Dīn al-Kātibī’s Shamsiyya, Sirāj al-Dīn al-Urmawī’s Maṭāliʿ, and Saʿd al-Dīn al-Taftāzānī’s Tahdhīb al-manṭiq, which became standard manuals of logic throughout much of the eastern Islamic world. In the Maghrib, Khūnajī’s own epitome al-Jumal likewise served as a widely studied handbook of advanced logic and continued to be taught there for centuries (El-Rouayheb 2010, xlviii–l).

Khūnajī’s multi-domain semantics and his account of the objecthood of the impossible also influenced later developments in metaphysics. For examples of this influence in the works of Jalāl al-Dīn al-Dawānī (d. 1502), one of the philosophers of the Shiraz school, see El-Rouayheb 2025b; a broader survey can be found in Ibrahim 2025.

Bibliography

Primary literature

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  • [Qiyās] Shifā, al-Manṭiq, al-Qiyās, edited by S. Zāyid, Cairo: al-Hayʾa al-ʿāmma li-šuʾūn al-maṭābiʿ al-amīriyya, 1964.
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  • [Ilāhiyyāt] The Metaphysics of The Healing: A Parallel English–Arabic Text (al-Ilāhiyyāt min al-Shifāʾ), translated and annotated by Michael E. Marmura, Provo, UT: Brigham Young University Press, 2004.
  • [Ishārāt] Al-Ishārāt wa al-Tanbīhāt, edited by Mujtabā Zāriʿī, Tehran: Būstān-i kitāb, 2008.
  • [Taʿlīqāt] Al-Taʿlīqāt, edited by Sayyid Ḥusayn Mūsaviyān, 2nd edition, Tehran: Iranian Institute of Philosophy, 2022.

Kātibī, Najm al-Dīn:

  • [Sharḥ] Sharḥ Kashf al-Asrār, MS: Süleymaniye Kütüphanesi, Istanbul, Carullah 1418.
  • [Jāmiʿ ] Jāmiʿ al-daqāʾiq fī kashf al-ḥaqāʾiq, edited by F. Özpilavcı, Istanbul: Matsis, 2022.
  • [Sharḥ Jumal] Sharḥ Jumal al-Khūnajī fī al-Manṭiq, edited by Ismāʿīl b. Aḥmad Sharrād, Kuwait: Dār al-Ḍiyāʾ; Cairo: ʿIlm li-Iḥyāʾ al-Turāth, 2024.

Khūnajī, Afḍal al-Dīn:

  • [Kashf al-Asrār] Kashf al-asrār ʿan ghawāmiḍ al-afkār, edited by K. El-Rouayheb, Berlin & Tehran: Institute for Islamic Studies & Iranian Institute of Islamic Philosophy, 2010.
  • [Talkhīṣ] Talkhīṣ al-Maṭālib al-ʿāliyya, edited by A. M. Ismāʿīl and M. Ḍarghām, Cairo: Iḥyāʾ Center for Research and Studies, 2019.

Ibn Wāṣil:

  • [Sharḥ] Commentary on the Jumal on Logic by Khūnajī, edited by Khaled El-Rouayheb, Leiden and Boston: Brill, 2022.

Rāzī, Fakhr al-Dīn:

  • [Mulakhkhaṣ] al-Mulakhkhaṣ: al-Manṭiq, edited by A. Qarāmalkī and A. Ashgarīnizhād, Tehran: Dānishgāh-i Imām Ṣādiq, 2003.
  • [Sharḥ Ishārāt] Sharḥ al-Ishārāt wa l-Tanbīhāt, edited by A. Najafzadeh, Tehran: Anjuman-i Āthār wa Mafākhir-i Farhangī, 2005.

Samarqandī, Shams al-Dīn:

  • [Qisṭās] Qisṭās al-afkār fī al-manṭiq, edited by A. Fallahi, Tehran: Iranian Institute of Islamic Philosophy, 2020.

Taḥtānī, Quṭb al-Dīn al-Rāzī:

  • [Muḥākamāt] al-Muḥākamāt bayna Sharḥay al-Ishārāt wa-l-Tanbīhāt, in Sharḥ al-Ishārāt wa-l-Tanbīhāt, with footnotes, Qom: Nashr al-Balāghah, 1996.
  • [Taḥrīr] Taḥrīr al-qawāʿid al-manṭiqiyya bi-sharḥ al-risāla al-Shamsiyya, edited by I. Qabalan, Beirut: Dar al-Kotob al-ilmiyah, 2014.

Ṭūsī, Naṣīr al-Dīn:

  • [Taʿdīl] Taʿdīl al-miʿyār fī naqd tanzīl al-afkār, in M. Mohaghegh & T. Izutsu (eds.), Collected Papers on Logic and Language, Tehran: Institute of Islamic Studies, 1974, 139–248.
  • [Sharḥ] Sharḥ al-Ishārāt, printed with Ibn Sīnā’s al-Išārāt wa l-Tanbīhāt, Vol. 1, Qom: Nashr al-balāghah, 1996.

Secondary literature

  • Adamson, Peter, Benevich, Fedor, and Klinger, Dustin, 2025, The Heirs of Avicenna: Philosophy in the Islamic East, 12–13th Centuries, Logic and Epistemology, Leiden: Brill.
  • Berto, Francesco, 2012, Existence as a Real Property: The Ontology of Meinongianism, Dordrecht: Synthèse Library, Springer.
  • Chatti, Saloua, 2014, “Avicenna on Possibility and Necessity”, History and Philosophy of Logic, 35(4): 332–353.
  • –––, 2016, “Existential Import in Avicenna’s Modal Logic”, Arabic Sciences and Philosophy, 26(1): 45–71.
  • Daşdemir, Yusuf, 2026, “Propositions with Negative Predicates in Arabic Logic”, History and Philosophy of Logic, 47(2): 217–235.
  • El-Rouayheb, Khaled, 2009, “Impossible Antecedents and their Consequences: Some Thirteenth-Century Arabic Discussions”, History and Philosophy of Logic, 30: 209–225.
  • –––, 2010, “Introduction” to Khūnajī, Kashf al-Asrār.
  • –––, 2012, “Post-Avicennan Logicians on the Subject Matter of Logic: Some Thirteenth—and Fourteenth—Century Discussions”, Arabic Sciences and Philosophy, 22(1): 69–90.
  • –––, 2016, “Arabic Logic after Avicenna”, in Catarina Dutilh-Novaes and Stephen Read (eds.), The Cambridge Companion to Medieval Logic, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 67–93.
  • –––, 2019, The Development of Arabic Logic, Basel: Schwabe.
  • –––, 2020, “The Liar Paradox in Fifteenth-Century Shiraz: The Exchange between Ṣadr al-Dīn al-Dashtakī and Jalāl al-Dīn al-Dawānī”, British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 28(2): 251–275.
  • –––, 2022, “Introduction” to Ibn Wāṣil al-Ḥamawī, Commentary on the Jumal on Logic by Khūnajī, ed. Khaled El-Rouayheb, Leiden: Brill.
  • –––, 2025a, “A Problem with the Wholly Hypothetical Syllogism: Some 13th-Century Arabic Discussions”, in Asad Q. Ahmed et al. (eds.) Logic, Soul, and World, Leiden: Brill.
  • –––, 2025b, “Qūshjī (d. 1474) and Dawānī (d. 1502) on Truth and Correspondence”, Journal of the History of Philosophy, 63(2): 191–208.
  • Fallahi, Asadollah, 2013, Mantiq-i Khūnajī (The Logic of al-Khūnajī), Tehran: Iranian Institute of Philosophy.
  • –––, 2018, “Fārābī and Avicenna on Contraposition”, History and Philosophy of Logic, 40(1): 22–41.
  • –––, 2019, “Evaluating the Attribution of Buridan and Barcan Formulas to Ibn Sina in Sinavi Logic”, Falsafa wa Kalām-i Islāmī, 51(2): 261–278.
  • –––, 2023, “Early Arabic Logicians on the Contraposition of the Particular Affirmative”, British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 31(3): 382–404.
  • Hodges, Wilfrid, 2012, “Affirmative and Negative in Ibn Sīnā,” in C. Dutilh Novaes and O. Thomassen Hjortland (eds.), Insolubles and Consequences: Essays in Honour of Stephen Read, London: College Publications, 119–134.
  • –––, 2017, “Ibn Sīnā on reductio ad absurdum”, Review of Symbolic Logic, 10(3): 587–601.
  • –––, 2023, “How did Avicenna Understand the Barcan Formulas?”, Logic Journal of the IGPL, 31(6): 1170–1191.
  • Ibrahim, Bilal, 2025, “The Extension of Reality”, Arabic Sciences and Philosophy, 35 (1): 107–151.
  • Janos, Damien, 2020, Avicenna on the Ontology of Pure Quiddity, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Mihirig, Abdurrahman Ali, 2024, The Problem of Non-existence in Islamic Philosophy, PhD dissertation, defended on November 4, LMU Munich.
  • Mousavian, Seyed N., 2022, “Avicenna on Talking about Nothing”, in Juhana Toivanen (ed.) Forms of Representation in the Aristotelian Tradition, Leiden: Brill.
  • –––, 2023, “Avicenna on the Impossibilia: The Letter on the Soul Revisited”, Arabic Sciences and Philosophy, 33(2): 163–213.
  • Street, Tony, 2013, “Avicenna on the Syllogism”, in Peter Adamson (ed.), Interpreting Avicenna: Critical Essays, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 48–70.
  • –––, 2014, “Afḍal al-Dīn al-Khūnajī (d. 1248) on the Conversion of Modal Propositions”, Oriens, 42(3–4): 454–513.
  • –––, 2024, Najm al-Dīn al-Kātibī’s al-Risālah al-Shamsiyyah: An Edition and Translation with Commentary, Abu Dhabi: NYU Press.
  • Street, Tony, and Behnam Zolghadr, forthcoming, “Gelenbevī on Kātibī’s Sofistry”, in Yasser Qureshy (ed.), Ismā’īl Gelenbevī: The Life, Works, and Thought of an 18th Century Ottoman Polymath, Leiden: De Gruyter Brill.
  • Strobino, Riccardo, 2018, “Ibn Sina’s Logic”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Fall 2018 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/fall2018/entries/ibn-sina-logic/>.
  • Strobino, Riccardo, and Paul Thom, 2016, “The Logic of Modality”, in Catarina Dutilh-Novaes and Stephen Read (eds.), The Cambridge Companion to Medieval Logic, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 342–369.
  • Thom, Paul, 2008, “Logic and Metaphysics in Avicenna’s Modal Syllogistic”, in Shahid Rahman, Tony Street, and Hassan Tahiri (eds.), The Unity of Science in the Arabic Tradition (Logic, Epistemology, and The Unity of Science, vol. 11), Dordrecht: Springer, 361–376.
  • Wansing, Heinrich, 2023, “Connexive Logic”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2023 Edition), Edward N. Zalta and Uri Nodelman (eds.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2023/entries/logic-connexive/>.
  • Zalta, Edward N., 1983, Abstract Objects: An Introduction to Axiomatic Metaphysics, Dordrecht: Reidel.
  • Zamboni, Francesco Omar, 2024, At the Roots of Causality, Ontology and Aetiology from Avicenna to Fakhr al-Dīn al-Rāzī, Leiden: Brill.
  • Zolghadr, Behnam, 2021, “Avicenna on Syllogisms from Opposite Premises”, in M. Mojtahedi et al. (eds.), Mathematics, Logic, and Their Philosophies, Dordrecht: Springer.
  • –––, 2025, “Avicenna and al-Khūnajī on de re and de dicto Modality”, British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 33(4): 741–755.
  • –––, forthcoming-a, The Logic of Afḍal al-Dīn al-Khūnajī, Leiden: Brill.
  • –––, forthcoming-b, “Al-Khūnajī on Essentialist and Externalist Propositions and Inferences from the Impossible”, Inquiry.
  • –––, forthcoming-c, “Avicenna and Khūnajī on Mixed Syllogisms”, in Tony Street and Mohammad Saleh Zarepour (eds.), The Handbook for Arabic Logic and Philosophy of Language, Cham: Springer.

Other Internet Resources

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