Friedrich Engels

First published Sat Oct 3, 2026

Friedrich Engels (1820–1895) was a preeminent figure in the formation of modern socialist politics and an interdisciplinary autodidact who wrote extensively on history, social theory, natural science, and philosophy. The lifelong collaborator of Karl Marx, he is often remembered primarily for his role in popularizing Marx’s ideas and in shaping the reception of Marx’s work. He himself wrote that he willingly played “second fiddle” to his more famous friend, but the modesty of this happy deference does an injustice to the originality and influence that he exercised as a thinker in his own right. Engels’s arguments and ideas were by no means identical with Marx’s own, though whether this represents a divergence in their views or instead a difference in their interests remains sharply contested. Throughout the twentieth and twenty-first centuries, Engels’s theoretical reflections on a wide range of themes have been the subject of extensive debate not only in the intellectual world of the socialist states and communist parties but also in European and American philosophy and social theory; much of his work was published only posthumously, and even basic interpretative questions continue to resist scholarly consensus. Yet his always complex, often fragmentary, and occasionally contradictory writings on nature and natural science, on the social character of human knowledge, on the dynamics of historical change, and of course on the politics of class and capitalism remain as influential as they are controversial.

Engels wrote major treatments of some issues that are of continuing philosophical interest and of many questions that are more central to other fields, from military history to sociology. After outlining the trajectory and periodization of his work as a whole, this article therefore focuses on the aspects of his thought that loom largest in his philosophical reception: the contested nature of his intellectual relationship with Marx; his distinctive account of materialism and dialectics; and the way he developed that account in his theoretical reflections on natural science and social history.

1. Life and Works

Friedrich Engels was born on November 28, 1820, in the Prussian town of Barmen. His father was a partner in a successful manufacturing firm that operated also in England, giving Engels an early window into the character of capitalism well before its advance in Germany. His devoutly Pietist parents expected him to join the firm after completing secondary school and were unsupportive of his own ambition to study philosophy at university. As a result, Engels completed no formal higher education; but in 1841 he took advantage of a period of military service in Berlin to sit in on university lectures and to integrate himself into the explosive intellectual world of the Young Hegelian scene. Establishing himself as a writer in this milieu, he thoroughly rejected the theological and political worldview of his upbringing, yet he maintained placid relations with his family and could count on intermittent employment in the firm to support himself. He first met Karl Marx in 1842, though they began working closely together only in 1844. Their collaboration across the second half of that decade is most famously represented by their joint 1848 work the Manifesto of the Communist Party, a product of their involvement in the nascent proletarian movements of Europe. After the failure of the 1848 Revolution—which saw Engels very briefly participating in the armed struggle in Germany itself—he and Marx both left the continent for England, where he lived the rest of his life. There he reluctantly assumed a more significant role in his father’s firm, partly in order to be able to support the much more financially precarious Marx family. He and Marx played an active part in the leadership of the International Working Men’s Association (the “First International”), a major organization of European and American socialist and anarchist parties formed in 1864 in London. After the International’s dissolution a decade later, he remained an active interlocutor and advisor for socialist leaders across Europe, especially in Germany. Outliving Marx by over a decade, he played an instrumental role in the consolidation of Marxism as both a political movement and an intellectual tradition. He died on August 5, 1895.

An easy student of languages and an autodidact in a range of fields, Engels wrote mostly in German but also published extensively in English. In anglophone writing he usually gave his first name as “Frederick” rather than “Friedrich,” a convention that is followed by some, though not all, later editions of his work, including the English-language Marx-Engels Collected Works (MECW).

Because of the fundamental role that his relationship with Marx plays in the interpretation of his writings and the debates around them, Engels’s work is best surveyed in terms of that relationship. Loosely, his work can be divided into four distinct, though uneven, periods: the several years of writing before his collaboration with Marx (up to the mid-1840s); the decade of collaborative coauthorship (into the 1850s); the long period of their “division of labor” (from the later 1850s through the 1870s); and his dozen years of work after Marx’s death in 1883.

1.1 Early work and collaboration with Marx

Engels wrote extensively alone before he and Marx ever wrote together; he was the more well-established figure in the literary world of German radicalism when they first began to collaborate. Writing under pseudonyms, he contributed observational accounts of working-class conditions and bourgeois life to influential Young Hegelian journals and reviews in the early 1840s, forming close relationships with figures like Arnold Ruge. His most substantial early foray into philosophical questions took the form of a polemical response to the work of Schelling, who moved to the University of Berlin in 1841 at the request of the Prussian king “in order to root out the subversive rationalism of Hegelian philosophy and, in particular, the political radicalism of the Young Hegelians” (Carver 1990: 65). In two major pamphlets (Schelling and Revelation and Schelling, Philosopher in Christ, both 1842), Engels, writing anonymously, responded both to Schelling’s major lectures on revelation and to the broader character of his speculative philosophy, defending the Hegelian project as a move beyond Christianity toward a more rational world. These works were widely and enthusiastically received in Young Hegelian circles.

But despite his defense of Hegel’s project against its conservative critics, Engels was also (like Marx) inspired by Ludwig Feuerbach’s attempt to push that project beyond its own limits, turning its methodological principles against its systematic conclusions. In the same period when Marx was taking up this task through his own (unfinished) critique of Hegel’s Philosophy of Right, Engels was pushing that project into new areas entirely. Though he had agreed to move to England in 1842 and involve himself in the family firm there, he remained in touch with the Young Hegelian literary scene and began sending off articles more fully concerned with the economic questions he could now examine firsthand. This led to his first important non-pseudonymous work of the early period, his groundbreaking “Outlines of a Critique of Political Economy” (1844). This text sketched a theoretical program for extending the Feuerbachian critique of idealism to the categories of political economy as a field, focusing on basic concepts like competition and value. It made a strong impression on Marx, who edited the journal in which it appeared, and it is usually seen as having given direction to Marx’s own turn toward questions of political economy.

The major work of this early period was his Condition of the Working-Class in England (1845). Written after his return from two years in England, where had been able to closely observe both capitalist production techniques and working-class living conditions, the book offered a vivid and systematic account of the socially destructive character of industrialization. Still widely regarded as Engels’s masterpiece, it displays many of the features that would define his mature thinking: a political commitment to communism as the abolition of private property and of class domination; an explanation of social institutions and historical processes in terms most fundamentally of class relations; and a creative synthesis of empirical observation, theoretical analysis, and sharp polemic. Because it is primarily journalistic or quasi-sociological in content, its reception in the philosophically-oriented literature on Engels is more limited; but it certainly represents the earliest full expression of the political commitments that would mark the rest of Engels’s life and work.

While Engels was drafting Condition, he began also collaborating with Marx more directly. Their period of direct coauthorship persisted through the revolutions of 1848 and into the early 1850s. The Holy Family (1845) was the first book they wrote together, though the chapters were individually signed and the bulk of the text was composed by Marx; in this volume they announced their break with the Young Hegelian milieu. Over the next two years, in an abandoned follow-up project that was published posthumously as The German Ideology (1845–46), they jointly developed the first substantial outline of their own “materialist” perspective on history and politics. (Most scholars now argue that this text was intended as a series of articles, not as a single book; see Carver 2010, Johnson 2022.) In the Manifesto of the Communist Party (1848), drafted first by Engels and then revised by Marx, they applied that perspective to the social tumult they saw on the horizon. By the time the Manifesto was published, the pan-European revolution of 1848 had begun. As that revolutionary upheaval rose and fell over the next several years, they followed its events closely and wrote about them both together and apart, producing a huge volume of journalistic commentary and political analysis, as well as longer works like Engels’s influential Peasant War in Germany (1850), Marx’s Eighteenth Brumaire of Louis Bonaparte (1852, MECW 10), and a coauthored critique of shoddy revolutionary leadership, the highly satirical Great Men of the Exile (1852, published only posthumously).

1.2 “Division of labor” and late work

After the defeat of the 1848 revolutions, Engels and Marx both left the continent for England. With the move came a new phase in their working relationship, one that would endure for several decades; direct coauthorship became less significant, though they did continue to collaborate closely on much of their journalistic and political writing. From the late 1850s to the early 1880s, Marx specialized increasingly in the critique of political economy (the work that would become Capital), while Engels extended their project into a range of other fields and defended their views to wider audiences. This period has therefore often been seen as involving a “division of labor” between them, as Engels himself sometimes put it (see his preface to the second edition of The Housing Question, 1887 [MECW 26]: 427).

Engels’s efforts in this period were wide-ranging: he published extensively on military affairs, drafted an abortive history of precapitalist Ireland (1870), published an influential pamphlet on The Housing Question (1872–73), and (like Marx) wrote extensively on the continental workers’ movements, among much else. But the most significant works he composed during this “division of labor” were his long book Herr Eugen Dühring’s Revolution in Science (1878, universally referred to as Anti-Dühring) and an ambitious but unfinished project on the sciences, published posthumously under the editorial title Dialectics of Nature (1873–82). The former, written from 1876 to 1878, is the text that most determined Engels’s legacy in later socialist and communist thought. Written at the request of German friends who were concerned by the growing influence of the philosopher Eugen Dühring within the emerging socialist movement in that country, it responds systematically to Dühring’s views on nature, philosophy, history, politics, and economics. Engels presented it as a defense and elaboration of the perspective developed by Marx, who in fact drafted one of its chapters on political economy, but its relationship to Marx’s views has been sharply debated in later scholarship, partly because much of it deals with questions on which Marx himself never published. Not all of the chapters focused narrowly on Dühring; some surveyed wider questions in the history of science and philosophy and in the development of socialist politics. Engels selected three such chapters and published them separately in 1880, in a lightly revised form, as the pamphlet Socialism: Utopian and Scientific (1880). For many decades this briefer work remained by far the most influential popular introduction to Marx’s and Engels’s ideas.

Philosophy and natural science were thematically central to the excerpts selected for Socialism: Utopian and Scientific, a choice that reflects Engels’s major intellectual preoccupations of this period. To write Anti-Dühring he had had to interrupt his ongoing work on the Dialectics of Nature project, which would never be completed. In those manuscripts he surveyed a range of developments in the natural sciences of his day, from thermodynamics to evolutionary biology, and reflected on methodological controversies about the relative importance of theory and experiment in the formation of scientific knowledge. The project aimed to offer an account of the sciences that could at once reconcile “materialist” commitments with “dialectical” methods and situate Marxist social theory within an overarching scientific sensibility. It arguably complicates or qualifies the simpler formulations developed in his works for popular audiences (like Anti-Dühring), but its unfinished character has inspired sustained debate over its meaning and significance.

Marx died in 1883, and the nature of Engels’s work changed once again. He devoted the bulk of his intellectual energy to engaging with the growing European socialist movement and to cultivating and expanding Marx’s own intellectual and political legacy. He spent years editing the unfinished manuscripts of volumes two and three of Capital for publication and wrote a number of substantive introductions to new editions of Marx’s earlier work and his own. In 1884 he published The Origin of the Family, Private Property, and the State, a book on the oppression of women and the rise of class society. Engels presented the project as “the fulfilment of a behest,” for it was based partly on Marx’s own notes on the work of authors like the American ethnologist Henry Morgan, but the arguments were largely his own. In Ludwig Feuerbach and the End of Classical German Philosophy (1886), Engels sketched an overarching interpretation of German Idealism and its relationship to Marx’s materialism, emphasizing the tension between Hegel’s dynamic dialectical method and his totalizing idealist system; when published as a pamphlet, it included the first appearance in print of Marx’s 1845 “Theses on Feuerbach.”

Engels’s final writings of any substance display both his independence from and his commitment to Marx’s oeuvre. At one end is his introduction to a reissue of Marx’s early work The Class Struggles in France (1895); in this essay he revisited, for a new era of expanding suffrage, the political strategy implied by that earlier text. Partly because it was first published in a redacted form that emphasized the significance of parliamentary politics for the socialist movement, it has inspired long controversy about Engels’s attitude toward “reformism” in his later years. On the other is his essay “On the History of Early Christianity” (1894–95), an account of the submerged revolutionary impulses that shaped the early church in its antagonism to the Roman Empire, culminating in the suggestion that socialism will be the realization rather than the betrayal of the project of Christian history. It is a text without any equivalent in Marx’s work.

2. The Marx-Engels relationship

Engels’s authorship is bound up with a coauthorship—his long collaboration with Marx. The significance of this relationship, which has few parallels in European intellectual history, is attested by the fact that in both German and in English the standard critical editions of their works are presented always as “the collected works of Marx and Engels”; there is no comprehensive scholarly edition of the writings of either of them alone.

The character of that relationship, however, is a matter of fundamental controversy, and it hangs over almost all scholarly literature on Engels. Especially after the move to England, they wrote in different styles and for different audiences, with Engels taking on the primary responsibility for advancing their positions in the public press. “This made it necessary for me to present our views for the most part in a polemical form,” Engels would remark after Marx’s death (1887 [MECW 26]: 427). Both Marx and Engels in their own lifetimes often spoke in this way of “our views,” and they always presented themselves as being essentially in agreement (see, e.g., Marx’s preface to the Contribution to the Critique of Political Economy, Part One, 1859). But because Engels intervened forcefully in areas where Marx remained silent, and because he often offered distinctive interpretations of issues that they did both write on, the accuracy of this shared self-presentation was contested almost from the start. As early as the 1890s, neo-Hegelian scholars in Italy and France were questioning what some saw as “Engels’s distortion of Marx” (Jacoby 1981: 53). But it was the Hungarian philosopher Georg Lukács who offered the most influential framing of the problem, shortly after the Russian Revolution of 1917. In History and Class Consciousness, Lukács spoke of the “misunderstandings that arise from Engels’ account of dialectics,” and attributed these “to the fact that Engels—following Hegel’s mistaken lead—extended the method to apply also to nature” (1923 [1971]: 24). On this view, the real difference between Marx and Engels was that the former carefully restricted the scope of his work to social inquiry, while the latter attempted to develop an overarching theory of nature as a whole.

The legitimacy of the “dialectics of nature” became an organizing center for subsequent debate over the Marx-Engels relationship, particularly as the posthumous publication of their unfinished work made further materials more widely available (including, in 1925, the Dialectics of Nature manuscripts themselves). Many interpreters—and by no means only those working in socialist states or aligned with communist parties elsewhere—continued to see Engels’s account of nature as essentially compatible with Marx’s own views, or at least as a complement to them. But for much of the twentieth century, “the dominant tendency … [was] to divorce the works of Marx from those of Engels, invariably to the latter’s disadvantage” (Rigby 1992: 4). Many argued not only (as Lukács had) that the turn to nature risked distorting Marx’s method, but also that it was the expression of a deeper intellectual divergence in how the two men understood human history and society as well. This interpretation usually sees in Engels’s work a more deterministic and reductionistic account of historical materialism, a systematic “worldview” rather than a critical method. The most extreme versions of this position counterposed “Marx’s naturalism and Engels’s mechanistic materialism” in order to argue not simply that Engels, in a “tragic deception,” systematically misrepresented Marx’s humanistic critique as a static and dogmatic doctrine, but also that in this way he laid the ideological foundation for Stalinist authoritarianism (Levine 1975: xiv–xvi). As this claim suggests, debates about the Marx-Engels relationship were, for much of the twentieth century, deeply shaped by the political context of the Cold War: separating Marx from Engels, and identifying the Soviet Union with the legacy of the latter, functioned to rehabilitate Marx’s own work for western audiences, as a number of scholars have argued in retrospect (see Blackledge 2019: 1–20).

This interpretative emphasis on the divergence between Engels and Marx—and the usually negative evaluation it implied of Engels’s own thought—remains an influential view, but it was never simply a consensus position in the scholarship (overviews of the debate can be found in Blackledge 2019, Hollander 2011, Liedman 1997, Liedman 2015 [2018], Rigby 1992, Sheehan 1985 [2017]). Moreover, a handful of scholars, both during and after the Cold War, developed an intermediate approach, distancing Engels from Marx but doing so in order to make Engels’s work more intelligible as an object of study in its own right (see especially Carver 1983, Carver 2020). Over the last two or three decades, interpretative scholarship on both men has been revitalized not only by the weakening of Cold-War–era ideological pressures but also by the ongoing publication of the new edition of the Marx-Engels Gesamtausgabe (MEGA), which is making available all of their extant manuscripts, drafts, correspondence, and research notes in the original languages and with a detailed editorial apparatus. The internationally-organized MEGA project has changed the landscape of the debate over the Marx-Engels relationship in several ways. It has opened up Engels’s nature manuscripts to new interpretations that emphasize their unfinished and exploratory character (see, e.g., Kangal 2020), and it has made clear that Marx’s own interest in the natural sciences was much more substantial than was once understood (see, e.g., Saito 2017); but more significantly, it has also pushed the question of nature away from the center of that debate as a whole, and turned the focus to Capital instead. The second and third volumes of Capital were editorially reconstructed by Engels after Marx’s death; with the manuscripts for those volumes now available in their unedited forms, the major debates about the Marx-Engels relationship increasingly concern the adequacy or inadequacy of that editorial effort. Yet the dispute about Engels and Capital has achieved no more consensus than the earlier dispute about Engels and nature: his editorial work has today both fervent defenders and incisive critics (see Blackledge 2019, Hoff 2009 [2017], Hollander 2011, Moseley 2015).

Contemporary scholarship thus continues to accommodate a very wide range of sharply opposed views on the relationship between Engels and Marx. This article does not assume a specific position on these questions, but it does presuppose that Engels is worth examining in his own right—a possibility that some of the most extreme twentieth-century interpretations did not always admit.

3. “Materialism” and “Dialectics”

“Materialism” and “dialectics” are recurrent, and philosophically fundamental, keywords for Engels. But partly because Engels uses these terms in various senses and in the context of very different kinds of questions, and also partly because they loom larger in his work than they do in Marx’s own, their meaning and significance are contested. The interpretative issues are compounded by the fact that Engels himself did not use the compound term “dialectical materialism” to describe his and Marx’s ideas, though this later became the standard name for various systematic philosophical views developed on the basis of his writings and Marx’s own, especially in the Soviet Union and in the para-academic discourses of communist parties elsewhere. (The term “dialectical materialism” may have multiple origins, and is commonly attributed both to the Russian Marxist G. V. Plekhanov and to the German communist Joseph Dietzgen; it was widely popularized only after Engels’s death, but its occasional use in editorial headings added to posthumous editions of his work has contributed to the mistaken impression that it was his own term of art.) Outside of texts he coauthored with Marx, the most important sources for Engels’s account of materialism and of dialectics are the works of the late period: Anti-Dühring, Dialectics of Nature, Ludwig Feuerbach and the End of Classical German Philosophy, and to some degree also The Origin of the Family, Private Property, and the State. A number of shorter texts—such as Engels’s review of Marx’s 1859 Contribution to the Critique of Political Economy—also figure prominently in the debate on these themes. The disparate genres, audiences, and purposes of these texts complicate the interpretative questions further: the Dialectics of Nature manuscripts, for example, were fragmentary parts of an unfinished project, and so must be handled differently even than the closely related Anti-Dühring, a published polemic against another philosopher’s views.

Across these varied sources, “materialism” and “dialectics” play two basic roles. On the one hand, both of these terms are fundamental to how Engels presents the history of philosophy: they name substantive themes whose development across time he interprets in a particular overarching way. On the other hand, they also name core methodological principles of his own work, motivating arguments that sometimes unfold without much explicit attention to the terms themselves.

3.1 As themes of the history of philosophy

In works intended for a popular audience, Engels argues that the history of philosophy can be understood, in a fundamental way, as an extended conflict between two basic approaches or positions: idealism and materialism. In the Feuerbach pamphlet, he suggests that “the question of the relation of thinking to being, of the mind to nature” is “the paramount question of the whole of philosophy,” and he argues that

Answers to this question split the philosophers into two great camps. Those who asserted the primacy of the mind over nature and therefore, in the last instance, assumed world creation in some form or other … comprised the camp of idealism. The others, who regarded nature as primary, belong to the various schools of materialism. (1886 [MECW 26]: 366)

Moving beyond the (pedagogical) simplicity of this characterization, Engels denies that either idealism or materialism is a transhistorically stable position or perennial doctrine; each approach “underwent a series of stages of development,” in which not only the competing answers to the basic question, but the ways in which that question was asked, were transformed in line with wider social developments (1886 [MECW 26]: 369). In the “scholasticism of the Middle Ages,” for example, the problem of the relation between thinking and being “was sharpened into this: Did God create the world or has the world existed for all time?” (1886 [MECW 26]: 366). Similarly, in the early modern period, “each epoch-making discovery even in the sphere of natural science” required materialism “to change its form,” and as a result, the materialism of the eighteenth century was “predominantly mechanical, because at that time, of all the natural sciences, only [gravitational] mechanics … had come to any certain conclusion” (1886 [MECW 26]: 366–67). Engels associates such “mechanical materialism” especially with the French Enlightenment, and with the imagination of the world as a vast clockwork mechanism or machine.

The scientific developments of the nineteenth century—particularly in fields like chemistry, biology, and natural history—challenged the adequacy of this mechanical image of the world. But to make sense of how materialist thinking developed further in response, Engels suggests, we must attend to another fundamental distinction, which is orthogonal to that between materialism and idealism, but which likewise runs across the whole history of philosophy: the opposition between “dialectical” and what he calls “metaphysical” views. (On this see Feuerbach, 1886 [MECW 26]: 370ff., and especially Anti-Dühring, 1878 [MECW 25]: 21–27.)

Engels’s somewhat idiosyncratic sense of the term “metaphysical” as the antonym of “dialectical” is almost completely unrelated to the word’s meaning in contemporary philosophy (though it is similar in key respects to Hegel’s usage). Most basically, for Engels, a “metaphysical” view of the world sees it in terms of individuated, static things or entities with fixed essences, while a “dialectical” approach explains the world in terms of constitutively interconnected processes of transformation and change. As he puts it in Anti-Dühring:

To the metaphysician, things and their mental reflexes, ideas, are isolated, are to be considered one after the other and apart from each other, are objects of investigation fixed, rigid, given once for all. … Dialectics, on the other hand, comprehends things and their representations, ideas, in their essential connection, concatenation, motion, origin, and ending. (1878 [MECW 25]: 22–23)

Engels presents the history of (western) philosophy largely in terms of the back-and-forth movement between dialectical and metaphysical approaches, with each becoming more sophisticated over time. In Anti-Dühring and especially in the Dialectics of Nature, he locates the origin of dialectical thinking in ancient Greece, praising the pre-Socratics (particularly Heraclitus) for seeing the world in terms of flux and change. But he argues also that the more specialized sciences that emerged in early modernity were enlivened in turn by their “metaphysical” emphasis on analyzing isolated aspects of the world in detail. In this sense, Engels treats the metaphysical approach itself in a “dialectical” way, as a historically important aspect of the ongoing transformation of human knowledge.

Engels’s interpretation of the history of philosophy in terms of materialism and idealism, on the one hand, and metaphysics and dialectics, on the other, culminates in his account of the nineteenth century. German Idealism, in the work of Hegel most of all, offered a sophisticated picture of the world in terms of dialectical transformation and development, but in this picture, mind (or spirit) was given ontological and explanatory priority over nature. Mechanical materialism had developed a sophisticated account of the primacy of the natural world, but it could not easily assimilate the fundamentally non-mechanical processes at the heart of newly maturing fields like chemistry and biology—and of course the study of society. The resulting impasse, Engels suggests, could only be overcome by an orientation toward the world that is both materialist (in the sense of affirming the priority of nature over mind) and dialectical (in the sense of seeing the world in processual, rather than mechanical, terms). Engels argues that Marx’s work represented the first adequate attempt to unite materialism and dialectics in the necessary way. The result was an account of the world that saw it in terms of process, development, interconnection, and contradiction, yet which located these characteristically “dialectical” dynamics not simply in the workings of reason or the operations of the human mind but in our material conditions: human reason is the product, not the source, of the world’s dialectical character.

In texts like Anti-Dühring and the Feuerbach pamphlet, then, Engels interpreted Marx’s project as a fundamental achievement in relation to the history of philosophy and science; and he presented his own work partly as an effort to make that achievement accessible to a wider audience, and partly as an effort to develop it further in fields beyond those that Marx explored. Both “materialism” and “dialectics” therefore represent not just themes in his account of the development of human knowledge, but self-conscious methodological principles of his own writing.

3.2 As methodological principles

In the Feuerbach pamphlet, as we have seen, Engels presents materialism in terms of the primacy of nature over mind and of being over thinking. This formulation, which he endorsed as his own view, is not so far from Marx’s insistence in A Contribution to the Critique of Political Economy that “it is not the consciousness of men that determines their existence, but their social existence that determines their consciousness” (1859 [MECW 29]: 263), though the scope of Marx’s famous formulation is more narrowly restricted to social history. In his own writing, Engels takes the primacy of being over thinking, of nature over mind, as a more general principle, seeing Marx’s account of how “social existence” determines “consciousness” as an application of their shared method to the particular problems of economic history and ideology. Materialism in this capacious sense dates back at the latest to the project of the coauthored German Ideology project, which insists both on the ontological priority of nature over human reason and on the explanatory priority of the economic mode of production (“material conditions”) over thought. If Marx’s mature work focuses mainly on the social-theoretical dimensions of this materialism, then Engels’s late writings follow the principle across a range of other fields.

Engels’s materialism sits right at the boundary between ontology and epistemology: he advances this position certainly as a claim about the character of the world, but its significance—and the demonstration of its truth or validity—is as a principle of explanation. Engels gestures most explicitly to a materialist ontology in his writings on science and nature, which we will turn to in the next section. He employs materialism as a canon of explanation in his extensive historical and political writing, from The Peasant War in Germany (which explains theological conflicts in terms of underlying class dynamics) to The Origin of the Family, Private Property, and the State (which argues that kinship structures should be understood as part of the fundamental material base of society, alongside economic relations). In these contexts, his materialism is intended to contrast with various forms of “idealist” historical explanation, such as the view that social revolutions are caused by transformations in the “dominant ideas” or “spirit of the age,” rather than vice versa. We will examine this sense of materialism in the sections on his theory of history.

Engels’s own account of dialectics is more contested; its character and meaning remain sharply debated in the scholarly literature. The traditional center of controversy here is Engels’s presentation of the “laws of dialectics.” Though Marx used the language of “dialectical law” before Engels adopted it (see Liedman 1977 [2023]: 115, 317), it is associated distinctively with Engels’s work because of its centrality to Anti-Dühring and Dialectics of Nature. In Anti-Dühring, Engels outlines two key dialectical principles, which he refers to as “the transformation of quantity into quality” and the “negation of the negation.” By the former, he means primarily the way in which a continuous change by degrees can produce a change in kind; by the latter, he means the way in which some processes of development restore, in a new form, the earlier conditions from which they departed. Engels illustrates each principle with a number of examples, in both cases pointing first to phenomena examined by Marx’s social theory and then to further material in the natural sciences. The transformation of quantity into quality, for example, can be seen in how the cooperative effort of many workers laboring together “creates, to use Marx’s phrase, ‘a new power’, which is essentially different from the sum of its separate forces”; but it is equally demonstrated by molecular compounds in chemistry, when the “simple quantitative addition of elements” leads to “qualitatively different” substances being formed (1878 [MECW 25]: 117–18). The negation of the negation, likewise, can be seen in the historical development of forms of property (capitalist accumulation has destroyed earlier kinds of individual ownership of the means of production, but the socialization of property would restore such direct control, in a new form); but it is exemplified just as well by the growth of plants from seeds and by the dramatic life-cycles of butterflies (1878 [MECW 25]: 125–26).

In the Dialectics of Nature manuscripts, Engels presents further examples of these two kinds of process, but he also offers additional formulations whose status in his thought is unclear. In an incomplete (or abandoned) draft of a chapter on dialectics, he suggests a third principle, the “law of the interpenetration of opposites,” which he does not there explore in detail but which seems to concern forms of development that are structured by internal tension, antagonism, or “contradiction” (1873–82 [MECW 25]: 356); in one draft outline for the project as a whole, he lists a fourth principle, “spiral form of development,” without further comment (1873–82 [MECW 25]: 313). In both the more polished presentation of Anti-Dühring and the fragmentary considerations of Dialectics of Nature, these various dialectical principles are presented both as high-level descriptions of kinds of processes in the world and as forms of thought that correspond to those objective dynamics. Like his materialism, then, his own approach to dialectics sits right at the boundary between ontology and epistemology. (In earlier work, as for example in his review of Marx’s Contribution to the Critique of Political Economy, he likewise presents dialectics both as a form of objective historical development and as a form of logical analysis (1859 [MECW 16]). Most scholars suggest that this intertwining of the two sides is at odds with Marx’s own approach, though this, like every other aspect of the Marx-Engels relationship, remains contested; see Carver 1983: 96ff., and Hoff 2009 [2017]: 224ff.)

There are several contending interpretations of Engels’s account of dialectics and its “laws.” The most skeptical accounts reject them either as simply nonsensical or as the crude expression of a dogmatic worldview (on this see the discussion in Sheehan 1985 [2017]). More often they are criticized as an unduly a priori schematism that Engels imposes, perhaps too rigidly, on scientific knowledge; this view was influentially advanced by the Frankfurt School philosopher Alfred Schmidt in his argument that the “dialectical laws … are at best a possible way of presenting and interpreting the results of scientific research,” but that “they have absolutely no connection with the method of natural science itself” (1962 [2014]: 55). This assessment is not universal: the biologists Richard Levins and Richard Lewontin have offered an influential defense of dialectical methodology in Engels’s sense (Levins & Lewontin 1985), which has been taken up especially in contemporary Marxist ecological theory (Foster 2020 and 2024). And because, as Michael Heinrich has argued, “Engels was clear that with such general statements nothing is understood about individual processes” (2004 [2012]: 37), others have been prepared to interpret the “dialectical laws” in a more heuristic way, as deliberate generalizations intended to orient critical study of the world. The analytical Marxist Jon Elster offered a qualified defense of Engels’s dialectics in this sense, arguing that the basic principles outlined in Anti-Dühring are plausible enough as descriptions of “patterns of change” (Elster 1984: 40). The most deflationary version of this position suggests that Engels would have more clearly expressed his real insights without recourse to the terminology of dialectics at all (Timpanaro 1970 [1975]). Such interpretations, which downplay the significance of the language of “law,” underline Engels’s more fundamental emphasis on the constitutive interconnections between the processes of dynamic transformation in terms of which the world must be comprehended.

Beyond his programmatic methodological statements, Engels developed this sensibility most fully in his theoretical accounts of natural science and of social and political history, to which we now turn.

4. Theory of Science

In its rejection of the popular Hegelianism of the day, the philosophical and methodological materialism outlined in the German Ideology project affirmed what one might call the ontological priority of material nature over human reason and consciousness, but in its substantive focus on social history it ended up leaving the question of nature itself—and of natural science—largely to the side. By the end of the 1848 revolutions, Engels and Marx had developed a robust intellectual program, based both on their own political activity and on their study of the history of philosophy, but it was not one that seemed to call for much engagement with the basic questions of other scientific fields, and such concerns are largely absent from the works produced in their coauthorial period. But by the 1860s, when they had settled into the intellectual “division of labor” characteristic of their life in English exile, their relationship to the sciences was different, and the situation of the scientific world had changed as well. Marx was ever more focused on his critique of political economy (a project that would become Capital), and this project was concerned in a fundamental way with the putatively scientific character of the form of economic thought developed by the tradition stretching from Adam Smith to David Ricardo. As Sven-Eric Liedman argues (1977 [2023]: 97f.), this social-theoretical project implied methodological questions about the character of scientific knowledge in general—and this is the case regardless of whether “science” is here understood in its familiar anglophone sense, or in the wider German sense of Wissenschaft, which refers more broadly to organized scholarly inquiry. It was Engels who most directly took up these methodological questions about science as such, in an effort to defend the significance of their materialist project in the wake of a midcentury period that had been almost as revolutionary for the natural sciences as it had been for European politics.

In his mature work, then, Engels often refers to the program he and Marx had developed as “scientific socialism.” This term was intended of course to draw a contrast with “utopian” and other non-Marxian socialisms of the early nineteenth century, but it was also directed in a fundamental way “against competing conceptions of science and scholarship” (Liedman 1977 [2023]: 328). “To make a science of socialism,” Engels wrote in Anti-Dühring, “it had first to be placed upon a real basis” (1878 [MECW 25]: 21). The search for that “real basis” led Engels across a wide range of problems and concerns. Alongside his extensive writing on military affairs, Engels’s reflections on nature and natural science represent the most substantial body of text that he produced on any theme that does not figure prominently in Marx’s own work. For this reason, the account of natural science is often seen as his most influential—and most divisive—independent contribution to the early development of Marxist theory (Kangal 2020: 43–72; Sheehan 1985 [2017]: 25f., 46ff.).

The most significant textual sources for Engels’s views on science are the same as those for his wider account of materialism and dialectics, outlined above: Anti-Dühring, the Dialectics of Nature manuscripts, and the Feuerbach pamphlet. These texts date from the 1870s and 1880s, but they represent the culmination of an interest that had taken shape, at the latest, by the end of the 1850s. In 1858, Engels wrote to Marx that he had been studying recent developments in physiology and in physics (see his letter of 14 July 1858 [MECW 40]: 325ff.); and the next year—in what would be for him a pivotal moment—he read Darwin’s Origin of Species immediately upon its first publication.

4.1 The historical character of nature

In a letter to Marx about a month after Darwin’s work had appeared, Engels recommended it enthusiastically and summarized what he saw as its broader significance: “There was one aspect of teleology that had yet to be demolished, and that has now been done” (11/12 December 1859 [MECW 40]: 551). Marx himself read it a year later and offered an even stronger assessment. He wrote to Engels that it was “the book which, in the field of natural history, provides the basis for our views” (19 December 1860 [MECW 41]: 232), and Engels, for the rest of his life, would insist on the parallel between what Darwinian theory had achieved in the study of nature and what Marxian theory had achieved in the study of society. Darwin’s work provided Engels with an important model for understanding what might be called the relative autonomy of distinct scientific fields: it described tendential dynamics that rested on, but were not directly reducible to, the principles of more physically fundamental sciences like mechanics and chemistry. This was a methodological insight that Engels would rely on extensively in his own later writings on the relationships between different kinds of scientific knowledge. But Darwin’s work was even more significant in substantive than in methodological terms, for in Engels’s view, it established firmly that the natural world as a whole could only be understood in terms of process, transforming over time in ways that could be justly depicted in terms of “development” but certainly not in terms of “teleology.”

In the Dialectics of Nature project, Engels suggests that Darwin’s work in this way represented the culmination of a broader nineteenth-century scientific revolution in which many different fields abandoned the old picture of a “conservative nature, in which everything remained today as it was at the beginning of the world,” and converged instead on the view that nature itself “developed historically” and “had a history in time” (1873–82 [MECW 25]: 475). The foundation for this perspective was established first in astronomy, with Kant’s “nebular hypothesis” about the origin of the solar system, and it was bolstered by nineteenth-century developments in fields like geology and paleontology. Engels emphasizes that the discovery of the cell in biology, and of what is now known as the conservation of energy in physics, in a similar way made processes of dynamic transformation fundamental to the explanatory picture of the most basic physical sciences, while also allowing the connections between these fields to be at last much more fully understood (1873–82 [MECW 25]: 476–78; cf. the discussion in Feuerbach, 1886 [MECW 26]: 385–5). It is this interconnected and processual character of the material world that Engels refers to when he claims in Anti-Dühring that “nature is the proof of dialectics” (1878 [MECW 25]: 23).

The properly historical character of nature in itself is the core commitment of Engels’s account of the sciences. Emphasizing that the study of nature must be the study of its forms of change, he argues in Dialectics of Nature that the scientific advances of the nineteenth century had vindicated

the mode of outlook of the great founders of Greek philosophy, the view that the whole of nature, from the smallest element to the greatest, from grains of sand to suns, from Protista to man, has its existence in eternal coming into being and passing away, in ceaseless flux, in unresting motion and change. Only with the essential difference that what in the Greeks was a brilliant intuition, is in our case the result of strictly scientific research in accordance with experience, and hence also it emerges in a much more definite and clear form. (1873–82 [MECW 25]: 327)

In this way, he suggests, the recognition of nature’s non-teleological development makes it possible to bring the results of the specialized sciences together in a unified, though permanently incomplete, picture of the world as a whole. At the center of this picture is his concept of motion.

4.2 Motion and “reflection”

In Anti-Dühring, Engels writes that “motion is the mode of existence of matter” (1878 [MECW 25]: 55). This formulation has been often quoted and hotly debated; it has suggested to many interpreters that Engels’s materialism was both fundamentally mechanistic (despite his intentions) and a forerunner of later forms of reductionism in the philosophy of science (both methodological and ontological). In the Dialectics of Nature manuscripts, however, Engels complicates the claim, emphasizing that “motion” itself is not a unitary category, but instead “comprehends all changes and processes occurring in the universe,” from particle interactions to metabolic cycles, from gravitational orbits to human thought itself (1873–82 [MECW 25]: 362). Engels suggests that it is their attention to distinct forms of “motion” in this capacious sense that most clearly distinguishes different scientific fields and clarifies the relationships between them: while different kinds of motion can be transformed into each other (as the principle of the conservation of energy demonstrates, in his view), this does not entail that an adequate theory of a more basic form of motion vacates the need for an independent account of more complex ones. In Dialectics of Nature, Engels is explicitly dismissive of attempts to map economics or psychology onto the physical sciences (1873–82 [MECW 25]: 391, 527). Recent interpretations increasingly emphasize the anti-reductionistic significance of this account of motion, and identify Engels as a forerunner instead of later theories of emergence in the philosophy of science (Kangal 2020, Foster 2020, Shafer 2023a; for earlier accounts of Engels as a critic of reductionism, see Liedman 1977 [2023], Levins & Lewontin 1985, and the survey of the debate in Sheehan 1985 [2017]).

In the nature manuscripts, Engels suggests that the “dialectics of the mind is only the reflection of the forms of motion of the real world” (1873–82 [MECW 25]: 485), and such language of “reflection” appears frequently in his discussion of epistemological issues. Partly because Lenin drew heavily on Engels’s use of the term in his own polemical work on the philosophy of science (his 1909 Materialism and Empirio-Criticism), disputes over “reflectionist epistemology” or the “reflection theory of knowledge” became a mainstay of the intra-Marxist philosophical debates of the twentieth century. There are two major competing interpretations of how Engels himself uses such language. On one side is the view that “Engels’s metaphor of ‘reflection’ implies an empiricist passivity of mind in the production of knowledge,” a basically positivist account of truth grounded in a naïve realism about the objects of experience (Rigby 1992: 138, in a survey of the debate). In the twentieth century, this interpretation was linked by affinity to the reductionistic interpretation of his philosophy of science more broadly; like that interpretation, it has lost ground in more recent scholarship. Opposing it, on the other side, is a view that interprets “reflection” in terms of the generative interaction between the subject and object of knowledge. This account emphasizes Engels’s explicit critique of untheoretical empiricism, a critique that that can be understood as a precursor to Deweyan pragmatism or as a revision of Hegel’s earlier account of “reflection determinations” (Bedford & Workman 2023, Foster 2020, Rigby 1992). Indeed, Engels argues not only that knowledge emerges most of all from practical activity in the world, including scientific experiment, but also that such activity and experiment require complex theoretical interpretation and evaluation; as he argues in Dialectics of Nature, “one cannot bring two natural facts into relation with each other, or understand the connection existing between them, without theoretical thought” (1873–82 [MECW 25]: 354).

5. Theory of History

Engels wrote extensively on social and political questions, and much of that writing combines historical analysis with theoretical and programmatic-political argumentation. It is beyond the present scope to summarize the full range of his ideas about class struggle, revolutionary strategy, the state, military power, economic production, and social life; his views on such themes are all the subject of lively debates across a range of disciplines. This discussion will therefore focus on those elements of Engels’s thinking about politics and society that are most closely related to the theoretical perspective with which he remains most fundamentally associated: the “materialist conception of history.”

Engels’s theory of history cannot easily be disentangled from Marx’s, both because several of the most important accounts of what he would call their historical materialism were written by them together, and because in many of the texts he authored alone, he presented himself as simply transmitting Marx’s views to a wider audience. Often in doing so he offered sharp reformulations that reward close attention. But there are also certain areas where Engels offered highly original and distinctive contributions to the “materialist conception” on themes that were decisively his own, particularly in his writing on family structures and on the oppression of women. Just as in the case of his theory of science, scholarly debates about Engels’s account of social and political history are focused as much on its methodological and conceptual character as on its concrete contents; particularly significant is the question of whether Engels endorsed a deterministic account of historical change.

Engels offered historical (and historiographical) reflections across his entire body of work, from the earliest collaborations with Marx to the writings of his final years. The emphasis here will be on the core elements of his account (developed in the early work with Marx), its application to questions of ideology and morality, the influential revisions he offered in his late work on the family, and the contested problems of historical necessity and historical periodization raised by his arguments.

5.1 Production and class, base and superstructure

The basic elements of Engels’s theory of history were developed, albeit at a fairly high level of abstraction, in the two most important early works he coauthored with Marx: the German Ideology project (1845–46) and the Communist Manifesto (1848). In the former, they argue that historical change must be explained in terms of the transformation of the “mode of production” (sometimes “mode of production and exchange”), that is, the overarching way in which the productive activities of society are systematically organized. Any given mode of production, on this view, involves both a given repertoire of “forces of production” (tools, technologies, productive techniques, etc.) and a corresponding system of social relations—the division of labor and the ownership of property—which shape and organize productive activity and with it the wider society. But the development of the forces of production and the development of the relations of production (as they are usually called in later work) is a conflictual one; the rise of modern factory industry, for example, was incompatible with the forms of property characteristic of earlier feudal society, and it required new social relations for its realization. They thus argue that “all collisions in history have their origin…in the contradiction between the productive forces and the form of [social relations]” (1845–46 [MECW 5]: 74).

In the Manifesto, they emphasize a different form of social contradiction: the antagonism between classes, which are defined not in terms of relative wealth or poverty but in terms of different relations to the social production process. (Proletarians remain proletarians, on this view, regardless of how high or low their wages are; the essential fact is that they carry out work using means of production owned by capitalists, not by the workers themselves.) “The history of all hitherto existing society,” they write in the text’s first line, “is the history of class struggles” (1848 [MECW 6]: 482). Because classes can only be defined at all in relation to a given mode of production, and because they argue that class struggle shapes how both the forces and the relations of production develop over time, this way of explaining historical change is clearly closely related to that of the German Ideology, though the precise connection between the two kinds of historical “contradiction”—between forces and relations of production, on the one side, and between exploited and exploiting classes, on the other—can be interpreted in various ways.

Engels emphasizes in his mature writings that this account of production and of class was aimed most directly against “idealist” forms of historical explanation. As he puts it in a biographical essay about Marx, the materialist account of history rejects “the conception that the ultimate causes of all historical changes are to be sought in the changing ideas of human beings”; instead, it offers a picture of history in which “the conceptions and ideas of each historical period are most simply to be explained from the economic conditions of life and from the social and political relations of the period, which are in turn determined by these economic conditions” (1878b [MECW 24]: 191, 192–3). In other writings, Engels (like Marx) uses the language of “base and superstructure” to characterize this historical logic: the material base (sometimes “basis”) is the underlying economic structure of society, and the superstructure, which rests on the base and is shaped by it, encompasses the spheres of politics and law, alongside ideology, culture, and so on. In Anti-Dühring, Engels offers a way to hold these various elements of the materialist view of history together, writing:

Then it was seen that all past history was the history of class struggles; that these warring classes of society are always the products of the modes of production and exchange—in a word, of the economic conditions of their time; that the economic structure of society aways furnishes the real basis, starting from which we can alone work out the ultimate explanation of the whole superstructure of juridical and political institutions, as well as of the religious, philosophical, and other ideas of a given historical period. But now idealism was driven from its last refuge, the philosophy of history; now a materialistic treatment of history was propounded, and a method found of explaining man’s ‘knowing’ by his ‘being’, instead of, as heretofore, his ‘being’ by his ‘knowing’. (1878 [MECW 25]: 26–27, emphases original)

This formulation, intended for a popular audience, was not, however, Engels’s last word on these questions, though it was among his most influential summaries of Marx’s work and his own.

5.2 Ideology and morality

“Ideology,” in the basic sense of a system of ideas which expresses (or disguises) the interests of a ruling class or which renders material conditions intelligible only in a “mystified” form, was a major theme of the early collaborations between Marx and Engels. In the German Ideology project and the Manifesto, they argue that the historical development of ideas can be understood only in terms of the material conditions that those ideas interpret, justify, or conceal. In The Peasant War in Germany (1850), his first major exercise in historical writing, Engels applies this methodological principle to the analysis of the radical Reformation and to Thomas Müntzer’s revolt against the German princes in the sixteenth century, arguing that “the class struggles of those days were clothed in religious shibboleths” and that the “interests, requirements, and demands of the various classes were concealed behind a religious screen” (1850 [MECW 10]: 412). In this account of ideology, the base-superstructure picture becomes not simply a principle of historical explanation but also a tool for social and political analysis.

In later work, Engels extends and complicates this basic approach in several ways. The emphasis of texts like Anti-Dühring is on the problem of how moral and political principles come to be seen wrongly as “eternal truths,” rather than as the historically-specific expression of material interests. Because “society has hitherto moved in class antagonisms,” Engels argues, “morality has always been class morality,” in the sense that “it has either justified the domination and the interests of the ruling class” or has expressed “indignation against this domination and the future interests of the oppressed” (1878 [MECW 25]: 87). While he grants that there has been some “progress in morality, as in all other branches of human knowledge,” he argues that only a classless society could make morality in its true sense possible at all (1878 [MECW 25]: 86). In The Housing Question, he offers a similar account of the origin of law and a critique of the language of “justice,” which “is but the ideologised, idealised expression of the existing economic relations, now from their conservative, and now from their revolutionary angle” (1872–73 [MECW 23]: 381). While this way of explaining moral and political ideals in terms of underlying interests became central to later Marxist theories of ideology as “false consciousness” (see Roberts 2025), this phrase was not a keyword of Engels’s writing on such questions, though he did use it casually in correspondence.

Especially in the final period of his writing (after Marx’s death), Engels “anchored the concept of ideology in a critical theory of the state,” in which the state is interpreted as an “ideological power” that imposes the dominant terms of social conflict and political contestation (Rehmann 2013: 58; see also Khachaturian 2024). While the state itself, for Engels, must be understood as the major institution of the superstructure and thus as a product of society’s underlying class dynamics, its distinctive role in the maintenance of that class order is secured precisely through its apparent autonomy from the economic interests it secures.

5.3 Late revisions: Women and the family

The most substantial book that Engels published after Marx’s death was The Origin of the Family, Private Property, and the State (1884). In the preface to the first edition, Engels presents the work as “the fulfilment of a behest,” for it was based in part on Marx’s own reading notes on the ethnological research of Lewis Morgan, an American scholar who developed a wide-ranging theory of the origin of civilization on the basis of his study of Iroquois society (1884 [MECW 26]: 131). The arguments of the book are distinctively Engels’s own; their relation to the ideas expressed in Marx’s notes has been the focus of a dedicated corner of the wider debate over the Marx-Engels relationship ever since the latter materials were published in the twentieth century (see Krader 1974, Brown 2012, Anderson 2010 [2016]).

Origin advances both an implicit and an explicit revision to the explanatory structure of Engels’s historical materialism. As the next section will examine, the implicit revision has to do with problems of historical periodization, since Engels borrows Morgan’s own description of “barbarism”, “savagery,” and “civilization” as distinct historical stages. Even if these terms are revised in order to reconstruct the core argument in terms less beholden to the stereotyping simplifications about race and indigeneity that informed Morgan’s use of them, they suggest a rather different way of thinking of historical change than in terms of a succession of modes of production. The explicit revision, however, has to do with the way in which modes of production are understood in themselves. After reminding his readers that for “the materialist conception, the determining factor in history is, in the last resort, the production and reproduction of immediate life,” Engels argues that “this itself is again of a twofold character”:

On the one hand, the production of the means of subsistence, of food, clothing and shelter and the implements required for this; on the other, the production of human beings themselves, the propagation of the species. The social institutions under which men of a definite historical epoch and of a definite country live are determined by both kinds of production: by the stage of development of labour, on the one hand, and of the family, on the other. (1884 [MECW 26]: 131–32)

Here Engels locates kinship structures directly in the material “base,” not in the political or ideological “superstructure,” arguing that the organization of the family is as fundamental for historical explanation as is the organization of production in the usual economic sense. The book therefore develops an account of the oppression of women by men as a fundamental form of class domination. Engels argues that “the first class antithesis which appears in history coincides with the development of the antagonism between man and woman in monogamous marriage,” and he suggests that this form of family life is “the cellular form of civilised society, in which we can already study the nature of the antitheses and contradictions which develop fully in the latter” (1884 [MECW 26]: 173–74).

This methodological revision to the materialist account of history has been far more influential than any of Engels’s substantive comments on premodern forms of life. In American “second-wave” feminism, it was taken up widely in debates about the relationship between socialism and women’s liberation (see Firestone 1970, Sayers et al. 1987 [2009], MacKinnon 1989), and it remains significant for Marxist-feminist theories of social reproduction and intersectionality (see Vogel 1983 [2013], Bohrer 2019).

5.4 Historical stages and historical necessity

Marx was once widely interpreted as advocating a deterministic and unilinear theory of history, but recent scholarship increasingly rejects this view (see e.g., Mau 2023, Saito 2022). Engels has not been the subject of nearly as much revisionist interpretation along such lines, and the sense that he held to a more firmly deterministic account of history than Marx did likely remains the majority view. This interpretation is supported certainly by the rhetoric of historical necessity he freely deploys in works like Anti-Dühring and Origin, and the latter in particular evinces a strong sense throughout that the historical developments and transitions it surveys could not but have happened in the way that they did. Origin is the work in which Engels comes closest to reinstating the kind of teleological explanation that he rejected so decisively in his writings on the natural world, and this is in large part because of the way in which it uncritically adopts Morgan’s historical “epochs” of “savagery,” “barbarism,” and “civilisation” as its primary periodizing categories. In other texts, Engels (like Marx) usually distinguishes successive historical periods in terms of their modes of production, though he often writes as though the transition from one mode to another is a matter of historical inevitability.

But Engels also argued explicitly against those (like Dühring) who interpreted Marx in terms of logical necessity, and in his correspondence during the last years of his life, he strongly rejected the more deterministic interpretations of the base-superstructure metaphor that had already begun to circulate in the wider socialist movement. In one such letter he argues that historical materialism “is first and foremost a guide to study, not a tool for constructing objects after the Hegelian model” (5 August 1890 [MECW 49]: 8). Moreover, because all of Engels’s major public writings were intended to make his (and Marx’s) positions accessible and compelling to nonspecialist audiences, and because they were often pitched polemically against dramatically opposing views, it is possible to see his language of necessity or inevitability as a rhetorical and political posture rather than a conceptual or philosophical commitment. A number of interpreters do therefore see his account of history in basically non-deterministic terms, emphasize the non-deterministic character of his actual practices of historical analysis, or argue that the deterministic overtones should be carefully contextualized (Blackledge 2006, Shafer 2023b, Streeck 2020).

6. Legacy

In the twentieth century, in the context of an extended geopolitical conflict in which his very name was a potent ideological symbol, Engels’s work was put to many, many uses—too many to survey here. In some quarters he was praised as the visionary prophet of a post-capitalist future, in others castigated as an architect of authoritarianism. He was admired (and dismissed) as Marx’s most diligent and faithful interpreter; he was accused of having distorted Marx’s views beyond all recognition. All this made it harder to see his own work on its own terms. Some of that work had a systematic character; much was fragmentary, provisional, even experimental. In a career that spanned more than half a century, he developed some arguments extensively, left many insights only half-explored, and abandoned other lines of thought entirely.

Several decades have passed since the end of the Cold War, and more of Engels’s own writings are now available than at any other time since his death. Today it is possible to examine his arguments and ideas more fully and in new ways, at more distance from the partisan preoccupations and ideological imperatives that loomed so large in the older reception of his work. The themes surveyed above, which have dominated so much of the scholarly literature on Engels over the past century, will certainly continue to attract research and reinterpretation. But it is also likely that in this new political and historical moment, entirely unexpected dimensions of his complex and wide-ranging body of work will come over time to organize the debate about his ideas, their relation to Marx’s, and their significance for a world that is still far more like his own than he would have hoped for it to be.

Bibliography

Primary sources

Compilations

  • Marx, Karl and Friedrich Engels, 1976–, Gesamtausgabe [“MEGA”], Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Marx, Karl and Frederick Engels, 1975–2004, Collected Works [“MECW”], New York: International Publishers / London: Lawrence & Wishart / Moscow: Progress Publishers.

Specific Works

All quotations from Engels in this article follow the translations compiled in the Collected Works (MECW) above. Individually cited works by Engels, other than letters, are listed below by date, with bibliographical information given for the original publication, followed by a crossreference to the MECW edition. (The MECW does not always identify the translator.) In the handful of cases where the standard text in the MECW is based on a later edition that was substantially revised by Engels himself, both the first publication date and the last revised edition are given. In cases where the work in question appeared only posthumously, the date of composition is listed (with an asterisk), instead of the date of first publication, followed by a crossreference to the volume of the Gesamtausgabe (MEGA) that includes a critical edition of the relevant manuscripts.

  • 1842, Schelling und die Offenbarung. Kritik des neuesten Reaktionsversuchs gegen die freie Philosophie, Leipzig (published anonymously); translated as Schelling and Revelation: Critique of the Latest Attempt of Reaction against the Free Philosophy, by Barbara Ruhemann, in MECW 2: 189–240.
  • 1842, Schelling, der Philosoph in Christo, oder die Verklärung der Weltweisheit zur Gottesweisheit, Berlin (published anonymously); translated as Schelling, Philosopher in Christ, or the Transfiguation of World Wisdowm into Divine Wisdom, by Barbara Ruhemann, in MECW 2: 241–264.
  • 1844, “Umrisse zu einer Kritik der Nationalökonomie”, in Deutsch-Französische Jahrbücher, ed. Arnold Ruge and Karl Marx, Paris; translated as “Outlines of a Critique of Political Economy”, in MECW 3: 418–443.
  • 1845 (coauthored with Marx), Die heilige Familie, oder Kritik der kritischen Kritik. Gegen Bruno Bauer und Consorten, Frankfurt am Main; translated as The Holy Family, or Critique of Critical Criticism: Against Bruno Bauer and Company, by Richard Dixon and Celemens Dutt, in MECW 4: 5–211.
  • 1845, Die Lage der arbeitenden Klasse in England. Nach eigner Anschauung und authentischen Quellen, Leipzig; translated as The Condition of the Working-Class in England: From Personal Observation and Authentic Sources, by Florence Kelley-Wischnewetzky, in MECW 4: 295–583.
  • *1845–46 (coauthored with Marx), Die deutsche Ideologie. Kritik der neuesten deutschen Philosophie in ihren Repräsentanten Feuerbach, B. Bauer und Stirner, und des deutschen Sozialismus in seinen verschiedenen Propheten, published only posthumously (see MEGA II/5); translated as The German Ideology: Critique of Modern German Philosophy according to its Representatives Feuerbach, B. Bauer and Stirner, and of German Socialism According to its Various Prophets, by Clemens Dutt, W. Lough, and C. P. Magill, in MECW 5: 19–539.
  • *1847, “Grundsätze des Kommunismus”, published only posthumously (see MEGA I/6); translated as “Principles of Communism”, in MECW 6: 341–357. [This is Engels’s substantial draft of what would become the coauthored Manifesto of the Communist Party, see next.]
  • 1848 (coauthored with Marx), Manifest der Kommunistischen Partei, London; translated as Manifesto of the Communist Party, by Samuel Moore, in MECW 6: 477–517.
  • 1850, “Der deutsche Bauernkrieg”, Neue Rheinische Zeitung. Politisch-ökonomische Revue, No. 5–6, ed. Karl Marx; translated as The Peasant War in Germany, in MECW 10: 397–482.
  • *1852 (coauthored with Marx), Der großen Männer des Exils, published only posthumously (see MEGA I/11); translated as The Great Men of the Exile, by Rodney Livingstone, in MECW 11: 227–326.
  • 1859, [Review of] “Karl Marx, Zur Kritik der politischen Oeconomie”, [serialized in] Das Volk, Nos. 14 and 15; translated as [review of] “Karl Marx, A Contribution to the Critique of Political Economy”, by Salo Ryazanskaya, in MECW 16: 465–477.
  • *1870, Geschichte Irlands, published only posthumously (see MEGA I/21); translated as The History of Ireland, by Barrie Selman, in MECW 21: 145–185.
  • 1872–73, “Zur Wohnungsfrage”, [serialized in] Der Volksstaat, Nos. 51, 52, 53, 103, and 104; second edition [as pamphlet], 1887, Hottingen-Zürich; translated as The Housing Question, in MECW 23: 315–391.
  • *1873–82, Dialektik der Natur, published only posthumously (see MEGA I/26); translated as Dialectics of Nature, by Clemens Dutt, in MECW 25: 311–588.
  • 1878, Herrn Eugen Dühring’s Umwälzung der Wissenschaft, Leipzig [following serial publication in 1877–78 in numerous issues of Vorwarts and Wissenschaftliche Beilage]; third revised edition, 1894, Stuttgart; translated as Herr Eugen Dühring’s Revolution in Science [“Anti-Dühring”], by Emile Burns, in MECW 25: 1–312.
  • 1878b, “Karl Marx”, in Volks-Kalender, ed. Wilhelm Bracke, Brunswick; translated as “Karl Marx”, in MECW 24: 183–195.
  • 1880, Socialisme utopique et Socialisme scientifique, [serialized in] La Revue socialiste, Nos. 3, 4, and 5; translated as Socialism: Utopian and Scientific, by Edward Aveling, in MECW 24: 281–325. [This work was based on several chapters from Anti-Dühring, see above. It was first published in French, with the translation done by Paul Lafargue; in subsequent German editions it appeared under the title Die Entwicklung des Sozialismus von der Utopie zur Wissenschaft. The 1892 English translation by Aveling was from the fourth German edition of 1891.]
  • 1884, Der Ursprung der Familie, des Privateigenthums und des Staats. Im Anschluss an Lewis H. Morgan’s Forschungen, Hottingen-Zürich; fourth revised edition, 1891; translated as The Origin of the Family, Private Property, and the State: In the Light of the Researches by Lewis H. Morgan, in MECW 26: 129–276.
  • 1886 Ludwig Feuerbach und der Ausgang der klassischen deutschen Philosophie, [serialized in] Die Neue Zeit, Nos. 4 and 5; published as pamphlet, 1888, Stuttgart; translated as Ludwig Feuerbach and the End of Classical German Philosophy [“Feuerbach”], in MECW 26: 353–398.
  • 1887, “Vorwort zur zweiten, durchgesehenen Auflage Zur Wohnungsfrage”, [serialized in] Der Sozialdemokrat, Nos. 3 and 4, and in Engels, Zur Wohungsfrage, Hottingen-Zürich; translated as “Preface [to the Second Edition of The Housing Question]”, in MECW 26: 424–433.
  • 1894–95 “Zur Geschichte des Urchristentums”, [serialized in] Die Neue Zeit, Vol. 1, Nos. 1 and 2; translated as “On the History of Early Christianity”, in MECW 27: 445–469.
  • *1895, “Einleitung zu Marx’ Klassenkämpfe in Frankreich 1848 bis 1850”, first published in abridged form in Die Neue Zeit, Vol. 2, Nos. 27 and 28; full text published only posthumously (see MEGA I/32); translated as “Introduction [to Karl Marx’s The Class Struggles in France 1848 to 1850]”, in MECW 27: 506–524.

Secondary sources

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  • Levine, Norman, 1975, The Tragic Deception: Marx Contra Engels, Santa Barbara: Clio Books.
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  • –––, 1997, “Engelsismus,” in Wolfgang Fritz Haug (ed.), Historisch-kritisches Wörterbuch des Marxismus (Volume 3: Ebene bis Extremismus), Hamburg: Argument-Verlag, pp. 384–392; available in English as “Engelsism,” Max Henninger (trans.), Berlin: Rosa Luxemberg Stiftung, 2014. [English translation of Liedman 1997 available online]
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  • Saito, Kohei, 2017, Karl Marx’s Ecosocialism: Capital, Nature, and the Unfinished Critique of Political Economy, New York: Monthly Review Press.
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  • –––, 2022, Marx in the Anthropocene: Towards the Idea of Degrowth Communism, New York: Cambridge University Press.
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  • –––, 1977, “Engels and the Genesis of Marxism,” New Left Review, I/106: 79–104.
  • Steger, Manfred B. and Terrell Carver (eds.), 1999, Engels after Marx, University Park, PA: Pennsylvania State University Press.
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  • Timpanaro, Sebastiano, 1970 [1975], Sul Materialismo, Pisa: Nistri-Lischi; translated as On Materialism by Lawrence Garner, New York: Verso Books, 1975.
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Other Internet Resources

  • Marxists Internet Archive, an extensive online library of work by Marx and Engels and by later figures in the Marxist traditions, along with reference material and other relevant intellectual-historical resources.
  • Marx-Engels-Gesamtausgabe project (in German), the critical edition of all extant writing by Marx and Engels (still in progress).

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Matt Shafer <mshafer@fiu.edu>

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