Susanne Langer

Susanne K. Langer (born Susanne Katherina Knauth, 1895–1985) was and remains a widely-read and influential American philosopher, best known for her analyses of language, mind, art and ritual in terms of her notion of symbolic form, derived primarily from her study of logic, music, and the philosophical ideas of Sheffer, the early Wittgenstein, Russell, Whitehead, and Cassirer. Studying in Vienna in 1921, during the 1920s and 30s Langer gave pioneering readings of Frege, Russell, Whitehead and the early Wittgenstein, embedding their work within an American context in logic and philosophy stemming from the pragmatism, semiotics and philosophy of mind of Royce, Peirce, James and Sheffer and the Gestalt theory of Köhler (Sheffer, who studied under Royce and James, articulated “neutral monism” as a pragmatic theory as well as post-Principia mathematical logic; see Sheffer 1908; Russell 1927: Chapter 1). She published one of the first introductions to “analytic philosophy” (1930b) and the first modern textbook in symbolic logic in English (1937a). She then generalized her theory of meaning to music, language and culture in Philosophy in a New Key (Langer 1942 [1957], hereafter “PNK”), which, with the help of the New American Library’s Mentor mass market edition of 1948, sold over 600,000 copies, making it one of the best-selling English language philosophy texts of the twentieth century (Dryden 2003a,b; Isaac 2020; Windle 2024). The book helped broaden English speakers’ understanding of Cassirer’s work on symbolic forms, which Langer had already appealed to in her dissertation (1926a); she would later collaborate with Cassirer in New York and translate his Language and Myth (1946) into English.

Langer’s Feeling and Form, A Theory of Art Developed from Philosophy in a New Key (1953, hereafter “FF”) invented the notion of “virtual reality”, generalizing Langer’s theory of music in PNK to all the arts. It made her one of the most influential American philosophers of art of her time. Insisting that feeling constitutes a basic strand in the evolution of human culture and thought, Langer influenced philosophers (e.g., her students Arthur Danto, Nelson Goodman, Howard Gardner, and Peter Kivy) and important critics and artists (e.g., Clement Greenberg, Eva Hesse, Walker Percy, and Elizabeth Bishop [Wehr 1993]). Though she was undercited in the 1960s–1990s (Isaac 2020; Verhaegh 2022; Dengerink Chaplin 2020: ch. 3; Auxier 2024), Langer achieved lasting academic and cultural recognition in the philosophy of music and dance, and also during her lifetime as a public intellectual, writing on of philosophy of science, world politics, art, education, and social design, as well as linguistics, semiotics, the anthropology of art, biology, and psychology. Her notion of symbolic form is increasingly discussed today as questions about virtuality, symbolic form and politics rise to the fore of philosophy’s concern with new media, digital cultures, and political, phenomenological and economic aspects of algorithmic technology (Chalmers 2022; Massumi 2011, 2015, 2024).

Langer’s trilogy Mind: An Essay on Human Feeling (1967–1982) pioneered a systems approach to the emergence of consciousness from its evolutionary biological roots. Extending her notions of feeling and form, Langer offered an encyclopedic review of the biology, neurology, psychology, ethology, and anthropological hypotheses about human culture of her time, treating the emergence of organic life from matter, animal ethology, and the higher-order emergence of various systems of culture in terms of a general notion of act, differentiated into a range of organic forms of life-processes and adaptations (impact and response, reflex, association, sign languages of animals, etc.). This conceptual work foreshadowed the affective turn in neurology and philosophy of mind, as well as the philosophical turn toward animal ethology, environment, and forms of life, offering an early alternative, both to cybernetics and to behaviorism (Dryden 2007).

• 1. Overview
• 2. Life, Career, Politics
• 3. Early Work (1924–1939)
  • 3.1 Metaphysics
  • 3.2 Neutral “Monism” (M.A. Thesis, 1924a)
  • 3.3 A Logical Analysis of Meaning: Dissertation (1926a)
  • 3.4 Early Analytic Philosophy and Logic (1926–1939)
• 4. Philosophy in a New Key (1942)
• 5. Theory of Art (1945–1966)
• 6. Mind: An Essay on Human Feeling (1967–1982)
• Bibliography
  • A. Primary Literature
  • B. Translations by Langer
  • C. Secondary Literature
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Overview

Langer argues that the human mind is less like a telephone switchboard working up associative connections for practical purposes than it is “like a great projector” (PNK ch. II; 1944, 139), a “transformer” of feelings (perceptions, emotions, selective attentions, imaginings, etc.) and signs into expressive symbols (language, culture, mentality, dream, art). What she calls symbolic transformation is a natural human activity lifting us out of the immediate world of material survival and instinct, allowing us to develop higher-order “forms” of reasoning, thinking and feeling (PNK Preface). Human beings live, Langer wrote,

as much by symbols as by sense report, in a realm compounded of tangible things and images, of actual events and ominous portents, always between fact and fiction. (1944: 127)

This distinguishes us from other animals with whom we share many biological needs and the capacity for associating signs with events (PNK ch. II). Our mental life evolves in complex, higher-order ways from the most basic physical, biological and animal processes, an evolution of “form” whose shapes Langer characterized in her last three books, the trilogy Mind: An Essay on Human Feeling (1967–1982, hereafter “MEHF”).

According to Langer, the expressive symbolic “languages” of dream, ritual, art, religion and politics do not serve representation, denotation, reference and propositional articulation as “discursive” symbolisms do in science and mathematics; they are “presentational” in that they show but do not say. But they do not simply express the subjective state or intention of the creator; instead they are occurrent, concrete, symbolizing formations of organic feeling and life, creating “semblances” or Schein, to use Schiller’s term (see §5 below). Ritual, sacrament, dream, myth and the arts build up what she calls “virtual” and “illusory” spaces, times, motions, rhythms, movements and other forms of symbolization in art, religion, and politics. The various arts are differentiated by their specific guiding primary “illusions” and the structured conceptualizations of experience provided by our “symbolific” nature, in which the cognitive and the emotional are intertwined (PNK 34). It is characteristic that symbol and “meaning” (what is symbolized) are reversible, depending upon our interest: our perceptual experience is typically laced with both what is felt as present and what is felt as dream-like and illusory, a symbolized consciousness of the biological distinction Langer draws between what an organism takes on as impact, and what as autonomous action.

In broaching the notion of “virtual reality”, Langer developed notions of illusion, semblance, and virtuality in her FF that have proved influential in philosophy of culture and philosophy of mind (Massumi 2011; Lanier 2017; Chalmers 2022; Leddy 2024). Chalmers (2022) takes Langer’s notions to preclude an experience of “reality” in virtual space by construing her “semblances” as “hallucinations”. Given Langer’s dual-dimensional conception of symbolic form, her pluralistic notion of “facts”, her conception of science, and the fundamentality of her conception of feeling to “presence” and “psychic distance”, it is unclear how far Chalmers is correct: philosophically Langer was stimulated less by questions of skepticism than by the challenge of framing a naturalistic account of mental activity, consciousness and unconsciousness (Langer 1924a; 1929; MEHF I, II, III) and explaining the role of imagination in specific arts (Leddy 2024; Man 2024). Moreover she insisted, as theorists of video games do, that our sense of agency spans the virtual and the real. Her notion of “form” was intended to secure the public, shareable aspects of thought and experience in the sciences and the arts while lifting cognitive and aesthetic response above the practical levels of purpose and play (PNK ch. VI).

Langer’s thought falls into three main periods. From 1924–1939 she worked in logic, philosophy of science, early analytic philosophy, and Gestalt psychology, offering pioneering interpretations of Frege, Husserl, Whitehead, Russell and Wittgenstein’s Tractatus in her dissertation (1926a), importing the ideas of the Vienna Circle to the United States, and authoring many articles and three books: a collection of children’s fairy tales (1923), an introduction to the new “analytic” philosophy (1930b), and one of the earliest American textbooks of modern symbolic logic (1937a). In the 1940s–1960s she published PNK, worked with Cassirer, and developed her influential theory of art, participating in public discussion of the cultural importance of the arts (FF, 1957, 1958, 1962b). Finally, her naturalistic treatment of the biology, neurology, ethology and evolved anthropological forms of life and feeling culminated in her non-reductive account of mentality in MEHF. Langer also wrote throughout her life as a public intellectual on problems of immigration, displacement, politics, war, authoritarianism, world government and democratic education (1922, 1930a, 1945b, 1949b, 1951c, 1962b, 1965 [1966], 1966).

In 1953 drafts of Word and Object, rejecting Cartesianism’s myth of interiority, Quine invoked Langer:

Philosophy in a New Key … stresses the moral: the forerunner of language is to be sought not in primitive noises, but in early symbolic behavior…the earliest phase of symbolism, for the individual and for the race, would seem to be emotive… [and] … similar unconscious symbolism is what packs the wallop in poetry and art, and what gives vigor to myths … speech and song began as one. (Verhaegh 2022: 230–31; PNK 128)

Langer continues to influence philosophers and anthropologists interested in popular culture, semiotics, and politics (Massumi 2011, 2015, 2024; Leddy 2024), as well as dance and music, improvisation, creativity, cross-cultural analysis, religion, and child development (Geertz 1973; Colapietro 1997, 2000; Man 2020, 2024; Alperson 2022; van Eeke 2024; Innis 2024; von Bonsdorff 2025).

The literature on Langer is codified in Lachmann (1993), a thorough (German) bibliography of primary and secondary literature on Langer to that point. This was extended in Schultz’s (2000) on Cassirer and in Dryden (2003a,b). Kösters (1993), the first German book on Langer, was followed by Lachmann (2000) and more recent studies by Richter and Bahr ([eds] 2008), Innis (2009), Dengerink Chaplin (2020) and Gaikis ([ed.] 2024); a subset of secondary sources are cited in what follows. Langer is frequently treated or reprinted in anthologies surveying philosophy of arts and aesthetics (e.g., Guter 2010; Guyer 2014; Carroll & Choi [eds] 2006), American aesthetics (Gulick & Slater [eds] 2020; Innis 2020b), philosophy of music and dance (Budd 1985; Kivy 1989, 2002; Man 2020, 2024), and broad treatments of the history of American naturalism and pragmatism (Dryden 1997a, 2001; Innis 2007, 2009, 2016).

A multi-national effort led by Iris van der Tuin at the University of Utrecht has scanned and begun to digitally analyze the extensive card catalog collection from which Langer worked 1938–1985 (see the Other Internet Resources section below; for other manuscript materials see the website of the Susanne K. Langer Circle and Langer’s Papers, also in Other Internet Resources). The card catalog in particular opens new possibilities for the cartography of the history of philosophy in general, and twentieth century philosophy in particular (van der Tuin 2016, 2024), for it consists of over 64,000 pages of cross-referenced quotations and commentary on 4,000+ references and 2,158 authors, including over 1,000 women (Lord 1968; van der Tuin 2024). Langer responds to work of German-, French-, Italian- and English-speaking philosophers, anthropologists, historians, logicians, artists and biologists as these unfolded, commenting at length on a huge variety of anthropological, aesthetic, historical, philosophical, psychological, scientific, artistic and linguistic sources.

Preferring to be considered a “philosopher” rather than a “woman philosopher”, Langer belonged to the first generation of women allowed to vote throughout their adult lives and pursue academic careers in the United States. Her intellectual and artistic connections, pursued through her interest in studio art, children’s literature and democratic education, embed her in the history of feminism in the twentieth century; she worked with many women artists and influenced others (Bergonzo 2024). She joins the history of women interested in semiotics, language, philosophical analysis, logic and meaning from a wide-ranging point of view (Peijnenburg & Verhaegh [eds] 2022), commenting on many women philosophers and artists, including Lady Welby, Christine Ladd Franklin, Dorothy Wrinch, Susan Stebbing, Grace De Laguna, Mary Calkins, and Hannah Arendt, among many others.

2. Life, Career, Politics

The daughter of upper middle-class German immigrants to the United States, Langer was raised bilingually in New York, reading Kant’s Kritik der Reinen Vernunft and Alcott’s Little Women in the originals at twelve and later becoming fluent in French and Italian (Sargeant 1960: 91f.; Dryden 2003a,b; Dengerink 2020: 15). Poisoned by a poorly dosed cocaine prescription, she suffered ill health and did not enter Radcliffe, where she studied as an undergraduate (1916–1920), until the age of twenty-one (Dengerink 2020: 266, n. 8; Dryden 2003a,b). She began her study of logic and philosophy of science as an undergraduate with Sheffer, who remained a formative and lasting influence on her subsequent work; Langer is a primary source for understanding his philosophy in its Harvard context, an American tradition stemming from Royce, Peirce, and James through Lewis and Quine. Her use of logic as an inventive field for abstracting higher-order forms allowing for different “loci” of elements fleshes out Sheffer’s algebraical approach, commended by Russell in his introduction to the second edition of Principia Mathematica (1925; Sheffer 1926). Langer took from Sheffer and Huntington the Kantian idea that logic is a canon, not an organon: it can only serve to prevent errors by offering novel concepts, not positive knowledge. The use of logic, she argues, “rests with … imagination” (Langer 1938b).

Langer married historian William L. Langer in 1921. They spent that winter term in Vienna, where she studied with Victor Kraft (Lachmann 2000: 19) and probably read Wittgenstein’s Tractatus (1921). She studied the psychology of Gestalt theorists (Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 14; Verhaegh 2022: 219 n. 12). Upon return to the United States in 1922 Langer had her first child and moved to Worcester, Massachusetts where her husband took up a position at Clark University. Her first book, The Cruise of the Little Dipper and Other Fairy Tales (1923), illustrated by her friend, the artist Helen Sewall, came out the year after her first child’s birth. Her (1924a) Radcliffe M.A. thesis treated the notion of the unconscious.

Enrolling as a Radcliffe PhD student in 1924, Langer met Whitehead and attended his Harvard graduate seminar 1924–1925 during the period of her pregnancy with her second son (Lachmann 1997; Dryden 2003a,b); her notes of his lectures have been published (Langer 1924–1927 [1997]). They reveal Langer’s exposure to the history of philosophy and mathematics and physics, as well as Whitehead’s metaphysics of process and history, alongside several other ideas that would significantly influence her: the importance of the potential as something given with the actual; symbolism as an evolving framework for feeling and thought; the centrality of our aesthetic receptivity to perception; the fundamentality of relations; “givenness” as something relative to conceptual choice and occasion; and the centrality of process to metaphysics.

Langer’s remarkable dissertation, entitled A Logical Analysis of Meaning (1926a), was written under the supervision of Whitehead, Sheffer, and C.I. Lewis and cataloged at Radcliffe, as Harvard did not grant women PhD’s until 1963; she published in logic and analytic philosophy through the 1930s (§3 below). She taught as a tutor in philosophy at Radcliffe 1927–1942, advising undergraduates for their general exams, and as a lecturer in logic at Wellesley College in 1934. In 1941 she accompanied her historian husband William L. Langer to Washington, D.C. when he joined the foreign intelligence service (W. Langer 1977). In 1942, after publishing PNK, she and William Langer divorced. Her teaching relationship with Radcliffe ended in 1943, when she took the first of a series of temporary appointments that supported her over the next twelve years. Langer appears to have chosen to forego a permanent appointment at an undergraduate college in favor of a research appointment at a graduate institution. Peregrinating for a dozen years in temporary positions, she lectured widely, befriending artists and writing on education, the arts, philosophy and politics (Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 54). She worked with Cassirer 1941–1945 after he emigrated to the United States, apparently influencing his Essay on Man (1944; Auxier 1997: 87n–88n; Guyer 2014: vol. III, 354) and translating his Language and Myth (1925 [1946]). Tenured at Connecticut College in 1954 at age 58, she received a grant from the Kaufmann Charitable Trust (1956–1981) that freed her from teaching, allowing her time to write MEHF.

Langer frequently wrote as a public intellectual, convinced that philosophy should speak to broad issues of public concern. “Art,” she wrote, “is … the spearhead of human development, social and individual” (1966: 5) for it expresses freedom; “any miscarriage of the symbolic process is an abrogation of our human freedom” (PNK 290; Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 91). Her first publication concerned the impact of deportation and immigration (1922), and she wrote on human-caused environmental degradation, the rapidity of the cultural, political and emotional transformations wrought by modern science and the globalization of economies, nationalism as a destructive symbolic “idol” (1944), the relation between philosophy and education (1956), the difference between “civilization” and “culture” (1962b), and the significance of modern industrial and popular design (1965) [1966], among other topics. During the McCarthy era she defended the need for protections of individual freedom against the demands of militarized industrial democracies and argued for the importance of strengthening the United Nations to sustain world peace (1951c); she even proposed, in a Neurathian spirit of isotypes, that a spiral would be a better symbol of that institution than the projected map of the globe (1949b).

Langer read widely in the history of the destruction and forced migration of indigenous cultures in the United States. She knew Felix S. Cohen, a fellow student of Sheffer’s who became the most significant Native American Lawyer and anti-formalist legal theorist of his generation. Langer cites Cohen 1929 on the logic of questions (PNK 4) and published an article he wrote on field theory and judicial logic (Cohen 1950, cf. Henle, Kallen, & Langer [eds] 1951). In 1948 she attempted unsuccessfully to invite Einstein, E.B. White, and Oppenheimer to participate in a session of the APA meeting on World Society and World government, expressing shock at the lack of interest among professional American philosophers in shaping political and ethical concepts. In December 1953, she was named delegate to the National Council for UNESCO and the International Congress on History of Art by the American Philosophical Association; later in 1970 the Nixon administration published a Spanish translation of PNK without her permission and attempted to recruit her to serve on the American Security Council to defend the Vietnam war, but she declined, expressing disagreement with White House policies (Langer, Carton 1b, Harvard University Susanne K. Langer archives).

3. Early Work (1924–1939)

3.1 Metaphysics

Following Whitehead (1926) Langer holds that each human “epoch” reflects a core “generative idea” shaping the human “pursuit of meanings”. Philosophy’s job is to clarify meanings, analyzing their forms and generating basic concepts to organize them (1930b: 105; MEHF I: xx). Meanings always have a psychological factor, although they may be treated logically (1926a: 108).

Our time’s idea is symbolism, a ubiquitous mark of human mentality (Whitehead 1927; PNK 239). The forms of meaning, even mind itself, are not entities, as they were conceived in the Cartesian era, but higher-order aspects of symbolic activity, itself an evolved set of human patterns and relations within nature. Experience, sensation, perception, thought, action and creation are phase-transitions of order among relations, realized in embodied processes, particular space-time events that “include facts, notions, feelings, qualities, etc. as well as things” (1926a: 107–8).

For Langer the distinctions between form and content, substance and accident, and mind and body do not mark fundamental categorial divisions but are logical or “formal” (Langer 1924a, 1926a, 1926c). Her hermeneutics of “meaning”, inspired by American pragmatism and semiotics (Colapietro 1998; Innis 2009), is supported by her studies of modern logic. She shared Cassirer’s neo-Kantian aspiration “‘to compile a grammar of the symbolic function as such’ for language, art, mythology and religion” (Langer 1926a: 170, quoting Cassirer 1923–1927 Vol. 1:86) by stressing the importance—derived from Frege (1892a,b [1997], 1893/1903 [2013]), Whitehead and Russell (1910), and Sheffer (1921)—of generalizations in the theory of relations in modern logic that outstrip the older, static “substance/property” forms of Aristotelian logic (Langer 1926a: 36, 62, 55).

As a philosopher of logic, Langer never tried to produce a metaphysics, although, like Whitehead, she took metaphysics to be necessary, a “study of basic assumptions … in terms of which every element of our experience can be interpreted” (Langer & Gadol 1950; Langer 1951a, 1962b: 6–7, 1967; Dengerink Chaplin 2020: ch. 6). Whitehead (1929) inspired her conception of “organic form” as processual (Langer 1924–27 [1997]; Dryden 1997b; Dengerink Chaplin 2020: ch. 6). Reacting to Frege, Russell and Wittgenstein she developed an account of facts as immediate, yet never ultimate in form (Langer 1926c, 1933). Critical assessments of Langer’s “ontology” have produced little agreement about her ultimate stance, though authors note her engagement with conceptions of mind and reality (Lachmann 1997, 2000; Auxier 1997, 2008; Felappi 2017, 2024), her anticipation of later “metaontological” themes (McDaniel 2017), (Dryden 1997a,b, 2001), and her conviction, later absorbed into systems biology and philosophy of mind, that consciousness is a substrate of human psychology, grounded in a feeling, thought, and emotion (Dryden 2007; Dengerink Chaplin 2020).

The chief interpretive challenge for readers of Langer’s work is to characterize “symbolic form” as both expressive and logically higher-order—something essentially abstract—while adhering to her naturalistic conception of symbolization as an embodied, concrete process in human life (Auxier 1997).

3.2 Neutral “Monism” (M.A. Thesis, 1924a)

Langer never conceived of logic as a branch of psychology comprising the “laws of thought” (1926a: 16, n.); she argued instead that the “logical forms” of meaning should apply to mental categories. Her debts to William James (a teacher of Sheffer’s) were large (Dryden 2001). Her 1924a MA thesis is a critical study of von Hartmann’s dualistic Philosophy of the Unconscious (1882 [1884]; see von Hartmann 1877, Beiser 2014; Langer also studied his philosophy of art, including philosophy of music [von Hartmann 1886, 1887]). Langer defends the “unconscious” as a tool of psychological explanation through a logical analysis of the distinction between “unconscious” and “conscious”. She traces von Hartmann’s differences from Schopenhauer’s “classical voluntarism” (Langer 1924a: 26) noting his importance for Freud, particularly in having emphasized the tendency we have to imbue matter with “force” dualistically—something contemporary physics has outgrown. Langer denies that materialism can render consciousness an epiphenomenon; she criticizes Freud for having collapsed what he called the “virtual” character of psychic elements into materialistic ones (1924a: 36). Instead, she elaborates James’s (1904) idea of a “psychology without the self”, or “neutral monism” (developed by Sheffer in his dissertation (1908)), emphasizing the relational, attentional and value-laden character of the distinction between mental and physical. Langer (1924a) takes “mind”, “experience”, “consciousness” and “matter” to be differentiated only relative to “systems” formulated in descriptions of particular modes of existence and relation: what is “neutral” is not, she argues, a monistic “stuff” (1924a: 17)—contrary to Russell (1921)—but instead an “abstract form” or field of relations encompassing a number of possible valuations or orderings of experience (Langer 1924a: 3, 15, 42).

On this view it is not a metaphysical illusion that there are two kinds of ontological basics, the (conscious) “mental” and the “physical” (as “neutral monism” would have it). The mental is not simply epiphenomenal. Rather, there are two “forms” or “systems” of description of space-time events. The notion of the “unconscious” is “purely pragmatic and not strictly correct”, something constructed as an ideal point, analogous to the mathematician’s idea of lines that “meet at infinity” (1924a: Preface). This constructive Russellian approach—a “consciousness-event” is a “variable” that may be instantiated with relations among other events—allows her to argue that, generally speaking, we cannot “compute” the range of its possible modes of modification. She thus leaves open the possibility of discovering causal laws in psychology, but takes the “mind-system” to appear to be “infinitely complex” (1924a: 42). The system of conscious events consists of an open-ended evolution of possible classes or functions of modification, not “things”. Similarly an “unconscious” event is not (as in Freud) the lasting substrate behind a marker or “symptom” of repression, but rather an explanatory “symbol” capable of analysis in terms of possible modifications of conscious mental events. This makes sense of von Hartmann, Freud’s, and Jung’s treatment of the Unconscious as “timeless” and “unspatial”, as well as un-thinglike.

3.3 A Logical Analysis of Meaning: Dissertation (1926a)

Langer’s dissertation is the first in the United States to comprehensively treat the history of logic and theories of meaning—including phenomenology—from the early nineteenth century through 1926. Her annotated bibliography is an invaluable guide to the period. She focuses on Frege, Husserl, Couturat, Russell, Whitehead, Sheffer, and Wittgenstein, treating theories of meaning from Boole, Lady Welby, Peirce, and Cournot to Stout, Ogden, and Richards and many others, critically analyzing English, American, Italian, German, French and Polish sources. It shows the influence, not only of Whitehead and Sheffer, but also her tutor R.F.A. Hoernlé, a phenomenologist of meaning (see Hoernlé 1921), referred to in Langer’s 1926a dissertation). His wife, Agnes Winifred Hoernlé, whom Langer also knew, was the founder of social anthropology in South Africa. The Hoernlés lived in Boston 1914–1920, and became leading liberal critics of apartheid, publishing widely on race, anthropology, and social reform. Hoernlé became critical of Langer’s enthusiasm for logic (Hoernlé 1931) is a review of Langer’s first book 1930b).

Langer’s interpretation of the Tractatus in her dissertation is pioneering. Inspired by Wittgenstein’s “picture” conception, she defines the “logical basis of meaning” as the possibility of drawing a “correspondence of configuration among systems”—a necessary, though not sufficient, purely “formal” condition (1926a: 2, 10). Langer does not hold that isomorphism is sufficient for meaning, as her later critics would allege (Nagel 1943; Beardsley 1958 [1981: 335ff.]; Kivy 1989: 49, 61–64): she is not offering an analysis or Carnapian meaning-postulates. On her view logic concerns projectible relations of order and invariance among systems: forms rather than actual elements, and form is the possibility of structure (Tractatus 2.0333). Following Russell (1914), a form is not a constituent or a thing, but a (projectible) way in which constituents of a system or structure fit together (Langer 1926a: 36; 1926b; 1930b: 91–2; 1937a: 32–33; Felappi 2017, 2024). Langer extrapolates, as did Wittgenstein, to the idea that in philosophy we are concerned to see “possibilities of interpretation” rather than defend or demolish propositions (1930b: x).

This is the first reading to challenge a naïve isomorphic copy or empiricist interpretation of the Tractatus by invoking modality (Dengerink Chaplin 2020; Floyd & Shieh 2024): Langer echoes Cassirer’s point that

the naïve copy theory of knowledge is discredited … [and] the fundamental concepts of each science are regarded no longer as passive images of something given but as symbols created by the intellect itself. (1923 [1953: 75])

Wittgenstein’s analogy takes propositions to be picture-facts, embodied uses of configurations of signs that symbolize other facts through projection of possibilities (Dengerink Chaplin 2019, 2020, 2024); Langer stresses the idea that any such projection expresses a particular (possible) way of ordering and conceiving reality.

Following Wittgenstein, Langer argues for the reversibility of meaning-projections. Just as a range of configurations of figurines in a law court may be used (via spatial, colored, and other forms) to model a range of possible situations given conventional assignments of denotation to them, so also situations may be used to model possible configuration of figurines in the law court. That-which-is-common-to-all-possible-expressions-of-a-discursive-thought is given, not through any particular sentence, but through forms, the possibilities of projecting embodied configurations, and these are symmetrical and reversible. Langer argues that her analysis is more comprehensive than the asymmetrical theories of meaning to be found in Husserl’s doctrine of intentionality, Couturat’s (1905 [1914]) “ideational” algebraical account of logic, and Ogden and Richard’s causal theory—each of which Langer analyzes, along with Principia Mathematica, as rival “interpretations” or models of Couturat’s logical axioms for algebra.

Langer adopts from Royce and Sheffer an algebraical view of logic as the most general study of all types of order or pattern, of which the propositional system is merely a special one (Langer 1924a: 42; 1926a: Preface; 1927: 123; 1951a: 179; Felappi 2024). On this view, “logical forms” are formulated through progressive generalization and abstraction on relations; properties are handled, not only first-order (e.g., in empirical statements) but also higher-order (within systems). As Langer knew, the Tractatus utilizes as its primitive logical operation Sheffer’s (1913) reduction of the truth-functional connectives to single “strokes” of joint and alternate denial, which demonstrates that they comprise a Boolean algebra (Pilch 2024). Such structures, as Langer also knew, may be codified in “postulate systems”—“postulate” being pragmatically preferred to “axiom” to avoid the connotation of “self-evidence” (Huntington 1911: 171f.; Langer 1937a: 184; 1938b: 49; Floyd 2021: 32). To take another example, logically the real and complex numbers differ concretely as systems, while sharing the “form” of an algebraical field. Langer’s emphasis is on transformations among of systems of relations. This is evinced in her “youthful” Shefferian axiomatization of the tonal structure of Western music (Langer 1929a; FF 105, n. 2). Whether her logico-mathematical inspiration makes her treatment of form too abstract is a matter of debate (Kivy 1989: 63), but she undoubtedly worked toward making her ideas more concrete as her philosophy developed, and its second-order character must be borne in mind.

As Sheffer stressed, when relations are transformed or projected one must avoid entanglement in the “relativity” of particular elements and notations: “2” in the reals is not identical to “2” in the whole numbers, but a projected form (Sheffer 1921; Langer 1926a). Every notation or language reflects certain idiosyncratic, accidental, and conventional choices. Like Frege, Sheffer, and the early Wittgenstein, Langer was adamantly opposed to linguistic formalism, psychologism, and conventionalism about logic and meaning: she endorsed a universal account of the applicability of logic and meaning. We face, as Sheffer (1926) wrote, the “logocentric predicament”: to give an account of logic, we must use it (Langer 1926a: 1, 20). Inspired by Frege’s proposal in his (1906 [1984]) debate with Hilbert over axiomatic theories of geometry, Sheffer developed higher-order logical analysis to transcend the limitations, ambiguities, and psychological vagaries of particular systems and pure formalism, formulating “superpostulates” of propositional functions (Sheffer 1921). Langer supports this approach (1926a: 30; 1964b: 307). On this view logic extrudes every logically “ineffable” notion, all extra-logical experiences and acts, and all arbitrary, ad hoc devices, transcending purely conventional “human” features of the expression of thoughts, while universally encompassing “queer” and other differing “logics”, mental factors, and forms of expression (Sheffer 1908, 1909; Floyd 2021: §2.2.4).

Wittgenstein too extruded the arbitrary, the “inexpressible” and the “alogical” from his conception of logic in the Tractatus. Langer argues—anticipating later “resolute” readers—that Wittgenstein’s treatment of “meaning” is, while based on the uses of signs as symbols, expressively adequate, involving no “ineffable” realm of contents that are shown and not said (1926a: 19, 68, 72; Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 154). But she argues that Wittgenstein took the nature of the proposition to be fundamental to logic, as she does not. Following the American algebraical tradition, she argues that “the universe of possible meanings includes [but is not exhausted by] the meaning of propositions”, i.e., the propositional interpretation of logic is only one among others (1926a: Preface; compare Quine 1934). On her more comprehensive view there is no general “inexpressibility”, only unprojectability relative to particular configurations. This allows Langer an unbounded plurality of “meaningful” conceptions of reality, experience and relational structures (1926a: Preface, 2; 1926c: 437; Felappi 2024), the encompassing of Wittgenstein had called “higher” meanings (1921: 6.42; Langer 1926a: 2). “A system of logic which is universal”, she writes, “[is one that] expresses disjunctively either the laws of mathematics, of structure, of literary art, of thought …, or of anything else whatever” (1926a: 26–27). Thus, like Wittgenstein, though differently, she widens the purview of ethical significance to include fairy tales, art, and imagery (1926a: 136; Thaventhiran 2024).

Langer argues that “meanings”, determined as “positions in a system”, underlie the possibility of expression by analogy, metaphor, and allegory (1926a: 88n, 136). She follows Wittgenstein and Frege in speaking of the need for metaphorical “elucidations” of the fundamental notions of logic (Wittgenstein 1921: 6.54; Langer 1926a: 16, 27, 140), while agreeing with Wittgenstein’s remark (1921: 4.015) that the possibility of all similes and imagery in our language depends upon logical form. For Langer the logic of picturing rests just as much upon the possibility of similes as the other way around. She then gestures toward a future analysis of art, invoking Gestalt theorist Köhler to argue that in ordering the play of feelings and perceptions we “make that correlation between elements of different systems known as ‘synthaesthesia’”, that “it is through the testimony of our feelings that we come to recognize the correspondence between two artistic compositions or between such a composition and a configurationtion of events” and that “this correspondence between ‘synaesthetic’ systems is the basis of meaning in art” (1926a: 166–7).

3.4 Early Analytic Philosophy and Logic (1926–1939)

Langer was a leader among the rising generation of analytic philosophers at Harvard in the 1920s and 1930s, importing ideas from Vienna and organizing a series of philosophical discussions modeled on the Vienna Circle. Feigl wrote to Schlick in 1930 that he

was delighted to meet Susanne Langer, who is a professor here at Radcliffe College … She is an excellent woman and her versatility is admirable… She … speaks German as well as English…. We (i.e., a group of young people who are interested in logic and philosophy…) meet at her place every Monday evening for discussions on the Viennese model;

Feigl described Langer’s discussion group as “excellent”, finding her “amusingly” like Wittgenstein in her “demeanour, intuitive determination, and the conciseness of her statements” (Verhaegh 2022: 224). Carnap expressed an interest in working with her in his 1933 Rockefeller application (Verhaegh 2022: 223).

Langer’s earliest post-dissertation philosophical work consisted of a stream of pioneering articles on symbols, analysis and logical types (1926b,c; 1927, 1929a,b). Her dissertation argued that although Principia’s notation for propositional function, \(\hat{\varphi}x\) “cannot be rendered verbally” (1926a: 52f.), the ascent from type to type does not yield ambiguity if it is understood purely “formally”. This echoes Tractatus 3.333, but Langer actually means her own notion of “formal”: whereas Wittgenstein rejected Russell’s axiom of reducibility as contingently true, hence not logical (Tractatus 6.1233), Langer (1926a,b) sides with Russell’s proposal in the second edition of Principia (1925: xxx): movement from type to type is projection through similarity, so that \(\hat{\varphi}x\) is a “true abstraction”, hence not ambiguous at all, and there is no need for a special axiom.

Langer next introduced a “paradox” concerning the relation of form to content, emphasizing their ultimate inseparability for purposes of analysis (1926c). Recasting the more well-known logical paradoxes, she argues that there is neither an overarching totality of all forms nor just one form of an object or proposition, because each object and each proposition may be projected into many different systems, and a form always inheres in a system (1926c: 437; Felappi 2017, 2024). This pluralism, owing debts to James’s pragmatism, Russell and Wittgenstein’s conceptions of “form”, Sheffer’s theory of “notational relativity” and to C.I. Lewis’s conceptual pragmatism (Langer & Gadol 1950: 126), prefigures Carnap’s pluralistic “constructive” program in analytic philosophy (Verhaegh 2022: 221).

Langer’s pluralism is supported by her Tractatus-inspired analysis of meaning. The field of all possible analogies cannot be captured in a single proposition (1926a: 48, 88n, 92), though particular metaphors may be correct or incorrect, tight or loose, in a given context (1926a: 112, 159). In Langer (1927) she argues that Russell’s (1906) struggles with negative facts and the notion of “assertion” in the “verb” of a proposition may be resolved by taking propositions to express “inter-structural relations” of “analogy” and “projection” among systems (Felappi 2017). Langer’s 1929b argues that skeptical doubt is an inevitable result of making a demand for absolute truth, which is in turn driven by the refusal to admit that necessity is always relative to a system: the key flaw in traditional metaphysics lies in the tendency to treat concepts as entities and to begin with broad concepts (“cause”, etc.) instead of with systems (a point made also in the Tractatus). In asking whether consciousness exists (1904), for example, James should instead have asked, “Can we talk coherently about consciousness?” (Langer 1929b: 383).

A founding member of The Journal of Symbolic Logic, from 1926 to 1939 Langer reviewed nineteen logic and philosophy books in German, French, English, and Italian. Her first philosophy book, The Practice of Philosophy (1930b), was an introduction to “analytic” philosophy, developing ideas in her dissertation and intended as an introduction to philosophy for a general audience. Situating her conception of the “logical basis of meaning” in historical terms, she argued that a “synoptic”, “bird’s-eye view of all things … cannot be established by direct preoccupation with the cosmos as such” (1930b: 215), but only through analysis. She defends her quest for the discovery of “general patterns” and the importance for philosophy of “a systematic view of possibilities”, i.e., a knowledge of forms which would yield the ability to swiftly, independently, and clear-sightedly understand meanings “in nature, in life, in ritual and art” (1930b: 218, 221). Invoking her reading of the Tractatus, she criticizes the idea of an absolute “first cause” as a “pseudo-concept” on grounds that the concept of a particular cause has a place only within nature, not outside of it (1930b: 61ff.; see Langer 1936). The book was taken in the United States to indicate Langer’s importance for the “new movement” in philosophy (Blumberg & Feigl 1931: 281) and was actively discussed in the Vienna Circle, praised especially by Schlick (Verhaegh 2022: 216ff.).

Langer’s An Introduction to Symbolic Logic (1937a, still in print) was one of the first American textbooks in modern symbolic quantificational logic, offering a through treatment of the notions of logical form, relation, terms and degree, and difficulties of natural language and logical symbolism. She treats the idea of a truth-value and the differences between deductive, inductive and mixed systems of inference, the quantifiers, elementary class theory (including Shefferian postulate theories for it), and includes a chapter on the algebra of logic where she sets out the phenomenon of duality (e.g., any class formed with \(+\) may also be expressed in terms of \(\times\) and negation). She discusses Principia Mathematica’s use of the “material conditional” in light of “logistic” and mentions C.I. Lewis’s “strict implication” (Lewis 1918; Lewis & Langford 1932). Her textbook received positive reviews (Feigl 1938; Stebbing 1938) but, while very competent for the time, was not particularly mathematical. Carnap and Quine each expressed disappointment with it from this point of view, though it was clear that Langer was pushing in a very different direction.

4. Philosophy in a New Key (1942)

Cassirer’s “masterstroke” was, for Langer, to “emphasize the constitutive character of symbolic renderings in the making of [human] ‘experience’”, transforming neo-Kantianism

into an anthropological hypothesis, a key to several linguistic problems, a source of psychological understanding, and a guidepost in the maze of Geistesgeschichte. (Langer 1949a: 393)

The first book in English to present Cassirer, PNK generalized Langer’s theory of symbolism in this way, revitalizing his thought. Langer read Cassirer early (1926a: 36, 170) and worked closely with him after his 1941 emigration to the United States. She may be said to have carried out the analysis of art that was to have comprised Cassirer’s unpublished fourth volume of Philosophy of Symbolic Forms (1996; Grüny 2024).

Developing her earlier analysis of meaning, Langer distinguishes discursive symbolization—i.e., sign-configurations projecting possible ways things may be in the world—from presentational symbolization, which “shows” rather than “says”. An artwork symbolizes feeling by presenting a configuration in which forms of feeling are expressed or “virtually” imaged. Presentational symbols exhibit second order communicable “forms” of the arrangements of its elements, and these are not translatable into propositional or discursive contents.

Both discursive and presentational symbolizations are abstractive and generalizing. Following Whitehead (1927), Langer takes symbolic formation to be central to the evolution of art and science, earmarked by a constant “transference” between schemes of “presentational” immediacy (the precise, vivid perception of what is present before us) and “causal efficacy” (the sense of processes outside us). In pre-scientific thought “facts” are taken for granted as they are immediately perceived, re-conceptualized for cognitive and utilitarian ends as cognition develops. Feeling, always entwined with experience and thought, also evolves through its symbolic projections and articulations, issuing into pathology, myth, religion, and art (1924a; 1926a: 108; MEHF I). PNK surveys a great deal of the anthropological, linguistic, psychological and ethological literature of Langer’s time: Wundt, Stumpf, Sapir, de LaGuna, Köhler, Koffka, Piaget, and hundreds of others, framing their origins in the history of Western philosophy.

Both discursive and presentational symbolization are carried forward in our embodied biology. Jointly their complexity gradually gives rise to the main qualitative difference between human and other animal nature: symbolization in language, culture, morality, and the consciousness of life and death (MEHF I xvii). Animals utilize signs and associations between gestures and emotions; they can intend, feel and expect, but they do not articulate the human symbolic forms of myth, religion, science and art. Langer explores in detail the complex ethology and neurology of animals and humans in order to precisify the points of continuity and discontinuity between plant, animal and human forms of life. In the evolution of humanity, superstition and magic are not demolished by facts, she argues, but outgrown, instantiating a general tendency toward discursive intellectual growth from dreamlike fantasy. This, she holds, explains the growing cultural and political hegemony of science in our time (PNK 270).

Because Langer’s distinctions between sign and symbol, discursive and non-discursive symbolization, and conventional and “formulative” aspects of symbols possess logical, psychological and evolutionary-historical dimensions, her terms cut across the usual notions of “symbol” “sign” “reference”, “denotation” and even “semantics”. For this she was criticized, often with the charge that because Wittgenstein’s “picture theory” had been outdated, her thought was too (Nagel 1943: 325–326; Beardsley 1958 [1981]; Wollheim 1955; compare Budd 1985: VI; Kivy 1989: 49, 61ff.; 2002: 30; see Langer 1957: 126). Yet Langer’s different starting point—a higher-order modal account of picturing and form, a capacious view of “feeling”, an emphasis on processes, actions, and projective uses of signs and symbols—reflect a distinctive set of interests and ambitions (Dengerink Chaplin 2020: ch. 8; Verhaegh 2022: 231).

Langer reserves the term symbolism for discursive language systems, artificial or natural, in which meaning may be compositionally symbolized through a “logical syntax” using step-by-step construction of meaningful wholes through their parts. She commends Carnap (1934) for having scientifically analyzed this notion (PNK 67). But her purpose is to reject this paradigm as a generally adequate theory of symbolic form, expression, and “meaning”. Discursive symbolism is

useless for rendering the forms of awareness that are not essentially recognition of facts, … [e.g.] perceptions of our own sensitive reactions to things … and of the fabric of tensions which constitutes the so-called “inner life” of a conscious being,

and art, though it symbolizes the feeling of life, is not a symbolism, even though it displays a “logic” and “symbolic form” (MEHF I 85).

For Langer, then, although the origins of language are a topic of great evolutionary importance (she discusses ethology of apes and other animals at length), symbolic activity is not always grammatical and discursive, and language is neither the only nor the primary means of articulation and expression. She takes the organic totality of qualities created, expressed and projected in art symbols to be “verbally ineffable”, i.e., ill-suited to propositional and linguistic articulation of its meaning in terms of fixed rules (FF 39). But she rejects the emotivism of Russell and the neo-positivists on the ground that their account of the “non-cognitive”—which emerges from their restriction of “meaningful” symbolic expression to discursive systems—reduces feeling and aesthetic experience to “blind” cries, emotional venting, poetic metaphysics, or strategic control. Emotivism invites mystical ideas about art, ethics and culture as “ineffable”, and although Langer agreed that there are non-propositional aspects of meaning in art, she did not take the inexpressible to offer a route to mysticism; she took this path to have been wrongly embraced in Bergson’s version of phenomenology (van der Tuin 2016). Though she studied Heidegger, Langer was not sympathetic to his philosophy, aware of its political associations and the debate with Cassirer at Davos (Card Catalog [Other Internet Resources]; Cavell 2022: 77). While she admits our capacity for “intuition”, the taking in of Gestalten, she insists that its forms are communicable and subject to criticism (PNK ch. IV; MEHF I 80), thus rejecting the attempt to unseat discursive thought as a fundamental dimension of mental life. Cognitive value and formations of feeling are intertwined.

Experience is always presented in Gestalten: “our merest sense-experience is a process of [symbolic] formulation” (PNK 89) and “sense data are primarily symbols” (PNK 21), i.e., events of symbolic projection and transformation in which we construe a world of things and occasions out of the “pandemonium” of impressions (PNK 98). Following Whitehead Langer construes perception as action and event, a phase-transition in space-time, arguing that “every experience is an interpretation, a formalization” in which we apprehend actual events in terms of particular “forms”, but never “the” form, so that “what we can experience is a perspective, a ‘Gestaltung’” (1933: 183). What appear to us as “typical” associative signs of things at the level of animal habit are transformed into symbols through projections of thought and feeling. In the “fabric” of meanings in which we live, seeing is symbolically and ambiguously charged (PNK 280). As in the American tradition of James (1902) and Dewey (1934), “experience” for Langer encompasses the wide variety of “symbolific” phenomena that occur in everyday life: differing modes of feeling, perception, emotion and thought unfold over time in accordance with a variety of categories and forms of selective attention, feeling, interest, and engagement (Dryden 2001; Innis 2009).

Langer thus dispenses, as had Whitehead, with the idea of a raw, unfiltered, sense datum: experiences are complex structured relations. She regards the division between subject and object as “relative”, noting that in “protocol statements” language intervenes, displacing the line between the observer and the observed (MEHF I 37). The “meaning” a symbol expresses is thus relative to its context of use (Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 115). This anticipates both Austin’s (1946) attack on sense data and Quine’s (1951) rejection of the first dogma of logical empiricism: that each sentence may be associated with a fixed range of sensory observation.

Following Karl Bühler, Langer emphasizes our sensitivity to specific occasions of utterance, the “empratic” uses of language (PNK 9, 136ff.; Innis 2009). She also holds that the complex processes involved in symbolic formations “have to be supported by a vast intellectual structure in order to function”, as they mostly do, tacitly (PNK 283)—her emphasis on the role of the tacit in knowledge has been compared with and contrasted to Polanyi’s (Innis 1977, 2009, 2010; articles in Gulick [ed.] 2009–10; Dengerink Chaplin 2020: ch. 9, n. 229). While it is possible to fit what is implicit neatly into the frame of “our ultimate world-picture”, we ordinarily think with our symbolizations and do not have to think about them, for they are fused into the roots of perception. Prefiguring Austin, Langer also stresses the felt differences between dreams and artworks and perceptions in waking life. She also emphasizes the importance of conceptualization and the need for interpretation and translation in evaluating observational evidence, thus making the point—later emphasized by Kuhn, who read PNK (Kuhn 1962; Reisch 2019: 160; Basafa 2025)—that science is not a simple accumulation of facts. She notes that observation

has become almost entirely indirect, [requiring interpretive] readings [of fluctuating arrows, trailing paths of a stylus, or appearances of tiny specks of light] …. (PNK 20; compare Daston & Galison 2007)

It is the power of using symbols, rather than “higher sensitivity…longer memory or even quicker association” that “sets man so far above other animals” (PNK 89).

Though she endorses Kant’s conception of mental activity as an active imposition of form and synthesis upon a flux of experience, and his insistence that there is no ultimate unique form of reality apart from our conceptions of it (Langer 1933; Felappi 2017), Langer takes the Kantian emphasis on reason, principles, and a priori categories to overlook the importance of non-discursive orderings of perceptual forms. Rather than hiving off feeling to an irrational realm, she takes all human symbolic activity to bear upon reason (PNK 97, 143). She rejects Cassirer’s antipathy to Freud, taking their views of symbolic ideation to be “deep and close” (Langer 1949: 383, 395ff.). Cassirer’s originality, she argued, lay in his treating mythological forms of consciousness, not directly as symbols, but as evincing a “confusion of symbol and meaning” in which each is attributed the same degree of “reality” (1924b: 696); similarly unconscious feelings, as Freud argued, absorb the symbolic “virtually”, though Langer was critical of Freud’s naïve reductionism (Freud 1900/1930 [1955: 606]; cf. Langer 1924a: 36; Maigné 2019); it would take until MEHF for Langer’s embodied account of unfelt “acts” to transpose the idea, perhaps eliminating it, though on this scholars do not agree (Richter 2007: 113).

Science for Langer is less the accumulation of general theories to cover a widening domain of facts than an historically woven “fabric” of meaning, a scheme for handling facts, a “relatively stable context” (PNK 275). Fact-finding has become in our culture a primary measure, expressing an orientation that is empirical and historical (PNK 276). This has led, Langer argues, to a collapse of values; the power of everyday symbols that traditionally oriented humans in nature, on the earth and in society, have been lost in the fray of radically diversified modern forms of life (PNK 287). With the increasing power of causal laws, “we have put many stages of artifice and device…between ourselves and the rest of nature”, so that

the ordinary city-dweller knows nothing of the earth’s productivity; he does not know the sunrise and rarely notices when the sun sets…seed-time and harvest are nothing to him. (PNK 278)

The utilitarian use of nature has replaced the experience of it as sacred.

Langer’s distinction between discursive and presentational modes of symbolizing is not to be equated with that between literal and artistic meaning, for presentational symbols (e.g., graphs) may go proxy for what can be discursively stated (algebraical forms), whereas art symbols do not: they are untranslatable into discursive propositional contents. While essential in art, presentational imagery may however also be used when working out the stages of philosophy for a particular science, e.g., in biology (PNK 249f.; MEHF xviii, Ch. 10).

Langer thus interweaves, while distinguishing, the roles of models and “images” in science and art (Dengerink Chaplin 2024). “Images” are not necessarily visual but often “gestic, kinesthesic, verbal or… ‘situational’”, organizing and enhancing impressions directly received, rendering appearances in one perspective out of many possible ones, and setting forth what an object looks or seems or feels like (MEHF I 59). Aided by imagination, “imagery” abstracts phenomenal character, either its immediate effect on our sensibility or as something of importance, magnitude, strength, permanence, etc. By contrast, models illustrate a principle of construction or operation, telling us “how something works” (MEHF I 59). Artists have used a wide variety of devices for projecting three-dimensional presentations into two-dimensional presentations (tracing paper; the camera obscura, holding a thumb up to measure appearances of proportion in drawing, etc.), but here they have produced models by rules of symbolic transformation, not imagery. The forms so produced are “dead”, “empty” or “unfelt” (MEHF I 96). By contrast, “imagery” expresses living, moving forms. Poetic significance and factual reference are two different modes. Even though one may misleadingly speak of “truth” in myth and in science, the very idea of a conflict between them is “silly”, produced by confusing of presentational with discursive symbolization (PNK 202).

Langer’s interweaving of symbolization in science and in art is also designed to reject the idea that in creating symbols rather than copies of nature, art reduces to play or the “consummation” of practical and aesthetic experience (Dewey 1929 [1958]: Preface): music expresses an “unconsummated symbol” (PNK 159, 240). Langer accepts Dewey’s conception of the aesthetic as directly permeating everyday experience and shaping judgment, even politics, but she rejects his pragmatist account of heightened experience in ritual as a stock of habits arising from the repetition of game-like practical behavior (PNK ch. VI). It is our freedom in creating the possibility of significant projections of forms and sentience that Langer stresses, rather than play or practical purpose (MEHF I 53, 91). Music, Langer’s paradigm symbolic art, is

unconventionalized, unverbalized freedom of thought … The real power of music lies in the fact that it can be ‘true’ to the life of feeling in a way that language cannot … it can articulate feelings without becoming wedded to them. (PNK 243f.)

Langer’s dual-stream theory of symbolizing informs the anthropological side of her thought. She rejects the idea that prehistoric art was produced with only “utilitarian” or representational views in mind: the modern distinction between “efficacy and aesthetic appeal” is inappropriate, as magic is by no means a “prosaic” activity, but a symbolization of powers of nature (MEHF I 131). She points out that in coming to terms with the phenomenon of life and death, (the concept of) Woman is, at least to “primitive reflection”, one of the basic mysteries of nature, her body waxing and waning. However, “the actual process of human conception and gestation is too slow to exhibit a pattern for easy appreciation. One needs a symbol, to think coherently about it”—for example, the moon in Maui mythology (PNK 191). This telescoping of many concepts into one symbol, encompassing its constituent parts, is what psychoanalysts call “condensation” in dreams, a series of embedded, organic analogies rather than actual belief. Being able to see Woman in the moon “helps to humanize and define the functions of that deity” (PNK 193).

Langer’s emphasis on the notion of symbol drew deeply on the best linguistics and anthropology of her time. She particularly influenced the anthropologist Clifford Geertz (1973; see Isaac 2020). However, Geertz’s emphasis on interpretation and “thick description”, while sparked by Langer’s idea of symbolic form, is less concerned than she with the limits of the discursive mode. Although language is a crucial part of the symbolic evolution of humankind, it is not for Langer the origin of all abstractions. “Fantasies” (images and metaphorical associations) and play occur centrally in our life, ordering and expressing our sense of being alive, as does “the driving force” in human mentality: fear (PNK 158). Attunement to the ethnologist’s forms of feeling might transform social scientific work into something closer to art.

Langer speculates that human language could only have arisen in a human group in which the “lower forms of symbolic thinking”—i.e., dream, ritual, and superstitious fancy—were highly developed (PNK 127), for, appearing below the evolutionary level of communication of natural wants, “dreamlike” experiences and synaesthesia (e.g., children’s fear of objects without faces) originate the human power of general conception (PNK 118). The origins of symbolic transformation (as opposed to the merely associative or utilitarian uses of signs), may be rooted, not in survival value, but in the “lalling” or “babbling” instinct, the impulse to imitate and be interested in distinctive sounds, and “a great sensitivity to ‘expressiveness’ of any sort” (PNK 123). Animals share the capacity for signs and signals, symptomatic expression, practical design of tools, and complex modes of marking social orders, but human powers of symbolizing feeling transcend these.

In PNK chapter VIII Langer initiates her philosophy of art, beginning with music. Drawing on Schopenhauer and Hanslick, she sees feeling and form as central to what makes music music, taking this art to express virtual forms of feeling, motion, time, and patterns of sentient life (Kivy 1989: 43; 2002: 28f.). What music reflects is the morphology of feeling, and its forms are inexhaustibly rich (PNK 238f.). It is immediately sensuous and pleasurable, while also symbolizing and expressing, though not in the way that language does. This is why the numerous efforts to reduce music to a basis in our sensational or physiological reactions or descriptions of it fail (PNK 210ff.).

It is not the emotions caused by a musical passage, or expressed by the composer personally, or any language-like grammar or vocabulary of notes and other elements that make music meaningful, but rather the logical expression (formation, ordering) of feeling. There are analogies between, e.g., sign-languages—advanced telegraphic languages of drumming, sign languages for the deaf, and hieroglyphs—and the elements of music, but a sharp difference in that the former are discursive symbolisms, as music is not. The elements of, e.g., a system of musical notes in the Western tradition do not have any fixed emotional reference; instead they articulate forms that “language cannot set forth”: such forms are “untranslatable” or incommensurable with discursive forms (PNK 233). Langer argues in PNK that music arises from the expressive potential of ordinary speech, since these sounds that meet our ears are “intrinsically expressive” in having “not only associative value, but value as rhythms and intervals, exhibiting stress and release, progression, rise or fall, motion, limit, rest” (PNK 243).

Langer adduces numerous critics who have formulated the point about music’s “ineffability” in similar ways, while insisting, against any mystical view, that, like a good notation, musical symbolism has such vitality that it grows, as language does, by a process of articulation of new forms, rather than a fixed stock of forms or by a process of preconceived expression (PNK 240).

5. Theory of Art (1945–1966)

Feeling and Form (FF, 1953) extends PNK’s treatment of music to a general theory of the arts. It was received as “the most complete system of aesthetics to be enunciated … since Croce” (Wilkinson 1955: 221), bringing the issue of the relation of emotion to art front and center by offering the most detailed account in the first half of the twentieth century of an expression-cognitivist theory of art focused on feelings (Guyer 2014: vol. III, 365).

Langer recognizes “great” traditions and genres, but does not focus on these alone, seeking to pare art away from the “madhouse” of modern life where too many people live in a ruinously jumbled, disorganized streams of “artworks”, excellent and trivial (FF 53). She has been criticized for not providing criteria by means of which to separate good from bad works of art (Wollheim 1955; Budd 1985; Kivy 1989; Greenberg 2000: 104), but she is more interested in the practice of articulation and the characterization of the “transparency” of art symbols than in developing a hierarchy (FF 60), more interested in helping the reader become attuned to good everyday visual and auditory forms (for example, well-shaped textile designs, household utensils, decorated pitchers, jars, nicely proportioned doors and windows and embroideries, radio vs. live music) than in documenting the “greatness” of culture—the latter a kind of rhetoric she deeply distrusts (FF 53). In refusing to rely on a notion of culture, by turning instead to forms of life, Langer not only echoes Wittgenstein’s use of that concept (Floyd 2016), she also sets her conception of “symbolic form” apart from that of Panofsky, who took it to directly reflect a “culture” (Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 192ff.).

After FF Langer continued to discuss the relation between science, art, and culture; her political writings have been discussed above (§2). In addition she co-edited a Festschrift for Sheffer (Henle, Kallen, & Langer [eds] 1951), and published articles in the 1950s and 1960s on such topics as the notion of symbol, the process of feeling, emotion and abstraction in art and science (1951a, 1964a), materials and elements in the arts (1963b [2019]), the social influence of design (1965 [1966]), the cultural importance of the arts (1966), and the expression of feeling in dance (1976), collecting some of these in Problems of Art: Ten Lectures (1957) and Philosophical Sketches (1962a). She assembled Reflections on Art: A Source Book of Writings by Artists, Critics and Philosophers (1958b) and completed MEHF (1967–1982; §6 below).

Art for Langer is not a form of “play” or “escape” whose end is “practical” (PNK ch. VI; FF 15): it is not located in a “context of real circumstance and anxious interest” but is instead “abstract” symbolization, designed to make forms apparent by putting them to creative expressive use, freeing them from their common applications (FF 50f.). It is not that abstract form is itself an artistic ideal (though Langer was receptive to certain works of abstract expressionism); instead the artist abstracts and composes in order to allow concrete uses of elements and media to express forms of feeling (FF 51). Abstraction is multi-dimensional in art, difficult to analyze, appears in various kinds, and is not reducible to principles or progressive generalization according to levels (as propositional forms are). It “involves a constant play of formulative, abstractive, and projective acts based on a disconcerting variety of principles” (Langer 1964a: 380), paralleling the kind of abstraction at work in the higher order study of transformations of system-forms in abstract algebra and mathematics. For Langer there are “incommensurable” tensions in consciousness, mirroring the tensions that organic life reflects (FF 286).

In FF Langer downplays her earlier talk of “meaning” as isomorphism, which her critics had objected to. She nevertheless retains the idea of a second-order, morphological mirroring between the play of perceptible forms and forms of feeling (PNK 238), reworking Croce’s idea of art as expression in Cassirean terms: rather than copying nature, art creates and presents life’s forms. Art’s significance is its “vital import” (FF 32): its articulating the feeling of life by way of perceptible forms; it is a form of consciousness (Dryden 2004). To display and express this “aliveness” of forms, its primary and subsidiary forms must display something newly created, i.e., not merely an arrangement or configuration, but something that augments our “utmost conceptual power, imagination” with a sense of life (FF 40). Art expresses virtual objects, times, spaces, events and processes. Crucial to Langer’s treatment of art are her notions of “illusion”, “virtual” reality, the “liveliness” of forms, the processual nature of symbolization, and the “commanding form” (perhaps unconscious) of an artwork. These ideas have exerted an influence on recent theorists of virtuality (Chalmers 2022) and art as occurrence (Massumi 2011, 2015, 2024, 2025; FF 121).

At the same time Langer emphasizes the “studio basis” of art (FF 14), as well as the importance of craft and technique in every art (these she does not conceive as “mechanical”, FF 387). Art uses perceptible materials: pace Croce and Collingwood, an artwork is a “concrete symbol” in Cassirer’s sense: the transition from forms to sensuous appearance is not a “mechanical affair”, and the inarticulable richness of an artwork is a function of its concrete sensuousness (FF 120; Guyer 2014: vol. III, 335ff.). Langer distinguishes the materials of an artwork (tones, canvas, paper, glass, paint, bronze, wood, inscriptions, words, vibrations, cave walls, an artist’s experiences and emotions, etc.) from the elements that the artist puts to use in it through a medium (loose brushwork, cool colors, tones, straight or curvilinear lines, contradictory images or thoughts). Materials may be absorbed into elements, as plain song takes up words (FF 152), or a poet takes up her own feelings and responses. Choice of materials may affect range of elements and set different problems, providing different ways to present different feelings (FF 85).

In this way, while denying that an artwork expresses the artist’s intentions and emotions directly, Langer allows that art may take up and rework elements of actual life, thus answering the charge that she takes no account of the artist’s intentions, or postulates a deus ex machina of “symbolific” human needs (Wollheim 1955), or ignores the importance of clock time to the nature of music (Alperson 2004, Guter & Guter 2021). This leaves room for her to make sophisticated use of the ordinary notion of an “intention” or “point” of a technique, strategy, or material, as her notions of form and expression are organic: unlike, e.g., Beardsley, she does not rule the grammar of intention out as too psychologistic, but attempts instead to “logicize” or “grammaticalize” it as form, allowing for projective adjustments of means to expression in expressing forms with a material basis (compare Wimsatt & Beardsley 1946; Cavell 1969 [2002]: essays 7–8). She rejects Dewey’s appeal to a special aesthetic “attitude”: the discovery of “rightness and necessity” in sensuous forms of personal reactions to artworks does not require one to “dwell on one’s state of mind in the presence of a work”, but to reflect on transposability of forms (FF 34, 39; Gulick 2020: 16, 32n.). Still, there are many points of contact between Dewey’s treatment of experience as an organization of energies and forms with an “aura” around the edges and the semiotic parts of the pragmatist tradition emanating from Peirce (Innis 2022): Langer seems to underplay these connections.

Langer distinguishes materials and elements from virtual imagery (FF; Langer 1963b [2019]), thus sidestepping the later dispute between Gombrich (1960 [2001]), who claimed it to be impossible for a viewer to pay attention to a painting’s material character and its “depictive illusion” at the same time, and Wollheim (1987), who adduced the phenomenon of seeing something in the medium in response to Gombrich (Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 203f.). In emphasizing the difference between art and language, Langer places strong emphasis on the concept of natural, organic form and “experience” of virtuality—unlike, for example, Goodman 1968 [1976]), who, focusing on notations and languages, further ramified Langer’s taxonomy of symbols but shifts away from the process of psychic development and process (Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 211ff.).

Langer’s philosophy of music has remained the most continuously discussed part of her theory (Budd 1985; Kivy 1989, 2002; Alperson 2022), along with her philosophy of dance (Langer 1976; Man 2020, 2024), though she embedded herself quite generally in the history and philosophy of art and aesthetics in the United States (Innis 2009, Gulick & Slater [eds] 2020). She influenced her student Danto (1984, 1988; Auxier & Hahn [eds] 2013; Auxier 2013), Goodman (1968 [1976: xii]) and Gardner (2023), as well as artists, critics, and writers of renown, including Eva Hesse (Hesse 2016: 175, 339; Rahtz 2021), Fay Lanswer, Asger Jorn, Walker Percy, Paul Hindemith, and Clement Greenberg (Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 18ff.). Although Greenberg agreed with her emphasis on non-propositional, “ineffable” aspects of art, as well as its offering affordances to the imagination, he criticized Langer for not making the critic’s “taste” primary, thereby parting from her emphasis on the “studio basis” of artworks (2000: 25, 104). She knew poets Elizabeth Bishop and Richard Selig, painters such as Guy Anderson, Mark Tobey and Morris Graves, and musician Eva Heinitz (Wehr 1993, 2004). Her writings include thousands of perceptive remarks on particular works of art and philosophical criticism. She discusses art within many different traditions, genres, and lines of approach in Western and non-Western art, surveying a vast amount of critical and philosophical material in English, French, German and Italian. Her work on “symbolism” has been sublimated and appropriated in a variety of ways within, e.g., the theory of architecture, from Marxist semioticians to cultural conservatives, showing how important careful reflection on theories of symbolism is (Martin 2025). The multi-dimensional nature of her criticism and responses to theories of art up to her own time is only beginning to be systematically studied for its place in the context of the mid-twentieth century philosophy and art (van der Tuin 2024).

Langer appropriates Schiller’s idea of Schein (appearance, “semblance”, a term also used by Jung (FF 48)) as an inherent property of all art (Wilkinson 1955; Leddy 2024). Schein is also a critical norm, describing the way an illusion is created in a specific artwork to analyze to what degree and how successfully it expresses “aliveness”, and why (Wilkinson 1955: 221; compare Massumi 2011). Psychic “distance” and a sense of “presence” are essential to art: Langer points out that there is no need of imitating anything alive in order to convey the appearance of life (FF 312): artistically “nothing brings to mind life better” than the tense stillness of a tomb, or Van Gogh’s representation of a chair (FF 81, 98). Just as music expresses virtual temporal forms of duration and rhythm that are dynamic and not reducible to clock time or causally instantiated processes, a repeated decorative motif expresses virtual motion, making a surface more visible in its diversity (FF 61). Langer notes the universality of certain decorative forms among human cultures, hypothesizing—as an alternative to Malraux’s suggestion that a prehistoric unity of culture accounts for this (1947–1950, Vol. 2: 122f.)—that our capacity for perception of the feeling of life lies in an organizational capacity of the human visual field that comes to expression “so directly that it undergoes practically no distorting cultural influences, but brings forth a record of visual experience at its lowest terms” by projecting and transforming organic processes of feeling (FF 61).

An artwork, being singular and non-discursive, offers “truth” that has no negation and no deductive consequences, only emotional significance: it is appreciated with one or another degree of insight or intuition, like Russell’s knowledge by acquaintance (PNK 263). It is not the representational “likeness” of a Paleolithic reindeer image on the walls of a cave on Dordogne that make it an artwork, but its expressive way of organizing the flow of unity in lines and surfaces on a wall symbolically, something that may also have had a spiritual or magic dimension, orienting by a force of abstraction a “physiognomic” stage of perception in which feeling and perceiving are not clearly differentiated (MEHF I 166ff, 1964a: 383; Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 117) .

“Semblance” is not something to understood as hallucinatory, although Langer somewhat misleadingly uses the phrase “illusion” to describe virtual objects, spaces, times and lives; she explains that she does not mean by this a “delusion” (FF xi; Chalmers 2022).

Where we know that an object consists entirely in its Schein, … that apart from its appearance it has no cohesion or unity (like a rainbow or a shadow)—we call it a merely virtual object. (FF 49)

“Normally,” writes Langer, “semblance is not misleading; a thing is what it seems” (FF 49). But an art object (e.g., a vase or building) may come to arrest one’s sense (e.g., visual sense) so completely that many of its actual properties (weight, color) seem to fall away. She credits Schiller with the idea of semblance as a “liberation” of perception from practical purposes, allowing the mind to “dwell on the sheer appearances of things” (FF 49); this does not exclude that it may reform structures of agency, but it does so freely, without compulsion (compare Nguyen 2020 on games and art).

Langer’s philosophy of music is the platform from which her theory of the (differing) modes of art flows. She holds that the purpose of all “musical labor”, whether in thought or in physical activity, “is to create and develop the illusion of flowing time in its passage, an audible passage filled with motion that is just as illusory as the time it is measuring” (FF 120). She thus follows Schopenhauer’s idea that music is an iconic symbol of the emotions, which raises questions about whether particular emotions can be heard in music (Kivy 2002: 28ff.). But it is the play and seriality of formation of emotions that matters to Langer. The essence of all music, whether good or bad, is the creation of virtual time, determined by the movement of audible forms (FF 125). A musical work grows from an imagination of general movement to its complete, physical presentation or occurrence, governed by a basic form from which it is developed, a commanding form, as Flaubert called it, a kind of germ or “Idea” of the work (FF 122). This form, analogous to a living organism’s maintenance of its identity through time, dictates choices as the piece is composed, but also serves as a fecund symbol. Its aspects may be greatly various; what matters is the way of they unfold in a particular piece of music (FF 126).

Music symbolizes forms of feeling, but it does not have a language, despite the materials and elements it uses. This does not mean that it cannot “swallow up” words, e.g., in song (FF 152). Langer regards the intonation of speech in choric chant to be music, issuing forth “its own audible Time” even when one cannot understand the words (FF 125). On this view, music is more universal than any one tradition; noises (hammers pounding, etc.) are not music but may be incorporated into it, at which point there must be the semblance of organic movement, the illusion of an indivisible whole. Music also cultivates “hearing” rather than serving as a psychological stimulant or sedative: listening to music or singing lying in bed is a “natural education”, whereas the radio “harbors a danger … or learning not to listen” if it is occurring in a twilight zone of daydreaming, for the form of the dream, rather than art, “swallows” up the living forms of music (FF 147, 168).

Langer’s account of music has been praised for its treatment of motion and movement, as well as her emphasis on the richness of concrete musical experience and its emotional shaping of experience (Kivy 1989, 2002; Levinson 2015). There remain objections that have been lodged. Langer never explains in PNK and FF what exactly the structure of an emotion is—though it is clear she thinks our ordinary taxonomy of simple emotions (fear, sadness, etc.) cannot do justice to our experience of music and, to be fair, she takes the notion of feeling to be basic. She appears to assume that all instances of a given emotion must exhibit a common form or structure, though since emotions are occurrent processes, and no structure evinces just one form it is not clear that this charge meets the mark. Langer’s idea of the “logical picturing of emotional form” idea may appear circular or at best metaphorical. It also seems that emotion may be conventionally or traditionally associated with music, or identified as that which listening to the music arouses (Levinson 2011: 283ff.), though Langer’s idea that ritual can make particular feelings definite allows for the role of tradition in using music to around particular feelings. Langer has also been criticized for the ways in which she underplays the expression of specific, definite emotions in music that seem directly present in it, rather than virtually presented in general: it seems that just as sadness may be expressed immediately in a dog’s face or behavior, it can be expressed immediately in a musical passage, and if so, music does indeed represent actual emotions, rather than possible forms of them (Kivy 1989, 2002; Alperson 2004). It is not clear how fundamental such “resemblance” objections may be, because of Langer’s multi-layered and multi-dimensional view of symbolic forms and her sense of art materials and elements (Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 191).

Artworks afford us newfound sentience of organic and patterned forms of life through symbolization according to “primary” illusions that hold particular works, with their subsidiary forms and elements, together in different modes and allowing for interpenetration of different “secondary” modes of illusion drawn from the other arts: virtual movement, time and rhythm (music), virtual space (the plastic arts), virtual scenes and visible spaces (pictorial art), growth, virtual kinetic possibilities of volume (sculpture; see Gjesdal, Rush, & Torsen [eds] 2020), created space for an “ethnic” domain or “place” (architecture, see Guyer 2023), the virtual realm of power, influence and agency as a center of vital force (dance, abstracting from gesture), the illusion of life’s happening (poetic arts), virtual life or illusory experience (poetry), virtual memory (poetry, drama, novels), virtual history in the mode of dramatic action (drama), Destiny and Fate as virtual life-arcs. In film, Langer argues, we have a “new art” that swallows up other forms omnivorously, remaking the primary illusion of virtual history in the dream mode: it is the sole art yet to appear unentangled from religion, as it emerged through the entertainment business (FF 121ff., 412; Langer 1947). Each of these modes of art may be made perceptible in myriad ways, and each abstracts differently; each art may absorb the virtuality of another (dance’s forms offer semblance in musical virtual time; poetry and literature abstract virtual events), and novel forms evolve in unlimited ways.

If art is the objectification of feeling, it is also the subjectification of nature, “fusing” formal uses of materials in symbolic expressiveness (MEHF I 86f.). Its abstractions depend upon the specific artwork. Langer begins from her knowledge of music, but she also studied Paul Valéry (1939 [1958/2007]) on abstraction in poetry to reflect on her theory of the poetic mode of symbolization, sharing his fascination with the notion of life combining with higher order algebraical transformations, the idea of by-passing “entropy” through the projection of forms and descriptions of higher type (Rosenberg 2021).

The expressiveness in the play of “presentational” appearances is not a matter of “make-believe”, escape or pretending (as in Gombrich 1963 [1985]; Walton 1990, 1992; FF 228), but a way to disengage belief (FF 49) without appealing to fictional thoughts: “in [a] literal sense …[a representing] picture is an illusion”, and not a “copy” of visual impressions (FF 70). What the artist does is to compose an organic totality of relations among elements (e.g., sense qualities, which are “factors” in semblance (FF 84)) to produce another order of “quality” that is articulated concretely and felt as or seen in the artwork (devastation, warmth, sharpness). “Semblance” inheres in the organic totality of structuring and relations (forms) of sensory qualities.

6. Mind: An Essay on Human Feeling (1967–1982)

Langer’s trilogy Mind: An Essay on Human Feeling (1967–1982), to which she dedicated the final three decades of her life, expands her notion of symbolic form to delineate the role of “feeling” in the evolution of mind, consciousness and value. Her foundation for the philosophy of psychology traces evolution through many different forms of life, from the inorganic through plants, animals, and human culture. She begins with the transition to organic life itself—for which there are no absolutely fixed criteria—and traces through higher order forms of differentiation that lead to individuation, and, via feeling, to thought, language, mathematics and art, those formations of life that belong to human beings distinctively as symbolizers. She sorts through an enormous amount of scientific literature, including plant and animal ethology and biology, psychology, and neurology, rifling through striking examples drawn from plant and animal growth, morphogenesis and sexual behavior to language, mathematics, religion, and science.

Langer attends both to physical mechanisms and organicity, but she rejects the adequacy of psychological explanations offered in behaviorism, evolutionism, mechanism and cybernetics. These, she argues—adducing many examples—tend to vastly oversimplify: they reject direct evidence, skew descriptions of the phenomena, and pretend that algorithms always explain. Their main difficulty is an underestimation of the difficulty of characterizing the variety of forms of life.

Langer argues that what are needed are “images” that inspire new ways of viewing organic phenomena in relation to their environments, and not the off-the-shelf use of pre-existing scientific “models” designed to show how systems work. Reiterating her theory in FF, she expands her theory of abstraction in art and science, with its account of primary and secondary illusions, representations, synesthesia and metaphor, into a theory of biologically-rooted “psychical experience”. This experience is ultimately based, she argues, on the idea of an act, by which she means an embodied organic event, typically with subunits and higher complexities of form, applicable to aspects of the animal as well as the human world. There are proto-acts and acts that are not instantiated in overt behavior; reflex acts, temperature regulation by behavior, repertoires and “act centers” in organs. The culmination of MEHF I is her theory of acts (Richter 2007).

Langer canvasses thousands of ethological examples, from the lifting of a leg by a dog to pee, to the flinging of a branch watched by a gorilla, to the grooming of baboons (MEHF II 149f., 168f.). All animal acts are, Langer argues, instinctive, failing to achieve the vital activity of forms characteristic of the evolved human being, as she thinks her study of the ethology of insects, wolves, lemurs, migratory birds, monkeys, peacocks, turkeys, elephants, gorillas, grizzly bears, and other animals (building, e.g., on Lorenz, Kohler, Goodall, Schaller, Fossey, Jolly, Schoonmaker and others) shows. Acts that are peculiar to human beings are caused by agency, a kind of individuation that evolves biologically from the beginnings of life on earth through dialectical shaping of rhythms and vital activities in environments that comprise directions and degrees of individuation and patterning. Langer develops a theory of “pressions” to capture the constantly-adapting responses of the human organism to their environment, respecting the challenge of avoiding both naïve anthropomorphism about animals and the denial of all animal feeling. She canvasses problems about hereditary forms of life and revisits the question of the origin of language in light of recent ethology and linguistics. She argues that human virtues and vices are not animal values, in being symbolic: empathy must be distinguished from sympathy, suggestion, and imitation; chimpanzees become excited, but do not dance (MEHF II 305).

MEHF III traces the evolution of the moral structure of the human world through spirit, dreams of power, the appreciation of tragedy, the establishment of a sense of place, the rise and breaking apart of cultures in war and migration, and the evolution of mathematics and the reign of science from its origins in artistic and musical symbolization.

MEHF was not nearly as influential as PNK. However, Langer anticipated subsequent turns in psychology and neurobiology that locate reason in an organism’s embodied affective and cognitive engagement with the world (Merleau Ponty 1945 [2012]; Johnson 1987; Damasio 1994, 2001; Windle 2024), treat thought as an essentially symbolic process (Deacon 1997; see Dengerink Chaplin 2020: 226 and Dryden 1997a, 2007) and take the affordances of the environment seriously in examining perception (Gibson 1950, see MEHF II 54n). Her insistence on the centrality of projective metaphor and feeling to conceptual processes of thought was also pioneering (see Lakoff & Johnson 1980; Innis 2009: 12), as was her biological approach to consciousness in her descriptions of the organization of higher-order organic forms (Dryden 2007). Though she claimed that only humans are truly “symbolic” in the full sense, she was fascinated by animal life forms of all kinds, and the evolution of life on earth as a whole, from bacteria to cats; recent discussions of her work and contemporary art show how symbolic forms from the animal world and environment are accommodated by her aesthetic theory (Gaikis 2021).

Bibliography

A. Primary Literature

Works by Susanne K. Langer.

• 1922, “Deported”, The New Republic, 29(374/1 February 1922): 270. [Langer 1922 available online]
• 1923, The Cruise of the Little Dipper, and Other Fairy Tales, Illustrated by Helen Sewell, New York: Norcross. [Langer 2023 available online]
• 1924a, Eduard von Hartmann’s Notion of Unconscious Mind and its Metaphysical Implications, MA Thesis, Philosophy, Radcliffe College. [Langer 1924a available online]
• 1924b, “Review of Festschrift für Paul Natorp. Zum siebzigsten Geburtstage von Schülern und Freunden gewidmet”, The Journal of Philosophy, 21(25): 695–697. doi:10.2307/2014054
• 1924c, “Review of Theorie Der Dialektik. Formenlehre Der Philosophie, by Jonas Cohn”, The Journal of Philosophy, 21(15): 412–415. doi:10.2307/2013928
• 1924d, “Review of Logik. Logische Elementarlehre, by Benno Erdmann”, The Journal of Philosophy, 21(10): 275–277. doi:10.2307/2014841
• 1924–1927 [1997], “Susanne K. Langer’s Notes on Whitehead’s Course on Philosophy of Nature”, Rolf Lachmann (ed.), Process Studies, 26(1/2): 126–150. doi:10.5840/process1997261/213
• 1926a A Logical Analysis of Meaning, PhD Dissertation, Philosophy, Radcliffe College. [Langer 1926a available online]
• 1926b, “Confusion of Symbols and Confusion of Logical Types”, Mind, 35(138): 222–229. doi:10.1093/mind/XXXV.138.222
• 1926c, “Form and Content: A Study in Paradox”, The Journal of Philosophy, 23(16): 435–438. doi:10.2307/2014823
• 1927, “A Logical Study of Verbs”, The Journal of Philosophy, 24(5): 120–129. doi:10.2307/2015082
• 1929a, “A Set of Postulates for the Logical Structure of Music”:, The Monist, 39(4): 561–570. doi:10.5840/monist192939415
• 1929b, “The Treadmill of Systematic Doubt”, The Journal of Philosophy, 26(14): 379–384. doi:10.2307/2014323
• 1930a, “Just Think”, Atlantic Monthly, May 1930: 588–593.
• 1930b, The Practice of Philosophy, New York: H. Holt and Company.
• 1930c, “Review of Philosophie der Raum-Zeit-Lehre, by Hans Reichenbach”, The Journal of Philosophy, 27(22): 609–611. doi:10.2307/2015990
• 1930d, “Review of The Logic of Events. An Introduction to a Philosophy of Time, by Andrew P. Uchenko”, The Journal of Philosophy, 27(13): 361–363. doi:10.2307/2015257
• 1930e, “Letter: Reply to Uchenko”, The Journal of Philosophy, 27(21): 586–588.
• 1931a, “Algebra and the Development of Reason”, The Mathematics Teacher, 24(5): 285–297.
• 1931b, “Review of Erkenntniskritische Grundprobleme der Relativitätstheorie, Quanten und Wellenmechanik, by Erhard Brüll”, The Journal of Philosophy, 28(22): 610–612. doi:10.2307/2015829
• 1932, “Review of Introduction to Philosophical Analysis, by James Burnham and Philip Wheelwright”, The Journal of Philosophy, 29(18): 495–498. doi:10.2307/2016211
• 1933, “Facts: The Logical Perspectives of the World”, The Journal of Philosophy, 30(7): 178–187. doi:10.2307/2015751
• 1936, “On a Fallacy in ‘Scientific Fatalism’”, The International Journal of Ethics, 46(4): 473–483. doi:10.1086/intejethi.46.4.2989285
• 1937a [1953], An Introduction to Symbolic Logic, London: G. Allen & Unwin. Second revised edition, Boston and New York: Houghton Mifflin, 1953; Third revised edition, New York: Dover Publications, 1967. References are to the 1953 edition.
• 1937b, “Review of ‘Logique mathématique et syllogisme’ (1937), by J. Cavaillès”, Journal of Symbolic Logic, 2(2): 92. doi:10.2307/2267389
• 1937c, “Review of ‘Der wissenschaftliche Nachlass von Gottlob Frege’ (1936), by Heinrich Scholz and Friedrich Bachmann”, Journal of Symbolic Logic, 2(1): 56–57. doi:10.2307/2268843
• 1937d, “Review of ‘Non-Aristotelian Logic and the Crisis in Science’ (1937), by Oliver L. Reiser”, Journal of Symbolic Logic, 2(2): 88–89. doi:10.2307/2267382
• 1937e, “Review of ‘Grundlegung der wissenschaftlichen Semantik’ (1936) by Alfred Tarski and ‘Sur la signification des symboles logiques’ (1936) by Thomas Greenwood”, Journal of Symbolic Logic, 2(2): 83. doi:10.2307/2267368
• 1938a, “Review of ‘Modal Functions in Two-Valued Logic’ (1937) by Frederic B. Fitch”, Journal of Symbolic Logic, 3(1): 50. doi:10.2307/2267527
• 1938b, “Review of ‘The Method of Postulates’ (1937) by Edward V. Huntington”, Journal of Symbolic Logic, 3(1): 49. doi:10.2307/2267525
• 1938c, “Review of The Principles of Mathematics (2nd Edition, 1937), by Bertrand Russell”, Journal of Symbolic Logic, 3(4): 156–157. doi:10.2307/2267779
• 1939a, “Review of ‘Fondements et méthodes des mathématiques. Notes sur la réunion d’études de Zurich’ (1939) by Robert Feys”, Journal of Symbolic Logic, 4(2): 102. doi:10.2307/2269090
• 1939b, “Review of Nove lezioni di logica simbolica (Angelicum, Rome 1938) by Innocenzo M. Bocheński”, Journal of Symbolic Logic, 4(1): 36. doi:10.2307/2266236
• 1939c, “Review of The Doctrine of Signatures: A Defense of Theory in Medicine, by Scott Buchanan”, Ethics, 49(2): 236–237. doi:10.1086/290075
• [PNK] 1942 [1957], Philosophy in a New Key: A Study in the Symbolism of Reason, Rite and Art, first edition, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1942. Second edition, 1951. Third edition, 1957. [PNK references to 3rd edition, 1957.]
• 1943, “Review of Whitehead’s Theory of Knowledge, by John Blyte”, Mind, 52(205): 84–85. doi:10.1093/mind/LII.205.84
• 1944, “The Lord of Creation”, Fortune Magazine, 30(January): 127–128, 139–140, 142, 144, 146, 148, 150, 152, 154.
• 1945a, “Review of The Enjoyment of the Arts, by Max Schoen”, Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 5(4): 608–611. doi:10.2307/2102824
• 1945b, “Make Your Own World”, Fortune Magazine, 31(March): 156, 158–160, 192, 194.
• 1946, “Preface to Cassirer, Language and Myth”, in the translation of Cassirer 1925 [1946: vii–x].
• 1947, “Reply to Henry Aiken’s Criticism”, Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 7(4): 671–672.
• 1949a, “On Ernst Cassirer’s Theory of Language and Myth”, in The Philosophy of Ernst Cassirer (The Library of Living Philosophers 6), Paul Arthur Schilpp (ed.), Evanston, IL: Library of Living Philosophers, 381–400.
• 1949b, “Symbols and Emblems for a United World”, Common Cause: A Journal of One World, 2(9/April): 338–340.
• 1950a, “The Primary Illusions and the Great Orders of Art”, The Hudson Review, 3(2): 219–233. doi:10.2307/3856641
• 1950b, “The Principles of Creation in Art”, The Hudson Review, 2(4): 515–534. doi:10.2307/3847705
• and Eugene T. Gadol, 1950, “The Deepening Mind: A Half-Century of American Philosophy”, American Quarterly, 2(2): 118–132. doi:10.2307/3031449
• 1951a, “Abstraction in Science and Abstraction in Art”, in Henle, Kallen, and Langer 1951: 171–182.
• 1951b, “In Praise of Common Sense, Review of The Concept of Mind by Gilbert Ryle”, The Hudson Review, 4(1): 146–149. doi:10.2307/3847134
• 1951c, “World Law and World Reform”, The Antioch Review, 11(4): 462–473. doi:10.2307/4609523
• [FF] 1953, Feeling and Form: A Theory of Art, New York: Scribner.
• 1956, “On the Relations between Philosophy and Education”, Harvard Educational Review, 26(2): 139–141.
• 1957, Problems of Art: Ten Philosophical Lectures, New York: Scribner.
• 1958, “Man and Animal: The City and the Hive”, The Antioch Review, 18(3): 261–271. doi:10.2307/4610070
• (ed.), 1958, Reflections on Art: A Source Book of Writings by Artists, Critics, and Philosophers, Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins Press.
• 1960a, “On Artistic Sensibility”, Daedalus, 89(1): 242–244.
• 1960b, “The Origins of Speech and Its Communicative Function”, Quarterly Journal of Speech, 46(2): 121–134. doi:10.1080/00335636009382402
• 1961 [1969], “Why Philosophy?”, The Saturday Evening Post, 234(19/May 13): 34–35, 54, 56; reprinted in The Journal of Critical Analysis, 1(2): 57–66. doi:10.5840/jcritanal19691211
• 1962a, Philosophical Sketches, Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins Press.
• 1962b, “Scientific Civilization and Cultural Crisis”, Annals of the Japan Association for Philosophy of Science, 2(2): 120–126. doi:10.4288/jafpos1956.2.120
• 1963a, “A Footnote to Professor Tejera’s Paper”, Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 23(3): 432. doi:10.2307/2105085
• 1963b [2019], “Materials and Elements in Art”, Lecture, Yale University. Published in 2019 in Graduate Faculty Philosophy Journal, 40(2): 477–488. doi:10.5840/gfpj201940228
• 1964a, “Abstraction in Art”, The Journal of Aesthetics and Art Criticism, 22(4): 379–392. doi:10.2307/427932
• 1964b, “Obituary: Henry M. Sheffer (1883–1964)”, Philosophy and Phenomenological Research, 25(2): 305–307.
• 1965 [1966], “The Social Influence of Design”, University: A Princeton Quarterly, 25(1965 Summer): 7–12; reprinted in Who Designs America? The American Civilization Conference at Princeton (Princeton Studies in American Civilization 6), Laurence B. Holland (ed.), Garden City, NY: Anchor Books, 35–50, 1966.
• 1966, “The Cultural Importance of the Arts”, Journal of Aesthetic Education, 1(1): 5–12. doi:10.2307/3331349
• 1967, “Intent: One Scientific System: Reply to Sir Herbert Read’s review of Mind: An Essay on Human Feeling (Vol I)”, The Saturday Review, 26 August 1967: 26.
• 1967–1982, Mind: An Essay on Human Feeling, 3 volumes, Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins Press.
  • [MEHF I] 1967, Volume I [Langer 1967 available online]
  • [MEHF II] 1972, Volume II
  • [MEHF III] 1982, Volume III
• 1974, “De Profundis”, Revue Internationale de Philosophie, 28(110): 449–455.
• 1976, “The Dynamic Image: Some Philosophical Reflections on Dance”, Salmagundi, 33/34: 76–82.
• 1988, Mind: An Essay on Human Feeling, Gary Van Den Heuvel (ed.), Abridged edition, Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press.

B. Translations by Langer

• Murchison, Carl (ed.), 1930, A History of Psychology in Autobiography, Volume 1, Worcester, MA: Clark University Press. [Murchison 1930 available online]
  • Langer, Susanne (trans.), “F. Kiesow”, 163–190, from the German original manuscript.
  • Langer, Susanne (trans.), “William Stern”, Raymund Schmidt (ed.), 335–388, from Philosophie der Gegenwart in Selbstdarstellungen, volume 6, Leipzig: Felix Meiner, 1927.
  • Hodge, Thekla and Susanne Langer (trans.), “Carl Stumpf”, Raymund Schmidt (ed.), 389–441, from Philosophie der Gegenwart in Selbstdarstellungen, volume 5, Leipzig: Felix Meiner, 1924.

C. Secondary Literature

• Alperson, Philip, 2004, “The Philosophy of Music: Formalism and Beyond”, in The Blackwell Guide to Aesthetics, Peter Kivy (ed.), Malden, MA: Blackwell, 254–275. doi:10.1002/9780470756645.ch14
• –––, 2022, “The Expressivity of Musical Improvisation”, in The Routledge Handbook of Philosophy and Improvisation in the Arts, Alessandro Bertinetto and Marcello Ruta (eds), New York: Routledge, 201–213 (ch. 14).
• Austin, J. L., 1946, “Symposium: Other Minds”, Aristotelian Society Supplementary Volume, 20: 148–187. doi:10.1093/aristoteliansupp/20.1.122
• Auxier, Randall E., 1997, “Susanne Langer on Symbols and Analogy: A Case of Misplaced Concreteness?”, Process Studies, 26(1/2): 86–106. doi:10.5840/process1997261/229
• –––, 2008, “Ernst Cassirer (1874–1945) & Susanne Katherina (Knauth) Langer (1895–1985)”, in Handbook of Whiteheadian Process Thought, Volume 2, Michel Weber and Will Desmond (eds), Frankfurt: Ontos Verlag, 552–570.
• –––, 2013, “Preface”, in Auxier and Hahn 2013:. xix–xxxii.
• –––, 2024, “Foreword”, of The Bloomsbury Handbook of Susanne K. Langer, Gaikis 2024: xii–xiv.
• Auxier, Randall E. and Lewis Edwin Hahn (eds), 2013, The Philosophy of Arthur C. Danto (The Library of Living Philosophers 33), Chicago: Open Court.
• Basafa, Mark Nader, 2025, “Kuhn’s Harvard and the Resolution of a Historicist Scientific Era in the Structure of Scientific Revolutions”, PhD Dissertation, Philosophy, University of Vienna.
• Beardsley, Monroe C., 1958 [1981], Aesthetics, Problems in the Philosophy of Criticism, New York: Harcourt Brace. Second edition Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 1981.
• Beiser, Frederick C., 2014, After Hegel: German Philosophy, 1840–1900, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press. doi:10.1515/9781400852536.
• Bergonzo, Carolyn, 2024, “ ‘That She Cannot Be Catalogued’: Tracing Susanne K. Langer’s Fortuna”, Gaikis 2024: 275–280.
• Blumberg, Albert E. and Herbert Feigl, 1931, “Logical Positivism”, The Journal of Philosophy, 28(11): 281–296. doi:10.2307/2015437
• Budd, Malcolm, 1985, Music and the Emotions: The Philosophical Theories (International Library of Philosophy), London/Boston: Routledge & Kegan Paul.
• Carnap, Rudolf, 1934, Logische Syntax der Sprache (Schriften zur wissenschaftlichen Weltauffassung 8), Wien: J. Springer. Translated as The Logical Syntax of Language (International Library of Psychology, Philosophy and Scientific Method), Amethe Smeaton (trans.), London: Routledge & K. Paul, 1937.
• Carroll, Noël and Jinhee Choi (eds), 2006, Philosophy of Film and Motion Pictures: An Anthology (Blackwell Philosophy Anthologies), Malden, MA: Blackwell Publishing.
• Cassirer, Ernst, 1923–1927 [1953–1957], Philosophie der symbolischen Formen, 3 volumes, Berlin: B. Cassirer. Translated as The Philosophy of Symbolic Forms, Ralph Manheim (trans.), 3 volumes, New Haven, CT: Yale University Press. References are to English translation unless otherwise stated.
  • 1923 [1953], Erster Teil: Die Sprache, translated as Volume 1: Language.
  • 1925 [1955], Zweiter Teil: Das mythische Denken, translated as Volume 2: Mythical Thought.
  • 1927 [1957], Dritter Teil: Phänomenologie der Erkenntnis, translated as Volume 3: The Phenomenology of Knowledge.
• –––, 1925 [1946], Sprache und Mythos, ein Beitrag zum Problem der Götternamen. (Studien der Bibliothek Warburg, VI), Leipzig, Berlin: B.G. Teubner. Translated as Language and Myth, Susanne K. Langer (trans.), New York: Dover Publications, 1946.
• –––, 1944, An Essay on Man: An Introduction to a Philosophy of Human Culture, New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
• –––, 1996, The Philosophy of Symbolic Forms, Volume 4: The Metaphysics of Symbolic Forms, John Michael Krois and Donald Phillip Verene (eds), John Michael Krois (trans.), New Haven, CT: Yale University Press.
• Cavell, Stanley, 1969 [2002], Must We Mean What We Say? A Book of Essays, New York: Scribner; updated edition, New York: Cambridge University Press, 2002. doi:10.1017/CBO9781316286616
• –––, 2022, Here and There: Sites of Philosophy, Nancy Bauer, Alice Crary, and Sandra Laugier (eds), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press. doi:10.4159/9780674276437
• Chalmers, David John, 2022, Reality+: Virtual Worlds and the Problems of Philosophy, New York: W. W. Norton & Company.
• Cohen, Felix S., 1929, “What is a Question?”, The Monist, 39(3): 350–364. doi:10.5840/monist192939314
• Cohen, Felix S., 1950, “Field Theory and Judicial Logic”, The Yale Law Journal, 59(2): 238–272. Reprinted in Henle, Kallen, and Langer 1951: 255–281. doi:10.2307/793099
• Colapietro, Vincent, 1997, “Susanne Langer on Artistic Creativity and Creations”:, Semiotics, 1997: 3–12. doi:10.5840/cpsem19971
• –––, 1998, “Symbols and the Evolution of Mind: Susanne Langer’s Final Bequest to Semiotics”, Semiotics, 1998: 61–70. doi:10.5840/cpsem199820
• –––, 2000, “Let’s All Go to the Movies: Two Thumbs up for Hugo Münsterberg’s The Photoplay (1916)”, Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society, 36(4): 477–501.
• Couturat, Louis, 1905 [1914], L’Algèbre de la logique, Paris: Gauthier-Villars. Translated as The Algebra of Logic, Lydia Gillingham Robinson (trans.), Chicago: Open Court. [Couturat 1905 [1914] available online]
• Damasio, Antonio R., 1994, Descartes’ Error: Emotion, Reason, and the Human Brain, New York: G.P. Putnam.
• –––, 2001, “Descartes’ Error Revisited”, Journal of the History of the Neurosciences, 10(2): 192–194.
• Danto, Arthur C., 1984, “Mind as Feeling; Form as Presence; Langer as Philosopher”, The Journal of Philosophy, 81(11): 641–647. doi:10.2307/2026170
• –––, 1988, “Foreword”, in Langer 1988: v–vi.
• Daston, Lorraine and Peter Galison, 2007, Objectivity, New York/Cambridge, MA: Zone Books.
• Deacon, Terrence William, 1997, The Symbolic Species: The Co-Evolution of Language and the Brain, New York: W. W. Norton.
• Dengerink Chaplin, Adrienne, 2019, “Langer’s Logic of Signs and Symbols: Its Sources and Application.” Eidos. A Journal for Philosophy of Culture, 4(1): 44–54.
• –––, 2020, The Philosophy of Susanne Langer: Embodied Meaning in Logic, Art and Feeling, London: Bloomsbury Academic.
• –––, 2024, “Scientific Models and Artistic Images: Susanne K. Langer and the Early Wittgenstein”, in Gaikis 2024: 35–48 (ch. 2).
• Dewey, John, 1934, Art as Experience, New York: Minton, Balch & Company.
• –––, 1929 [1958], Experience and Nature (The Paul Carus Foundation Lectures I), second edition, Chicago/London: Open Court, 1929. Second edition reprinted, Dover: New York, 1958.
• Dryden, Donald, 1997a, “Susanne K. Langer and American Philosophic Naturalism in the Twentieth Century”, Transactions of the Charles S. Peirce Society, 33(1): 161–182.
• –––, Donald, 1997b, “Whitehead’s Influence on Susanne Langer’s Conception of Living Form:”, Process Studies, 26(1/2): 62–85. doi:10.5840/process1997261/22
• –––, 2001, “Susanne Langer and William James: Art and the Dynamics of the Stream of Consciousness”, The Journal of Speculative Philosophy, 15(4): 272–285. doi:10.1353/jsp.2001.0036
• –––, 2003a, “Susanne K. Langer (1895–1985): American Philosopher”, in Key Writers on Art: The Twentieth Century, Chris Murray (ed.), London/New York: Routledge, 180–186.
• –––, 2003b, “Susanne K. Langer”, in Dictionary of Literary Biography, Vol. 270: American Philosophers Before 1950, Philip B. Dematteis and Leemon B. McHenry (eds), Farmington Hills, MI: Gale, pp. 189–199.
• –––, 2004, “Memory, Imagination, and the Cognitive Value of the Arts”, Consciousness and Cognition, 13(2): 254–267. doi:10.1016/j.concog.2004.01.003
• –––, 2007, “The Philosopher as Prophet and Visionary: Susanne Langer’s Essay on Human Feeling in the Light of Subsequent Developments in the Sciences”, The Journal of Speculative Philosophy, 21(1): 27–43. doi:10.2307/25670642
• Feigl, Herbert, 1938, “Review of An Introduction to Symbolic Logic, by Susanne K. Langer”, The American Journal of Psychology, 51(4): 781. doi:10.2307/1415721
• Felappi, Giulia, 2017, “Susanne Langer and the Woeful World of Facts”, Journal for the History of Analytical Philosophy, 5(2): 38–50. doi:10.15173/jhap.v5i2.2812
• –––, 2024, “Susanne K. Langer on Logic as the Study of Forms and Patterns of Any Sort”, in Gaikis 2024: 63–78 (ch. 4).
• Floyd, Juliet, 2016, “Chains of Life: Turing, Lebensform, and the Emergence of Wittgenstein’s Later Style”, Nordic Wittgenstein Review, 5(2): 7–89. doi:10.15845/nwr.v5i2.3435
• –––, 2021, “Sheffer, Lewis, and the ‘Logocentric Predicament’”, in C. I. Lewis: The A Priori and the Given, Quentin Kammer, Jean-Philippe Narboux, and Henri Wagner (eds), New York: Routledge, 27–103.
• Floyd, Juliet and Sanford Shieh, 2024, “Modality in Wittgenstein’s Tractatus”, in Wittgenstein’s “Tractatus Logico-Philosophicus”: A Critical Guide, José L. Zalabardo (ed.), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press, 24–49 (ch. 2). doi:10.1017/9781009067690.003
• Frege, Gottlob, 1892a [1997], “Über Begriff und Gegenstand”, Vierteljahrsschrift für wissenschaftliche Philosophie, 16(2): 192–205. Translated as “On Concept and Object”, in Frege 1997: 181–193.
• –––, 1892b [1997], “Über Sinn und Bedeutung”, Zeitschrift für Philosophie und philosophische Kritik, 100: 25–50. Translated as “On Sinn and Bedeutung”, Peter Geach (trans.), in Frege 1997: 151–171, 1997.
• –––, 1893/1903 [2013], Grundgesetze der Arithmetik, Band 1 in 1893 and Band 2 in 1903, Jena: Hermann Pohle. Translated as Frege, Gottlob, 2013, Basic Laws of Arithmetic: Derived Using Concept-Script. Volumes I & II, Philip A. Ebert and Marcus Rossberg with Crispin Wright (eds/trans), 2 volumes, Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2013.
• –––, 1906 [1984], “Über die Grundlagen der Geometrie”, Jahresbericht der Deutschen Mathematiker-Vereiningung, 15: 293–309 & 293–309. Translated as “The Foundations of Geometry, Second Series”, in Collected Papers on Mathematics, Logic, and Philosophy, Brian McGuinness (ed.), E.-H. W. Kluge (trans.), Oxford/New York: Basil Blackwell, 1984, 293–340.
• –––, 1997, The Frege Reader, Beaney, Michael (ed.), Oxford/Malden, MA: Blackwell.
• Freud, Sigmund, 1900/1930 [1955], Die Traumdeutung, Leipzig and Vienna: Franz Deuticke, 1900; 8th ed. enlarged and revised, 1930. English translation of 1930 edition, The Interpretation of Dreams, James Strachey (ed and trans.), New York: Basic Books, 1955.
• Gaikis, Lona, 2021, “Thinking with Susanne Langer: Sonar Entanglements with the Non-human”, Open Philosophy, 4(1): 149–161.
• Gaikis, Lona (ed.), 2024, The Bloomsbury Handbook of Susanne K. Langer, London: Bloomsbury Academic. doi:10.5040/9781350294660
• Gardner, Howard Earl, 2023, “Revisiting Susanne Langer’s Philosophy in a New Key—Again”, Common Knowledge, 29(2): 247–250. doi:10.1215/0961754X-10568862
• Geertz, Clifford, 1973, The Interpretation of Cultures: Selected Essays, New York: Basic Books.
• Gibson, James J., 1950, The Perception of the Visual World, Boston: Houghton Mifflin.
• Gjesdal, Kristin, Fred Rush, and Ingvild Torsen (eds), 2020, Philosophy of Sculpture: Historical Problems, Contemporary Approaches (Routledge Research in Aesthetics), Abingdon/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780429462573
• Gombrich, Ernst H., 1960 [2001], Art and Illusion: A Study in the Psychology of Pictorial Representation (Bollingen Series, 35. The A. W. Mellon Lectures in the Fine Arts, 5), New York: Pantheon Books. Millennium edition, with a new preface by the author, Princeton: Princeton University Press, 2001.
• –––, 1963 [1985], Meditations on a Hobby Horse: And Other Essays on the Theory of Art, London: Phaidon Publishers. Fourth edition, 1985, London: Phaidon.
• Goodman, Nelson, 1968 [1976], Languages of Art: An Approach to a Theory of Symbols, Indianapolis, IN: Bobbs-Merrill. Second edition, Indianapolis, IN: Hackett, 1976.
• Greenberg, Clement, 2000, Homemade Esthetics: Observations on Art and Taste, New York: Oxford University Press.
• Grüny, Christian, 2024, “The Systematic Position of Art in Susanne K. Langer’s and Ernst Cassirer’s Thinking”, in Gaikis 2024: 121–132 (ch. 8).
• Gulick, Walter B., 2020. “Toward an American Aesthetics”, in Gulick and Slater 2020: 3–38.
• Gulick, Walter B. (ed.), 2009–10, “Langer and Polanyi”, Special issue, Tradition and Discovery: The Polanyi Society Periodical, 36(1). [Gulick 2009–10 available online]
• Gulick, Walter B. and Gary Slater (eds), 2020, American Aesthetics: Theory and Practice (SUNY Series in American Philosophy and Cultural Thought), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
• Guter, Eran, 2010, Aesthetics A-Z (Philosophy A-Z), Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press. doi:10.1515/9780748630066
• Guter, Eran and Inbal Guter, 2021, “Susanne Langer on Music and Time”, Estetika: The European Journal of Aesthetics, 58(1): 35–56. doi:10.33134/eeja.195
• Guyer, Paul, 2014, A History of Modern Aesthetics, 3 volumes, New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9781107110342
• –––, 2023, “Susanne Langer on Architecture: Ethnic Domain, Virtual Space, and the Feeling of Life”, Aesthetic Investigations (Dutch Association of Aesthetics), 6 (Special Issue: Architecture Beyond the Building): 52–68. [Guyer 2023 available online]
• Henle, Paul, Horace M. Kallen, and Susanne K. Langer (eds), 1951, Structure, Method, and Meaning: Essays in Honor of Henry M. Sheffer, New York: Liberal Arts Press.
• Hesse, Eva, 2016, Eva Hesse: Diaries, Barry Rosen with Tamara Bloomberg (eds), New Haven, CT: Hauser & Wirth in association with Yale University Press.
• Hoernlé, R. F. A., 1921, “A Plea for a Phenomenology of Meaning”, Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, 21: 71–90. doi:10.1093/aristotelian/21.1.71
• –––, 1931, “Review of Susanne K. Langer, The Practice of Philosophy”, The Personalist, XII: 132–134.
• Huntington, Edward V., 1911, “The Fundamental Propositions of Algebra”, in Monographs on Topics of Modern Mathematics: Relevant to the Elementary Field, J. W. A. Young (ed.), New York: Longmans, Green, and co., 151–207. The Huntington monography republished standalone with the same pagination, Brooklyn, NY: Galois Institute Press, Long Island University, 1941.
• –––, 1937, “The Method of Postulates”, Philosophy of Science, 4(4): 482–495. doi:10.1086/286479
• Innis, Robert E., 1977, “Art, Symbol, and Consciousness: A Polanyi Gloss on Susan Langer and Nelson Goodman”, International Philosophical Quarterly 17(4): 455–476.
• –––, 2002, Pragmatism and the Forms of Sense: Language, Perception, Technics (American and European Philosophy), University Park, PA: Pennsylvania State University Press.
• –––, 2007, “Placing Langer’s Philosophical Project”, The Journal of Speculative Philosophy, 21(1): 4–15. doi:10.2307/25670640
• –––, 2009, Susanne Langer in Focus: The Symbolic Mind (American Philosophy), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
• –––, 2010, “Minding Feeling”, Integrative Psychological & Behavioral Science, 44(3): 197–207.
• –––, 2016, “Between Philosophy and Cultural Psychology: Pragmatist and Semiotic Reflections on the Thresholds of Sense”, Culture & Psychology, 22(3): 331–361. doi:10.1177/1354067X16638847
• –––, 2020a, Between Philosophy and Cultural Psychology (SpringerBriefs in Psychology), Cham: Springer International Publishing. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-58190-9
• –––, 2020b, “Feeling, Abstraction, Symbolization: Langer’s Aesthetic Model of Minding”, in Innis 2020a: 49–67. doi:10.1007/978-3-030-58190-9_4
• –––, 2022, Dimensions of Aesthetic Encounters: Perception, Interpretation, and the Signs of Art (SUNY Series in American Philosophy and Cultural Thought), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press. doi:10.1515/9781438488264
• –––, 2024, “Psychological Dimensions, Cultural Consequences, and their Breakings in Susanne K. Langer’s Symbolic Mind”, in Gaikis 2024: 149–164 (ch. 10).
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• –––, 1904, “Does ‘Consciousness’ Exist?”, The Journal of Philosophy, Psychology and Scientific Methods, 1(18): 477–491. doi:10.2307/2011942
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• Kivy, Peter, 1989, Sound Sentiment: An Essay on the Musical Emotions, Including the Complete Text of The Corded Shell (Arts and Their Philosophies), Philadelphia, PA: Temple University Press.
• –––, 2002, Introduction to a Philosophy of Music, Oxford/New York: Clarendon Press.
• Kösters, Barbara, 1993, Gefühl, Abstraktion, Symbolische Transformation: zu Susanne Langers Philosophie des Lebendigen, Peter Lang: Frankfurt am Main.
• Kuhn, Thomas S., 1962, The Structure of Scientific Revolutions (International Encyclopedia of Unified Science: Foundations of the Unity of Science, 2.2), Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
• Lachmann, Rolf, 1993, “Susanne K. Langer: Primär- und Sekundärbibliographie”, Studia Culturologica, 2: 91–114.
• –––, 1997, “From Metaphysics to Art and Back: The Relevance of Susanne K. Langer’s Philosophy for Process Metaphysics”, Process Studies, 26(1–2): 107–125. doi:10.5840/process1997261/226
• –––, 2000, “Alfred North Whiteheads naturphilosophische Konzeption der Symbolisierung”, Zeitschrift für philosophische Forschung, 54(2): 196–217.
• –––, 2024, “Susanne K. Langer’s Foray into Art as a ‘Phenomenology of Feeling’”, in Gaikis 2024: 93–104 (ch. 6).
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• Martin, Reinhold, 2025, “A World of Ideas: Selected Encounters in Architectural History and Philosophical Aesthetics, 1940–80”, Journal of the Society of Architectural Historians, 84(1): 105–120. doi:10.1525/jsah.2025.84.1.105
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Other Internet Resources

• Susanne K. Langer Circle, Descartes Centre for the History and Philosophy of the Sciences and the Humanities Utrecht University. A large collection of on-line resources, including Langer’s MA and PhD theses, some archival material, bibliographies of secondary literature, and other resources, including records of the activities of the Circle.
• Susanne K. Langer Papers, 1895–1985 (MS Am 3110). Houghton Library, Harvard University. (under construction)

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