Model Organisms

Model organisms are a widely used component of contemporary biology and biomedicine. Although the term “model organism” gained formal recognition with the National Institutes of Health (NIH) in 2000 [Other Internet Resources], it has a longer history and has become increasingly widespread in both the sciences and philosophy. Today, definitions of model organisms vary, including which organisms considered count as model organisms. While biologists conceive of model organisms as experimental tools, philosophers have increasingly examined how model organisms count as scientific models in their own right, raising questions about how they represent other systems, the criteria that justify their selection, and the broader infrastructures and practices that sustain their epistemic and practical roles within scientific experimentation.

• 1. A History of the Term
• 2. Organisms as Scientific Models
  • 2.1 Model Organisms and The Question of Representation
  • 2.2 Models as Exemplars and Surrogates
  • 2.3 Exploratory Models
  • 2.4 Negative Models
• 3. Situating Model Organisms in Practice
  • 3.1 Materiality, Abstraction, and Standardization of Model Organisms
  • 3.2 Experimental Systems
  • 3.3 Repertoires
• 4. The Multi-faceted Justification of Organism Choice
  • 4.1 Krogh Organisms
  • 4.2 Expanding the Range of Reasons for Model Organism Choice
• 5. Artificial Intelligence and Model Organisms
  • 5.1 AI as a “Discovery” Tool in Model Organism Research
  • 5.2 Artificial model “organisms”
• 6. Implications of Model Organism Research
  • 6.1 The Research Biodiversity Challenge
  • 6.2 Ethical Implications
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. A History of the Term

Although the term “model organism” was occasionally used before the 1990s, it came into widespread use in the life sciences with the rise of genome mapping and sequencing projects (Ankeny and Leonelli 2020). In 1990, the Department of Health and Human Services and the Department of Energy issued a report on the first five years of the Human Genome Project that featured a limited set of organisms, including a bacterium, Escherichia coli, the yeast Saccharomyces cerevisiae, the fruit fly Drosophila melanogaster, the roundworm Caenorhabditis elegans, and the mouse Mus musculus (Department of Health and Human Services et al. 1990). The priority for this list reflected the aim of sequencing the genomes of what were considered to be a core set of biomedically important organisms. During this time period, genome sequencing was seen as an important modality to develop in different organismal systems; however, it was not sufficient to make an organism a model organism for the NIH (2000b [Other Internet Resources]).

In 2000, the National Institutes of Health (NIH) officially designated a canonical set of model organisms for biomedical research which included the mouse (Mus musculus), rat (Rattus rattus), fruit fly (Drosophila melanogaster), zebrafish (Danio rerio), frog (Xenopus), roundworm (Caenorhabditis elegans), social amoebae (Dictyostelium discoideum), and budding yeast (Saccharomyces cerevisiae) (NIH 2000a [Other Internet Resources]). The next year, the NIH added a plant, the thale cress (Arabidopsis thaliana) and by 2007, the list was expanded to include the chicken (Gallus gallus), a filamentous fungi (Neurospora crassa), the water flea (Daphnia), and fission yeast (Schizosaccharomyces pombe) (Leonelli 2007; NIH 2009 [Other Internet Resources]). Each of these organisms had parts or systems of parts that served as models for parts and systems in humans of medical importance. They also served as models for non-human targets as well.

Most of the NIH designated model organisms have had a long history of use in biology and medicine. Drosophila, rats, and mice were developed as experimental systems early in the twentieth century and played foundational roles in the development of genetics (Kohler 1994, Rader 2004, Clause 1993, Logan 2002, 2005). Most of this early research concerned basic biological processes. Only gradually would these organisms become models for processes in other species. In Drosophila, a comparative approach that juxtaposed D. melanogaster to other closely related species gave way to its functioning as a model for other species with the advent of molecular biology beginning in the 1950s (Kohler 1991). The rat had a much quicker trajectory toward use as model for other species. Beginning in the 19th century, it was used as a model for human disease. The standardization of rat models in 1906 at the Wistar Institute allowed it to flourish in the early twentieth century as an experimental organism with low variability that enabled higher reproducibility of results (Clause 1993, Logan 2002). Other organisms had been used as models for human disease but were not included in the NIH list and gradually became less common in their use. Guinea pigs, for instance, had been used as a model for human epilepsy as early as 1899, but in the twentieth century lost out to rats and mice as the mammalian model systems (Logan 2002, Endersby 2007).

By the first decades of the 21st century, the designation of model organism by the NIH became a marker of status and authority, not to mention financial investment from U.S. federal funding agencies, like the NIH (Gilbert 2009, Farris 2020). Soon after the NIH announced its list, many other organisms were proposed as model organisms by scientists eager to highlight their organism’s value for a range of problems (Wittbrodt, Shima, and Schartl 2002, Behringer et al. 2009). Other organism that had long been in use in biology were re-christened as model organisms (Bonner 1999) and guides have been published for turning any organism into a model organism (Matthews and Vosshall 2020). Advocacy for the importance of non-model systems also started to rise (Shuker, Lynch, and Morais 2003). A common refrain among many non-model organism advocates was that preference for model organisms amounted to a deliberate neglect of most of the species in the tree of life (see section 6.1 on the research biodiversity challenge).

2. Organisms as Scientific Models

The NIH played a key role in formalizing the category and terminology of model organisms, but today, the term is not restricted to the canonical NIH list. Scientists use the term liberally and informally across fields, ranging from biology to medicine and from neuroscience to psychology. Despite its widespread use, philosophical disagreement remains over how model organisms function as scientific models, and what kinds of models they are.

Although all organisms used in scientific experiments count as experimental organisms, model organisms are a subset of those experimental organisms (see Figure 1). Some philosophers define a model organism in terms of a representational relationship between species (see section 2.1). For example, Ankeny and Leonelli argue that an organism functions as a model when it can represent features of other organisms by having a broad representational scope (allowing results to be extrapolated across species) and a clear representational target (allowing it to stand in for particular phenomena in another system). Model organisms, on such a view, are supported by communities and infrastructures that integrate knowledge about the organism as a whole, treating its properties as part of an interconnected system rather than as isolated experimental traits (see section 3.3 on repertoires). In other words, model organism can be readily adapted to investigate new phenomena and be extended to new species.

Emphasizing multiple targets and species thus explains what is epistemically distinctive about model organism research (Ankeny and Leonelli 2011, 2020). Others, however, have argued that such representational accounts alone fail to capture the versatility of model organisms. Instead, model organisms should be seen as model carriers – understood not through their representational power, but instead as organisms that are ontogenetically changeable, standardized, and evolved (Prieto and Fábregas-Tejeda 2025).

Experimental organisms are divided into those that are not used as models and those that are. The boundary between models and non-models is represented as permeable because an organism can serve as a model at one point in time and as non-model at some other point in time depending on its research context. Among model organisms, some meet only minimal criteria for use as a model, while others meet more complex criteria involving a wider array of targets and a wider scope which in turn require, for instance, standardization and the development of community resources that support its use as a model. This is represented as a gradient of complexity for model organism criteria.

Because there are many other uses for experimental organisms and because the term “model organism” is liberally used in biology, we find it appropriate to refer to all organisms that satisfy a modeling relation as model organisms, where model organisms serve as a source for a target. However, to preserve the variable ways in which model organisms acquire epistemic value, those satisfying single criteria, such as representation alone, may be referred to as minimal model organisms, whereas those accounts that define model organisms by multiple criteria can be referred to as complex model organisms (see Figure 1). More complex definitions of model organisms often include features such as the tractability of an organism, the infrastructure costs of maintaining such organisms, and the breadth of the organism’s representational scope. Many biologists define model organisms using a set of features (Russell et al. 2017, Farris 2020, Wittbrodt et al. 2002). Some philosophers, however, seem to apply a simpler definition when they consider model organisms as models (Frigg 2023, 401; Sartori 2023, 1). The boundary between model organisms and non-model organisms is also not fixed, because an organism can serve as a model at one point in time and as non-model at some other point in time depending on its research context.

Below we survey the various ways that model organisms have been treated as models within philosophical and scientific contexts, including accounts of models as surrogates, exploratory models, and negative models. These accounts are not mutually exclusive. As will become evident, model organisms can be any combination of negative, surrogate, or exploratory models.

2.1 Model Organisms and The Question of Representation

Whether and how models represent their target systems remains an open philosophical problem (Frigg and Hartmann 2025). Do model organisms satisfy the same representational criteria as theoretical models– for example, in the same way that dynamical equations represent fluid motion or where neural networks represent cognitive processes?

Ankeny and Leonelli offer one influential way of addressing this question by characterizing model organisms in terms of their representational scope and representational target (Ankeny and Leonelli 2020). In the simplest case, a species A is a model for another species B, if A has a property, p, that represents a feature of B. Representational scope captures how many different species, B, can be modeled by A, while the representation target refers to the properties or phenomena, p, that are represented in both species A and B. Scope may range from one species to many, and the target may range from a single phenomenon to a broad set of organism features.

This account supports treating model organisms as something similar to theoretical models by drawing on Frigg and Nguyen’s DEKI framework for scientific representation (Frigg and Nguyen 2021; Frigg and Hartmann 2025). On the DEKI model, a model denotes a target system (D), exemplifies relevant features (E), provides a key or mapping rule linking those features to the target (K), and imputes them to the target (I) to generate information about it. Interpreted through DEKI, model organisms denote biological targets, exemplify experimentally accessible traits, rely on interpretive keys supplied by experimental practice, and license inferences about the target systems (Frigg and Nguyen 2021).

What distinguishes model organisms from other experimental organisms, on Ankeny and Leonelli’s view, is not merely their material similarity to a target but their representational power, which is established and maintained through a history of practices. These include techniques, infrastructures, conventions, and social organization that stabilize and transform organisms over time, or what they call a repertoire of practices (see section 3.3). Although DEKI provides a schema for understanding representation, how a model denotes a target is complicated by the fact that modeling is embedded in evolving research practices. The conceptual, material, and social elements of repertoires shape not only what counts as a model but how representational relations are continuously modified rather than fixed once and for all.

Lorenzo Sartori (2023) extends Ankeny and Leonelli’s representational picture and use of DEKI by clarifying the role of interpretive keys within such repertoires. He distinguishes between broad and local keys. Broad keys capture general background assumptions about how models relate to targets, while local keys provide the fine-grained mappings from specific model properties to target properties that are required for justificatory work. Although broad and local keys ideally inform one another and reach reflective equilibrium, only local keys can support claims about a model’s accuracy. On Sartori’s account, factual correctness is therefore justified on a case-by-case basis rather than inherited globally from a model system.

Strong representational accounts, such as Sartori’s, provide resources for extending the representational capacities of model organisms into new domains. Recent work draws on this framework to justify the use of novel model organisms in neuroscience, including in research on basal cognition systems (Rorot 2025 [Other Internet Resources]). Nonetheless, not all philosophers agree that thinking about model organisms as theoretical models provides the right framework for understanding what model organisms do epistemically. Some have instead sought the foundations of model organism research outside of a strongly representational account.

Levy and Currie (2015), for example, argue that model organisms are better understood as specimens rather than as theoretical models. On their view, experimental organisms are concrete biological samples drawn from a larger population, and the inferences scientists make from them depend on empirical extrapolation rather than representational mapping. These extrapolations are secured by background knowledge – such as phylogenetic relatedness, mechanistic conservation, and population structure – rather than by abstract keys linking model features to target features. Whereas theoretical models are typically characterized by explicit abstraction, idealization, and formal mapping rules, Levy and Currie emphasize that model organisms are contingent, embodied systems. The epistemic work they perform derives from their status as well-chosen biological specimens, not from their functioning as representational surrogates.

Many discussions of model organisms similarly proceed without strong commitments to representation. Marcel Weber, for instance, emphasizes their epistemic value not in terms of representational scope or specimen status, but in their capacity to function as instruments for causal inference (Weber 2005). Importantly, Weber stresses that speaking of model organisms as “tools” or “technological artifacts” must be understood metaphorically. Experimental organisms are not machines constructed by humans; they are evolved, living beings that have been modified, standardized, and stabilized to make experimental interventions possible. Practices such as inbreeding, genetic engineering, and cross-species gene transfer do not transform organisms into artifacts, but exemplify the experimental manipulation of natural objects (Weber 2024). On this view, what gives model organisms their epistemic force is their ability to render causal structures accessible through controlled intervention, allowing scientists to identify and generalize causal relationships beyond the particular organism under study.

Taken together, these approaches resist the idea that model organisms earn their epistemic status primarily by standing in representational relations to targets. Instead, they emphasize extrapolation, intervention, and material continuity as the basis for inference. Yet abandoning representation entirely leaves open an important question: how do scientists move from concrete experimental systems to claims about broader biological domains without some form of modeling relation?

It is precisely this tension that Prieto and Fábregas-Tejeda (2025) aim to resolve in recent efforts to take a hybrid view to this representational/ non-representational debate. They side with non-representationalists in arguing that model organisms are not themselves models. At the same time, they agree that scientists routinely construct models of specific target phenomena using model organisms. Their proposal claims that model organisms are best understood not as models tout court but as material carriers of scientific models (Prieto and Fábregas-Tejeda 2025). On their account, organisms are physical systems from which researchers selectively abstract and interpret particular parts, mechanisms, or behaviors, and organize these into models of phenomena of interest. The model itself consists of the interpreted subset of organismal features (e.g., particular cellular mechanisms), not the whole organism (Prieto and Fábregas-Tejeda 2025). The carrier provides the experimental context, but only the interpreted parts are mapped onto the domain of interest and then used to represent phenomena in other organisms (Prieto and Fábregas-Tejeda 2025). This distinction helps reconcile traditional representationalist intuition that model organisms function like formal and mathematical models with the view that organisms are not models in themselves but support the construction of models by virtue of what researchers abstract and interpret from them.

2.2 Models as Exemplars and Surrogates

Many scientists attribute epistemic value to model organisms while remaining agnostic about their representational status. In this way, model organisms can act as exemplars – examples that stand in for a broader class or lineage (Bolker 2009) – or as model surrogates, which are meant to substitute for a specific biological target. Using surrogate models is widespread in the biomedical and biological sciences because it aligns with the NIH policy of using animal models as experimental stand-ins for humans for clinical and translational research. A surrogate model organism has some physical or functional similarity as a designated target organism or class of organisms. Here, animal systems become stand-ins for a target system because they offer greater epistemically tractability, as, for example, rodents do for certain human processes and traits in biomedical research (see Frigg and Hartmann 2025). Although using models as surrogates and exemplars are not mutually exclusive, model exemplars are not subject to the same demands as surrogates. Whereas surrogates need to be responsive to manipulations in the same way as would its target, exemplars represent a higher taxon (Bolker 2009). In other words, surrogates only need to match its representandum with respect to the processes narrowly relevant to one’s study (Creager, Lunbeck, and Wise 2007), whereas exemplars raise philosophical issues about the legitimacy of modeling an entire class or lineage. For example, Drosophila melanogaster is often treated as an exemplar of invertebrate genetics, or Danio rerio (zebrafish) as an exemplar of vertebrate embryonic development, rather than as surrogates for a particular species or condition.

Philosophical debates about surrogates and exemplars often focus on whether shared ancestry can justify extrapolating findings from one organism to another without treating the surrogate as a representation of the target (Levy and Currie 2015, Weisberg 2013). Ankeny and Leonelli note that this approach to model organisms relies more on organismal attributes (shared ancestry) and does not engage with the extensive body of scientific practice concerning how model organism research is done (Ankeny and Leonelli 2020, 56). Moreover, appeal to shared ancestry alone is complicated when the organism and its target have distinct environmental histories. However, in the context of clinical and translational research, the philosophical discussion of surrogates has typically focused less on deep biological similarity and more on features that facilitate practical relevance. To discover the appropriateness of a surrogate for purposes of intervention and generalization, researchers will prioritize the display of relevant phenotypes or traits, physiological mechanisms or processes that are known to be homologous with humans, and focus on symptom expression rather than disease etiology (Bolker 2009). Consequently, even when the underlying causes of a disorder are unknown or not reproducible in an animal model, the presence of behaviorally or physiologically similar traits can justify the use of surrogate models within a translational framework.

This logic is paramount in the context of psychiatric and neurological research through the use of what scientist Georg Striedter has called endophenotypes (2022). Rather than attempt to reproduce the full complexity or causal history of a disorder such as schizophrenia or autism, researchers isolate intermediate traits – features such as deficits in working memory, altered social interaction, or impaired sensorimotor gating – that are measurable across species (Dietrich, DiMarco, Taylor, and Lewontin 2026). These endophenotypes serve as tractable targets for modeling and intervention, even when their connection to the underlying pathology remains uncertain. In this way, endophenotypes extend the logic of surrogate modeling by emphasizing epistemically useful symptoms over representational fidelity to disease origins.

Philosophical challenges to surrogate models focus less on perfect biological equivalence and more on what Bolker (2009) notes as the inherent incompleteness and disparity between model and target systems. Due to ‘unknown unknowns,’ surrogate models are shaped by selection pressures in laboratory contexts and empirical uncertainties about which biological aspects must be included for the model to remain relevant. These gaps reveal the limits of any model’s capacity to fully capture the target system’s complexity, although they are increasingly being addressed by the use of big data techniques in science (see section 5). Moreover, Weber (2014) highlights an important distinction in experimental modeling strategies: models that physically replicate the same kinds of processes found in their targets, and surrogate or ‘stand-in’ models that represent physically distinct processes but are nevertheless used as functional substitutes in laboratory settings. This distinction emphasizes that surrogate models do not require physical identity with their targets but instead operate as pragmatic tools that stand in for aspects of the system under study. Sara Green also outlines a more instrumental sense of surrogacy for model organisms where they serve as tools or living assays. Rabbits, for instance, used to be used as a means for pregnancy testing, only to be replaced by the frog, Xenopus (Gurdon and Hopwood 2000). These animals were not models of human reproduction per se, but they were sensitive to human hormones, and their responses provided evidence of some of the human hormonal changes that accompany pregnancy (Green 2024). Generally, surrogate models exemplify a broader shift in experimental biology toward prioritizing measurable and manipulable traits over comprehensive reproduction of a target’s full biology. While surrogate models do not provide one-to-one representations, their utility lies in balancing practical relevance with the acknowledgment of inevitable epistemic gaps. This is a tension that underlies many contemporary strategies for designing and validating experimental models, as discussed below.

2.3 Exploratory Models

Exploratory models gain their distinctiveness as tools that aim less at representing target systems faithfully and more at opening up new investigative pathways: generating novel questions, uncovering patterns, mapping out conceptual or empirical possibilities, helping identify fruitful directions for inquiry, and sometimes revealing overlooked aspects of phenomena (Weber 2024). Axel Gelfert (2016) notes that these models are often deliberately simplified or idealized to the point that their epistemic value lies in four general functions: as a starting point for future inquiry, as a feature in proof-of-principle demonstrations, as a source of potential explanations of observed (types of) phenomena, and as a means of exploring the suitability of the target. With respect to model organisms, Juan Larraín argues that exploratory models also have a type of perspectival modelling function (2024). For example, in the context of early embryonic studies, Larraín notes that C. elegans enabled the mapping of a complete cell lineage and the discovery of apoptosis, while mice provided proof-of-principle demonstrations of regulative development and later revealed unexpected biases in early cell fate (2024). In both cases, their usefulness derived not from mirroring human development but from their capacity to support exploration and generate new vantage points that fostered new thinking about development. Exploratory models can be epistemically indispensable without making strong commitments about the representational content of the putative target systems.

2.4 Negative Models

Our focus has been on the positive mapping between models and targets, but there are also a plethora of model organisms used in research precisely because they lack specific diseases or physiological conditions observed in standard model systems. Known as negative models, these systems are frequently used in the context of clinical translation to understand the mechanisms of resistance when they fail to demonstrate physiological reactions to particular stimuli or diseases. Examples include the use of chimpanzees to study HIV pathogenesis (Veazey and Lackner 2017), cats to study diabetes (Hoenig 2012), or pangolins to study Covid19 (Gupta et al. 2022), as these models fail to develop conditions and symptoms of disease in the same way that humans do.

The epistemic status of negative models as generalizable models has been disputed, since having an animal exhibit unique adaptations to disease does not imply that it shares the same mechanisms as a human, even though these adaptations can provide insights into human biology via analogous mechanisms (Stegmann 2021). Nonetheless, negative models continue to be scientifically generative, contributing both to translational research, such as potential therapies, and to basic understanding of physiological and pathological processes beyond their original applied context (Green 2024). For example, research on naked mole rats’ cancer resistance has provided fundamental insights into tissue mechanics related to aging and pain in humans (Green 2024).

Green, Dietrich, Leonelli, and Ankeny (2018) argue that what they call Krogh organisms can often constitute negative models. Building on the August Krogh’s selection of organisms with extreme adaptations for physiological research (see section 4.1), Green and her collaborators claim that “Krogh organisms are not selected for their representational scope or their similarity to other organisms; rather, they are selected because of distinct features that make a given trait (a mechanism in this case) more experimentally accessible” (Green et al. 2018, 65). The selection of the axon of the squid, Loligo, for instance, was based on how its very large size made voltage clamp techniques much easier for the scientists involved (Green et al. 2018, 64–65; Maxson Jones 2022). The transition from the extreme adaptations common in Krogh organisms to using them as negative models is “motivated by the hope that understanding why certain physiological limitations are not observed in selected species can offer insights into human physiological problems and potential solutions” (Green at al. 2018, 64). Even if the traits of these organisms have translational value, Krogh organisms usually do not serve as the basis for generalizations in the way that model organisms can.

3. Situating Model Organisms in Practice

Model organisms were developed by communities of scientists and cultivated as resources for those communities. Understood as parts of social and material systems for the production of knowledge, model organisms carry with them more than just their intrinsic biological features. Put another way, model organisms are embedded in larger systems; the features of those systems play important roles in explanations of the how model organisms function in experiments and why certain model organism systems have been so historically successful.

3.1 Materiality, Abstraction, and Standardization of Model Organisms

Abstraction and idealization are familiar features of theoretical models in science, where theoretical models can be thought of as fictions, sets, or expressions (Griesemer 2005, Potochnik 2017, on theoretical models see Frigg and Hartmann 2025). As material models, model organisms create an important opportunity to consider how philosophical accounts of abstraction or standardization must be understood within the context of the material practices of science.

Experimental organisms, notes Ramsden, “are, simultaneously, both artefacts and samples of nature” (Ramsden 2011, 365). Unlike a purely theoretical model, the materiality of model organisms matters. As a natural object with some modifications for its roles in the laboratory, a model organism has aspects that are both unknown and known. As a model, some parts of a model organism may represent parts of its targets, but if the model organism system is to be capable of generating new knowledge as part of an experiment, it must have capacities, structures, and functions that are not fully understood. Gaining an understanding of how something functions within the model organism affords the opportunity that the same understanding will hold for its target organisms. As Huber and Keuck put it, “an examination of the role of materiality for animal-based modelling thus needs to address both, how living organisms are technologically kept under control (e.g. by generating transgenic mice) and the extent to which organisms resist processes of (techno-guided) standardization” (Huber and Keuck 2013, 389).

Model organisms are themselves not completely “natural” things. Like most experimental organisms, model organisms have been highly standardized. Naturally occurring variability has been eliminated through the breeding programs of most model organism strains, so that some causal interventions will more reliably produce their effects. This standardization within and across laboratories imparts greater experimental control, making it easier for experimental results to travel and for results to be replicated and extended in other laboratories because of close similarities between the organisms used in each. Nicole Karafyllis refers to these kinds of results as “biofacts” that are both biological and artificial (Karafyllis 2003). This kind of standardization may be a feature of early stages in model organism development. According to Ankeny and Leonelli, “focus on highly standardised organisms in fully standardised environments”… “were key components of the (original) model organism repertoire” (Ankeny and Leonelli 2020, 66). As research progresses, scientists are able to reintroduce the kinds of variability that were initially reduced by conditions of research that demand control. They are motivated to do so because highly standardized model organisms can be less representative of a range of targets (Ankeny 2010, Love & Travisano 2013). For example, various strategies exist in the biomedical literature for re-exposing models to microbes to improve the quality of mouse models in preclinical translational research, with the argument that overly controlled experiments can lose epistemic power for clinical translation (Wallis 2025). In recent years, similar motivations have shaped work on model organisms in the behavioral neurosciences, where researchers seek to recover more ecologically rich behavior, arguing that non-“naturalistic” laboratory behavior may interfere with adequately understanding neural activity (Ulanovsky 2025). Nonetheless, unlike preclinical biomedicine – where model targets such as immune responses or disease phenotypes that are relatively well specified – efforts to restore “naturalistic” experiments with model organisms in the behavioral neurosciences face epistemic problems related to the ‘unknown unknowns’ generated by the selection pressures of the laboratory contexts themselves (see section 2.2). Nemati argues that when behavior itself is the target, introducing ecological richness does not straightforwardly make model organisms more representative of wild type models. Instead, such approaches depend on new forms of technological and methodological standardization that stabilize model organism–environment interactions. As a result, attempts to make behavioral model organisms more “natural” simultaneously engineer what kinds of behaviors the model organism can express and be used to represent (Nemati 2026).

Model organisms can also be subject to a process of abstraction. Leonelli characterizes this process “as the activity of selecting some features of a phenomenon P, as performed by an individual scientist within a specific context, in order to produce a model of (an aspect of) P” (Leonelli 2008, 521). For a material model, like Arabidopsis, the process of abstraction involves choosing a set of features of interest and then stabilizing those models (plant ecotypes) so that they retain those features. This practice aligns with the epistemic priorities of scientists using this material model, because they need to “maintain control over the development of traits characterising different ecotypes, thus ensuring the replicability of specimens as well as their non-locality (that is, the stability of their features regardless of the time and location of their use)” (Leonelli 2008, 522). Abstraction, then, is a set of practices that take place in a particular experimental context relative to articulated epistemic goals. Leonelli summarizes the entire process when she writes: “Abstracting involves selecting a limited set of material features of Arabidopsis wild types as potentially interesting for research purposes; devising ways in which these properties can be incorporated into a unique specimen; making sure that specimens with those characteristics can actually be grown; and constructing a toolkit of guidelines, materials and instruments allowing researchers worldwide to grow specimens in the same way” (Leonelli 2008, 523). Abstraction in this sense is rooted in the materiality of the model, incorporates some parts of standardization, and is necessary for the functioning the model organism research community.

3.2 Experimental Systems

According to Hans-Jörg Rheinberger, research in biology always “begins with the choice of a system rather than with the choice of a theoretical framework” (Rheinberger 1997, 25). Of course, in biology, organisms are crucial components of those systems. One way to contextualize model organisms then is as components of experimental systems.

Rheinberger characterizes experimental systems as units of experimental activity that combine “local, technical, instrumental, institutional, social, and epistemic aspects.” (Rheinberger 1997, 238). Here, an experimental system is comprised of two components: epistemic things and experimental conditions (also referred to as scientific objects and technical objects). The former is the object of study and defined as a material thing that is subject to manipulation but is not fully known or characterized. The experimental conditions are created by a collection of technical objects that are well defined and often standardized. These objects partially stabilize the epistemic thing and in doing so limit its possible actions within the conditions of the experiment. Crucially they do not limit all of the possible outcomes, otherwise an experimental system would not be able to generate novel results and would be reduced to demonstrating already known results that were the products of that set of experimental conditions. As such, Rheinberger’s concept of an experimental system addresses the challenge of explaining how an experiment can be both controlled and able to generate novel results (Weber 2024).

Rheinberger applies his framework to many instances within the history of biology. Most notably for present purposes, in his book, The Epistemology of the Concrete, Rheinberger addresses five experimental systems built around organisms: Carl Corren’s research on Pisum and Zea maize, Max Hartmann’s research on Eudorina elegans, Alfred Kühn’s work on Ephestia kühniella, and the efforts in the Kaiser Wilhelm Institute for Virus Research to research Tobacco Mosaic Virus. Rheinberger assembles his discussion of these organisms under the heading of model organisms, by which he means: “a living thing from the plant, animal, or bacterial kingdom that has been tailored to experimental purposes; manipulating it can generate insights into the constitution, functioning, development, or evolution of an entire class of organisms” (Rheinberger 2010, 7). Rheinberger’s analysis does not focus on model organisms qua model, but as parts of experimental systems. From his analysis of these cases, Rheinberger notes a peculiar feature of model organisms; namely, that “as material supports for scientific work, they can survive the disappearance of entire research programs” (Rheinberger 2010, 8). His history of Tobacco Mosaic Virus certainly supports this claim. However, he also shows how research on Ephestia did not have the staying power that Drosophila did (Rheinberger 2010, 127).

Gail Davies uses Rheinberger’s experimental systems to differentiate the standardization of a model organism from the standardization of the technical objects that comprise its experimental conditions (Davies 2013). While her argument is developed for the case of mice as model organisms, it can be extrapolated to other model organisms. For Davies, there are two senses of standardization relevant to model organisms. The first is “the standardization of the animals around specific gene loci to develop replicable animal models of human diseases” (Davies 2013, 135). This sense of standardization allows the mouse to function as a genetic tool. The second sense of standardization applies to parts of the experimental system. Davies argues that standards “for cage size and design, for husbandry procedures and operating protocols,” are necessary “so that the whole experimental systems can be replicated in different laboratory spaces” 2013, 136). Model organisms are both technical objects in an experimental system and partly epistemic things under investigation. This allows the experimental systems featuring model organisms to “replicate themselves whilst also remaining arrangements in which new kinds of knowledge can be generated” (Davies 2013, 136).

3.3 Repertoires

Rachel Ankeny and Sabina Leonelli embed model organisms in an extensive system, called a repertoire. As they first described it in 2015, a repertoire is “the ensemble of material and social conditions that makes it possible for a short-term collaboration, set up to accomplish a specific task, to give rise to relatively stable communities of researchers” (2015). Repertoires provide a context for model organism research that Ankeny and Leonelli use to explain how model organisms represent, why they are plausible models, and why certain canonical model organisms, such as Drosophila, C. elegans, and Arabidopsis have been so successful (Ankeny and Leonelli 2020, 40).

For Ankeny and Leonelli, a repertoire is “a general framework for analysing the emergence, development, and evolution of particular ways of doing science,” which is focused on how researchers align “conceptual, material, logistical, and institutional” practices to create a plan for research that can be supported and sustained (2020, 41). As such a model organism repertoire includes (1) characteristics of the organism, such as it size, tractability, and its representational scope and target, (2) characteristics of the community, such as commitments to evolutionary conservation and data sharing as well as a source of long-term funding, and (3) characteristics of the broader landscape, such as institutional support for model organism research and a regulated system of exchange for materials, techniques, and data (see Table 1 for a complete list from Ankeny and Leonelli 2020, 41–42).

As much as some philosophers may want to separate features included in a repertoire and deal with their favorites in isolation from the rest, Ankeny and Leonelli argue for their functional integration based on how science is practiced. With their own detailed historical studies of model organism development in Arabidopsis and C. elegans supporting their views, Ankeny and Leonelli argue that “without a combination of canny management by the stock centres, databases, and their users; public relations efforts by governmental funders across the globe; and regularly updated arguments about the role played by these resources in research development including new data-driven methods, these essential components of the repertoire would have disappeared along with much of the attraction of working with model organisms” (2020, 42, 45, Ankeny 2001, Leonelli 2007). Put another way, work at the community and broader landscape levels created the conditions necessary for model organisms, such as Drosophila, to have an incredible record of empirical scientific success. A growing track record of scientific successes also reinforced certain community practices. As a result, the model organism system and its community of users become intertwined or “co-constitutive” (Ankeny and Leonelli 2020, 45).

Each model organism has its own unique repertoire, even if they share some commonalities. This allows Ankeny and Leonelli to explain why the mouse repertoire is different from the Drosophila repertoire, for instance. Importantly, while repertoires are complex and contingent, not every organism develops or sustains one. Even some of the canonical model organisms, such as Xenopus, faltered in the development of its repertoire early on. Other organisms, such as planaria or axolotls, have been widely used in biological research, but, according to Ankeny and Leonelli, do not have all of the features found in the repertoires of the most successful model organisms. For them, this is a valid reason to not consider them as model organisms. Putting aside what gets to be called a model organism for a moment, Ankeny and Leonelli’s repertoire concept offers a way to explain the historical success and distinctiveness of the canonical model organisms. They have identified important features of scientific practice among different organismal systems that explain differences in research output and impact among organismal research communities.

4. The Multi-faceted Justification of Organism Choice

Biologists choose to work on only a fraction of the millions of species on this planet. Which organism a biologist chooses to use and their justification for that choice constitute the problem of organism choice. Biologists typically employ a range of practical and epistemic criteria for their choice. Model organisms are often seen as possessing a particular cluster of distinctive features that justifies their use in biology and medicine.

4.1 Krogh Organisms

Among biologists, the criterion most frequently cited for organism choice is that of the Nobel Prize winning physiologist, August Krogh. Dubbed “Krogh’s Principle” in 1929, the principle states: “[f]or such a large number of problems there will be some animal of choice, or a few such animals, on which it can be most conveniently studied” (Krogh 1929, Krebs 1975, Krebs and Krebs 1980, Green et al. 2018). For instance, Krogh collaborated with Christian Bohr on lung function using the tortoise (Krogh 1929). Bohr had brought the tortoise to lung research because the branching of its trachea was much higher up in the neck than that of other vertebrates, which made it easier to independently study each lung in respiratory studies (Green et al. 2018).

The kinds of organisms that Krogh favored in his research tended to have unique features that were often extreme adaptations. In contrast to model organisms, Green and her collaborators note that so-called Krogh organisms tend not to be standardized, do not have lasting infrastructures supporting their use, and most importantly tend to pick out a small set of specialized features as bearing on a particular research question (Green et al. 2018, 5–6).

While Krogh’s principle is popular among biologists, a number of biologists and philosophers have moved beyond an appeal to convenience and proposed more fine-grained accounts of organism choice (Dietrich et al. 2020, Andrews and Enstipp 2016, Burian 1993, Clarke and Fujimura 1992, Gest 1995, Hopwood 2011, Robert 2008, Zallen 1993).

4.2 Expanding the Range of Reasons for Model Organism Choice

The canonical model organisms were given special status by the NIH, which led to their prioritization among researchers for funding purposes. In a 2106 news post, Michael Lauer, the NIH’s Deputy Director for Extramural Research, discussed an internal NIH study that found that projects using model organisms were awarded grants at a rate that was higher than the rate for all NIH applications (Lauer 2016 [Other Internet Resources]). Increases in NIH and National Science Foundation (NSF) funding for specific organisms were also correlated with increases in publications (Dietrich, Ankeny, and Chen 2014, 792). Being designated a model organism thus seemed to be associated with both higher rates of funding and publication.

Although many federal grants supported laboratory research, several also funded community resources and infrastructure necessary for model organism work. Stock centers and databases for Arabidopsis and C. elegans, for instance, supported both the research of disparate laboratories and the creation of a sense of community among researchers using the same model organism (Leonelli and Ankeny 2012).

While cost has been an important factor in the selection of particular model organisms, this factor alone does not capture the complexity of these decisions, which are often multi-dimensional. Additionally, some model organisms are repurposed from other experimental contexts, chosen not only for their practical tractability but also for the availability of associated methods and infrastructure, even when they were originally studied for different purposes (Kaplan 2025). Scientists will sometimes articulate the grounds for their choices explicitly. For instance, Isabel Rubio-Aliaga writes:

Most model organisms are cost-effective: they have short regeneration times, their maintenance and reproduction in the laboratory is easy and standardized, they have small size and require little space. Moreover, model organisms have been chosen for their different basic biological properties and should reflect the underlying human-derived questions, i.e. have similar pathways and physiological/pathological responses. Most models have been chosen due to their practicability or physiological tractability. A good understanding of their metabolism and biochemistry facilitates data interpretation and extrapolation to humans and therefore their applicability (Rubio-Aliaga 2012, 17).

This mix of practical and biological reasons for organism choice is very common (Dietrich et al. 2020). However, Rubio-Aliaga also includes important community features that support research on a specific organism. In her words, “the use of a model organism is reinforced by a large scientific community behind it, which promotes the interchange of knowledge and tools, such as mutant or bioinformatic resources” (Rubio-Aliaga 2012, 17). These kinds of features figure prominently in Ankeny and Leonelli’s analysis of model organism success (Ankeny and Leonelli 2020, see section 3.3). From scientists’ accounts, Dietrich and his collaborators articulated a list of twenty criteria (Table 2) that may be used in selection of an organism for biological research (Dietrich et al. 2020). These criteria were grouped into five clusters: access, tractability, resourcing, economies, and promise. Choice of an organism using these clusters and criteria involves multiple criteria in a heavily contextualized judgement that may weigh criteria against each other and force researchers to refine their understanding of the criteria and the capabilities of the organisms under consideration.

While these criteria were proposed as generally applicable to all organism choices, the decision to use a model organism is often justified by invoking a narrower set of similar features. For instance, according to Hans-Jörg Rheinberger, “the operative criteria for selection of a model organism are the ease with which it can be maintained and handled, the quantity and quality of the knowledge already accumulated about it, and the ease of access to the phenomenon under investigation” (Rheinberger 2010, 7). Love and Yoshida (2026) further another perspective from evolutionary developmental biology, where model species are chosen to balance experimental tractability with the ability to integrate developmental conservation and evolutionary change, highlighting how organism choice can serve both practical and theoretical aims. Ankeny and Leonelli provide a more extensive set of criteria that include ease of breeding and maintenance in the laboratory, standardization of the organism, accumulation of resources including database infrastructures, conferences, training workshops, and systems for the distribution of organismal stocks. These last kinds of features are important to them because they argue that one of the aims of model organism research includes the creation of “a platform for interdisciplinary integration across biological disciplines and a reference point for comparative research across species” (Ankeny and Leonelli 2020, 3). Ease of phenomenal access is included in Ankeny and Leonelli’s account when they speak of the recognized usefulness of model organisms as tool for biological research. Of course, they also require that a model organism be capable of being applied to a broad set of representational targets.

5. Artificial Intelligence and Model Organisms

The rise of artificially intelligent, or AI, systems in science also introduces new epistemic challenges for the evaluation and use of model organisms. As AI models increasingly improve on tasks such as pattern recognition and feature extraction, they begin to function as models both for improving the scientific study of model organisms and even as substitutes for the organisms themselves.

5.1 AI as a “Discovery” Tool in Model Organism Research

As mentioned before (see section 2.2), a central challenge for mapping model organisms to their target systems concerns what’s known about the similarity between the model and its target. Determining which features are sufficiently similar between two biological systems to justify using one as a model for the other is not only a philosophical challenge, but also an empirical one. These empirical challenges are increasingly addressed by the use of various AI techniques in the biological sciences that can handle large datasets, permitting a kind of “discovery science” for model organism research (Wooley and Lin 2005).

In model organism selection, for instance, AI techniques assist scientists’ selection of the appropriate model organism by providing high throughput comparisons of genomic, molecular, or phenotypic similarities between candidate models and their target systems (Tee 2025). Innovations in molecular measurement techniques are also providing more detailed longitudinal recording across the development and lifespan of animals, revising the landscape of model organism research by requiring further temporal and spatial details for model mapping. For example, identifying specific timepoints over development and the organism’s lifespan where certain features align more closely between species can refine how model organisms are chosen and interpreted in research.

AI models are also being increasingly used to reduce the hypothesis space for testing, using computational models and simulations to run scenarios that would not otherwise be possible. In this way, AI-based modeling of nonhuman model organisms has already led to new theoretical targets for testing, and the same logic now extends to humans, as scientists use task-performing AI models to reduce the space of what is neurobiologically plausible in people (Kriegeskorte and Douglas 2018). For behavioral and cognitive functions, the success of specific task-performing models, such as deep neural networks (DNNs) has begun to unsettle core tenets and theoretical frameworks, such as large language models (LLMs) challenging key tenets of generative linguistics in language research (Piantadosi 2024). On the other hand, more specialized convolutional neural networks (CNNs) have been used to generate biologically testable predictions, such as about how anatomical and physical constraints shape receptive fields in the vertebrate retina and primary visual cortex, and to reconcile competing views of retinal function (Lindsey et al. 2019 [Other Internet Resources]).

Different AI techniques are also responsible for identifying genomic sequences that can be inserted from different model organisms to create new model systems – such as hybrid chimeras – that are ideal for answering specific scientific questions. These chimeric models can further serve as theoretical models to reduce the hypothesis space for testing in model organisms, as well as test what is minimally genomically necessary for specific biological functions (Green 2025).

5.2 Artificial model “organisms”

The pervasiveness of AI models is not confined to their use in the scientific testing of model organisms; rather, AI models can be used as a substitute for organisms as well. Scientists have long used virtual animal models as tools for hypothesis generation in biology, such as using computational creatures to test evolutionary hypotheses (Sims 1994). However, it is only in recent years that the behavioral performance of AI models – particularly, DNNs – have improved to such a degree that scientists are now using them as cognitive and behavioral models that stand in for both humans and nonhuman animals. For instance, researchers now place AI systems into roles structurally analogous to laboratory organisms by translating paradigms such as navigation, object permanence, and problem solving into virtual environments. Here, the artificial agents, rather than living animals, are trained and evaluated on a battery of cognitive tasks, undergoing standardized behavioral assays without any biological substrate (Crosby et al. 2020). This raises a question for using artificial models as model organisms, particularly in psychological and behavior research: do model organisms need to be living organisms, or can artificial models also serve as model organisms?

Drawing from Ankeny and Leonelli’s account of model organisms, minimally, for a system to count as a model organism, it must stand in a modelling relation characterized by a representational scope and a representational target. Animal model organisms satisfy these conditions because they belong to well-defined biological groups with shared evolutionary histories, which constrain both the range of systems to which results can generalize and the features those results are taken to represent. By contrast, it is unclear what the representational scope or targets are meant to be for DNNs given their limitations as non-biological models with no shared evolutionary history (Scholte 2018). Furthermore, the causal mechanisms by which these models operate are only partially understood, making it difficult to specify which systems they represent and in what respect (Millière and Buckner 2024 [Other Internet Resources]). In many cases, the functions that are instantiated by artificial systems are explicitly engineered differently than those in the target system. Hardalupas (2021) argues because DNNs lack a principled basis for projection to a determinate class of organisms or phenomena, this renders their modelling status vague and limited and better classifies them as Krogh organisms. Rather than explicitly aimed at representing a target system, artificial organisms are problem-focused and a representational target that is narrow (Hardalupas 2021). In the absence of a shared material makeup, questions about the use of artificial model organisms as model organisms for cognitive and behavioral capacities rely on answering more fundamental questions about what is required for such capacities – specifically, whether intelligence, cognition, and complex behavior require a biological substrate at all (for more, see Bickle 2020).

The ontology of organisms is complicated by recent efforts to use AI models to construct novel biological building blocks to generate novel model organisms, as well as novel behaviors (Kriegman et al. 2020). These pipelines complicate the boundary of model organisms insofar as biological information guides cognitive and behavioral modeling, then the representational scope and targets of these artificially generated systems, including the basis for projecting their results to natural organisms, remain indeterminate.

6. Implications of Model Organism Research

Out of the nine million or so species available to scientists, even a generously inclusive list of model organisms is only going to constitute a very small sample of extant species. Considered from a phylogenetic standpoint, the NIH canonical model organisms are confined to a very small portion of the tree of life. If, on the one hand, the point of designating model organisms was for them to serve as models for human biomedicine, perhaps this restricted range of species is justified. On the other hand, if model organisms are conceived of as needing to represent a wider array of species and addressing questions beyond the confines of biomedicine, then perhaps their lack of biodiversity is a more serious concern.

6.1 The Research Biodiversity Challenge

Some critics of model organism research argue that many of these canonical model organisms were chosen without sufficient attention to diversity of life forms available to study (Bolker 2019, Gest 1995, Hughes and Kaufman 2000, Gilbert 2009). Ralf Sommer, for instance, wrote, “All established model organisms represent just one of many species in a given taxa.… Also, these organisms do not represent the tree of life in a comprehensive way” (Sommer 2005). Others object to a presumption of generality regarding molecular processes that has led model organism researchers to discount the importance of variation and of comparison between species (Bolker 2012, 2019; Bolker and Raff 2009; Gest 1995; Jenner and Wills 2007; Gilbert 2009; Sedivy 2009; Sommer 2009, Farris 2020). Among the many proposed solutions to this narrow focus have been to sample more widely (Bolker 2012), sample related but similar species (Sommer 2005), sample species that “illustrate evo-devo’s conceptual themes” (Jenner and Wills 2007), and to be more careful in extrapolating from one species to another (Budd 2012). Another biologist has suggested disposing “of the terms ‘model’ and ‘non-model’ systems and adopt instead the more accurate term ‘research organism’” (Sánchez Alvarado 2018).

Documenting changes in organism used in biological research using bibliometric data, Dietrich, Ankeny, and Chen demonstrated that since 1960 there has been considerable growth in the use of most of the NIH canonical model organisms (Dietrich, Ankeny, and Chen 2014). Moreover, within the journal Genetics since 1960, the proportion of publication using non-model organisms has declined sharply. Although articles using non-model organisms comprise only 25% of the articles published in 2010, they account for 75% of the biodiversity in the journal’s articles. Overall, the diversity of species represented in the pages of Genetics is about the same between 1960 and 2010. The number of species (species richness) has actually increased since 1960, but that increase has come largely from non-model species (Dietrich, Ankeny, and Chen 2014). This overall increase in the diversity of organisms used in biological research has been further supported by an analysis of organism use trends in 817,239 publications (Pierson et al. 2017). However, Pierson and his collaborators note that this diversifying trend plateaued in the 1990s and that the instances of model organism use declined in their sample “from around 26–28% in the 1980s to around 21–22% in the 2010s.” Peirson and his collaborators conclude that their data calls into question “the widely held assumption that a small handful of model organisms have increasingly dominated biomedical research, causing declines in the diversity of experimental organisms in general” (Pierson et al. 2017). Earlier, Jamie Davies surveyed publications in developmental biology and argued that there is no clear dividing line between model and non-model organisms (Davies 2007). He takes this to be evidence that there is no preference for model organisms, despite the fact that the most widely used organisms in development are model organisms (Davies 2007).

These analyses of trends in research biodiversity should not be taken to imply that the concerns of scientists asking for more attention to a wider range of organisms have been addressed. Most of the concerns raised regarding research biodiversity are made with reference to specific fields of research, such as evolutionary developmental biology. Overall trends and the trend in the journal Genetics may not accurately represent that of other fields within biology.

6.2 Ethical Implications

The extensive use of animal systems in biomedical research, including the animal model organisms, has been the subject of criticism from proponents of animal ethics for decades (Franco 2013, Green 2024). While acknowledging the scientific value of animal experimentation, William Russell and Rex Burch began advocating for more humane standards in animal experimentation in the 1950s (Russell and Burch 1959). Their book, The Principles of Humane Experimental Technique, famously argued for the adoption of the 3Rs: Refine, Reduce, and Replace. Refinement of experimental practices sought to decrease the suffering of animals used in experiments, while reduction urged researchers to use as few animals as possible while still maintaining the quality of their experiment. Replacement urged the substitution of “non-sentient material” for “conscious living vertebrates” (Russell and Burch 1959). The three Rs approach became widely accepted in the 1980s as a moderate path in animal ethics (Franco 2013). Versions of it are now common parts of animal welfare policies, including those the European Commission.

Animal welfare considerations have a significant impact on model organism research because the most popular model organisms, mice and rats, are vertebrates and so are subject to calls for reduction and replacement. Additionally, efforts to close the translational gap between, for instance, mice, as models, and humans, as targets, has led to efforts to “humanize” mice (Davies 2012, Hyun 2019). In these mouse model systems, a mouse bred to have a suppressed immune system has human cells or tissues introduced into their own tissues producing a human-mouse chimera (Stripecke et al. 2020). These humanized mice are then used to study features of the immune system, metabolism, and/or pathologies, such as cancer (Stripecke et al. 2020, Green 2024). The most controversial type of human-animal chimera, however, are human-animal neurological chimeras, such as those created when human glial progenitor cells were transplanted into neonatal mice and allowed to develop (Hyun 2019). From the standpoint of making an inference from model organism to its target, humanized mice can allow for more accurate comparisons based on shared features created through the process of humanization (Maugeri and Blasimme 2011). However, these epistemic advantages trade-off against new ethical concerns. The chief ethical concern with these kinds of chimeras is that they would begin to have characteristics, including cognitive traits, that we consider to be important to moral status (Hyun 2019, Streiffer 2005, on the moral status of animals see Gruen and Monsó 2024). An even stronger case for replacement then could be made for neurological chimeras.

The goal of replacing animal models may be admired and even mandated, but the successful replacement of animal models by non-animal models has also created a paradox. In the words of Hunter, “The paradox of model organisms seems to be that the need for them will only diminish once most of the fundamental mechanisms of biology have been solved to allow the greater use of both human tissue cultures and in silico methods for drug discovery. To reach that point, however, requires the extensive use of model organisms” (Hunter 2008, 719). Put another way, we are far from having enough knowledge of fundamental biological systems to be able to fully implement that knowledge into computer models and simulations. To get that necessary knowledge will require much more animal based research, so the goal of animal replacement may be laudable, but will not be fully realized in the near future.

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Cited Resources

• Lauer, Michael, 2016, “Model Organisms, Part 3: A Look at All RPGs for Six Models”, Open Mike Blog, August 24, 2016.
• Lindsey, Jack, Samuel A. Ocko, Surya Ganguli, and Stephane Deny, 2019, “A Unified Theory of Early Visual Representations from Retina to Cortex through Anatomically Constrained Deep CNNs”, arXiv:1901.00945
• Millière, Raphaël and Cameron Buckner, 2024, “A Philosophical Introduction to Language Models – Part II: The Way Forward”, arXiv:2405.03207
• National Institutes of Health, 2000a, “Model Organisms for Biomedical Research”, February 1, 2000.
• National Institutes of Health, 2000b, “Currently Funded Activities and Resources Responsive to the Non-Mammalian Models Workshop Recommendations, February 1999”, August 18, 2000.
• National Institutes of Health, 2009, “Model Organisms for Biomedical Research”, August 30, 2009.
• Rorot, Wiktor, 2025, “Looking for Keys in Model Organisms: Interpreting and Keying-up in Basal Cognition”.

Other Resources

• Model Organisms, FAQ for Reviewers, Center for Scientific Review (NIH)
• Model Organism Sharing Policy, Policy and Compliance (NIH)
• The Natural History of Model Organisms edited by Ian Baldwin et al. (eLife Collection)
• What is a mouse model?, (The Jackson Laboratory)
• Organism Databases:
  • Flybase
  • Rat Genome Database
  • Saccharomyces Genome Database (SGD)
  • The Arabidopsis Information Resource (TAIR)
  • Worm Atlas

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