1. On authenticity, see Guthrie (1978: 321–2), and Jowett (1875: 3–29). The anonymous 6^th century CE Prolegomena in Platonis Philosophiam (25.6–8) has a report similar to that in Diogenes, see Morrow (1960: 515–8). For a qualified rejection of the Laws’ authenticity, see Nails and Thesleff 2003. Their view, however, requires some highly controversial assumptions, cf. Irwin 2019.

2. On issues concerning stylometry, see Brandwood 1990, 2022; Kahn 1996: 36–70; Keyser 1991, 1992; Ledger 1989; Nails 1992; Charles Young 1994.

3. This entry uses the Greek text and lineation of É. Des Places and A. Diès (1951–1956) and with occasional modification, the translation of Reeve (2022). Hereafter Stephanus citations without a title refer to the text of the Laws.

4. Also see 2.660Dff., 3.696B–697C and 5.742D–744A. Note that justice includes wisdom (phronêsis), 1.631C. There will be citizens, to be sure, in whom the law fails to instill the whole of virtue, but Plato never suggests that the laws fail in the case of every non-philosopher. Indeed, he expects that there will be many successes, see, e.g., 1.630C, 631CD, 641BC, 647CD, 4.705E–706A, 707D, 5.731E–732B, 734E–735A, 742C–743C, 6.770C–771A, 7.790B, 807CE, 817BC, 818CD, 822E–823A, 9.853BC, 876CD, 878AB, 11.913BC, 921D–922A, 12.945BE, 946E–947B, and 963A. On happiness as the goal of law in the Republic and the Laws, see section 6.3.

5. This entry uses the Greek text and lineation of É. Des Places and A. Diès (1951–1956) and with occasional modification, the translation of Reeve (2022). Hereafter Stephanus citations without a title refer to the text of the Laws.

6. It is controversial whether and in what sense Plato at the time of the Republic thought that Kallipolis was actualizable and the exact sense of the claim that Kallipolis is possible. This entry is not the place to enter into this complicated dispute, but see, e.g., Beere 2023 and Marshall 2008. Section 3.2 shows that the exact identity of Magnesia is complicated, but this entry uses “Magnesia” for convenience and usually omits the qualifications noted in section 3.2.

7. Those who identify the best city of 5.739E-740A with Kallipolis include Schofield (2006: 75) and Wilburn (2021: 268 n. 270).

8. Kenneth Moore (2005: 31), for example, in a book in which “second-best city” is part of the title (Sex and the Second-Best City: Sex and Society in the Laws of Plato) defends the traditional interpretation by quoting Field (1949 [1969: 74]):

We should not, as Field says, “draw any conclusions about a possible change in Plato’s views … we are expressly told [referring to T1] that the provisions of the Republic still represent the ideal, but are not regarded as practicable in these circumstances”.

9. There was an old report that Magnesia on the Meander was colonized by Cretans, England 1921: 2.371.

10. Section 6.2 shows that the citizens’ maximal happiness is the ultimate criterion for laws and political institutions and it is not obvious that the degree of unity and the amount of happiness are always co-extensive. Further, to have any hope of being co-extensive, unity must be more than the degree to which pleasures and pains (or, more generally, goods and bads) are shared by the citizens, since the citizens might share these things to a high degree while having mistaken conceptions of them. This sort of high degree of unity would not correlate with great happiness.

11. On unity in the Republic, see Bobonich (2023a).

12. The case at 8.840E is complicated: (i) the need for Kleinias’ agreement (which is somewhat problematic here) is stressed, and (ii) the envisaged colonists might not be able to conform with the law, although it is within the general power of human beings. We must also distinguish colonists not being able to conform with a law and their being given a choice of options (7.820DE).

13. For the charge that Plato is an “enemy of the open society”, see Popper 1945.

14. In both cases, this is knowledge of relational goodness. At least in some dialogues, for example, the Republic, this knowledge of relational goodness may depend on knowledge of non-relational goodness (in the Republic, this would be knowledge of the Form of the Good).

15. In the Laws and elsewhere in the late dialogues, Plato sometimes uses “courage” and “moderation” to denote psychic dispositions that are not directed by wisdom (e.g., 2.661E, 3.696D). But these dispositions are not beneficial unless so directed and given the Reciprocity of the Virtues, courage is a virtue only when so directed. See Bobonich (2002: 288–92). Since the Laws holds that non-philosophers can be genuinely virtuous, some disposition short of full-blown philosophical knowledge must count as a kind of wisdom or play the role of wisdom, see Bobonich 2002: 194–200.

16. This is the meaning in the first recorded use of “happy” in Greek literature, Hesiod, Works and Days (826–8).

17. For some recent works by linguists on this topic, see Kennedy 2007, Kennedy and McNally 2005, Rett 2015.

18. Versions of structurally similar conditionality theories are held by Immanuel Kant and a number of contemporary axiologists. See, e.g., Bradley 2006, Korsgaard 1983, Olson 2004, and Zimmerman and Bradley 2019. The main competing theory in contemporary axiology is a theory of organic unities of the sort found in G. E. Moore’s Principia Ethica (1903). The argument against the Isolated Life of pleasure at Philebus 21AD is a kind of conditionality argument, although one that differs from that found in the Laws.

19. Several passages in Plato have been thought to suggest that a sufficient degree of ill health could render the life of even the virtuous person not happy and, indeed, not worth living, see, e.g., Crito 47E and Gorgias 512AB (cf. 505A). For discussion, see Brickhouse and Smith (1987), Irwin (1986), Kraut (1984: 37–9), and Vlastos (1991: 200–32). We take no position on this issue.

20. (ii) is not strictly part of the Conditionality Theory, but follows quickly on the correct justification of the Conditionality Theory. If virtue’s goodness is sufficiently great, then we may be able to justify the claim that the just person is always better off than the unjust. Our point in the text concerns the implications of the set of claims that we note in the text. See section 5.1 for an argument that the Laws does accept the claim that the just person is always happier (i.e., has greater well-being) than the unjust person.

21. Cf. Rep. 1.361AD where Glaucon seems to demand that Socrates show the just option is always best.

22.

1. False anticipatory pleasures in which the anticipated pleasure never occurs (Phil. 39E-40C),
2. Misestimations of pleasures’ and pains’ sizes because of temporal distance (41A-42C),
3. Mistaking a neutral state for pleasure because of one’s prior pain or vice versa (42C-44A), and
4. Mistaking an impure pleasure for a pure one (44A-50E).

False pleasures (1) and (2) are still pleasures. In (3), the pleasure is merely apparent; in (4), the pleasure partly consists of pain which reduces its overall pleasantness. All four lead to overestimating pleasures and (2)–(4) to underestimating pains.

23. For a start on the literature, see Barney, Brennan, and Brittain 2012; Bobonich 2002, 2010a, 2017; D. Frede 2010; Kahn 2004; Kamtekar 2017; Kanayama 1987; Karfík 2005; Lautner 2005; Lorenz 2006, 2012; Lott 2011; Meyer 2018; Price 2009; Weinstein 2018; Wilburn 2021.

24. In the Statesman, Plato restricts membership in the good or just city to those who are capable of genuine virtue, that is, those who have received an education that gives them “really true opinion that is firmly settled about the fine, the just, and the good and their opposites”, Stsmn. 309C. This conception of the good city as a community of the virtuous aiming in common at living virtuously is not found in the Republic (since at the least the producers are not capable of virtue). Nor is it found for the first time in Aristotle’s Politics. It is constituted in Plato’s Statesman and Laws.

25. As England rightly notes, this question “brings us back to the main subject of the book” (1921: 2.280).

26. England is the only commentator to note that this is a “remarkable prohibition” (1921: 2.366). The repetition of ergon and parergon emphasizes the revision of the Republic.

27. Aristotle shares this conception: in the most finely constituted city,

the citizens must not live a mechanic or mercantile life (for such a life is ignoble and contrary to virtue), nor yet must those who are to be citizens in the best city be farmers (for leisure is needed both for the development of virtue and for political activity). (Politics 7.8 1328b39–1329a2)

[The] mechanic class has no share in the city, nor has any other class that is not a craftsman of virtue (Politics 7.8 1329a19–21).

28. Aristotle supports this reading. According to him, the citizens of Magnesia will live “in idleness” (argoi, Politics 2.3 1265a15–16) and their lives will be free “from necessary tasks” (Politics 2.3 1265a6–8). Indeed, Aristotle compares their freedom from necessary tasks to that of the auxiliaries and guardians of the Republic who live off the contributions of the producer class and are not engaged in farming or any other productive activity. Morrow’s arguments (1960: 152, 531) for the claim that most citizens work their land are well answered by Brunt (1993: 273–4) and Guthrie (1987: 345). Property classes affect some political duties and the less well‐off might have to devote more time to the supervision of their plots, even if they do not engage in labor themselves. But, as Morrow himself agrees, property qualifications do not play a large political role in Magnesia. On Greek views about the compatibility of estate management with leisure, see Brunt (1993: 264), Johnstone (1994), and Ober (1998: 341 n. 88). For a more pessimistic view of the possibility of leisure for Magnesian citizens, see Samaras (2012).

29. The fundamental and by far the best studies of Magnesia’s political and social institutions remain Morrow (1960) and Piérart (1974). Although Laks (2022) does not attempt to provide a systematic account of them, his various remarks are suggestive and valuable. Lane (2022) also discusses them.

30. Golding and Golding (1975: 353) estimate Magnesia’s population at about 50,000 plus resident aliens.

31. On land ownership in Magnesia, see Morrow (1960: 105–7). For limitations on the lot holder’s testamentary powers, see 9.877CE and 11.923Aff. On common meals, see 12.955E, 8.847E–848B, and Morrow (1960: 395–6).

32. Some have interpreted Plato to mean that the highest class has only between two and three times the value of the lot, i.e., their total property taking the notional value of the lot into account would be worth up to four times the value of the lot. The interpretation that they may have movable assets up to four times the value of the lot is held by Aristotle (Politics 2.3 1265b21–3 and 2.4 1266b5–8) and is convincingly argued for by Morrow (1960: 131 n. 112). This is important, since the other interpretation reduces the lowest class to the level of subsistence farmers and thus significantly reduces their chances for political participation or leisurely activity.

33. For passages supporting H, see Rep. 4.420B, Laws 1.631B, 4.715AB, 5.742DE, 743C; 7.806C. On whether the Republic has an organic conception of the city’s happiness, see Bobonich (2023a: 106–9).

34. Cooper (1977) and Waterlow [Broadie] (1973) attribute to Plato in the Republic a strong form of act-consequentialism, although they may not recognize that this is what they are doing.

35. For further discussion of these issues and of the above objections to the idea that Plato’s views have some significant affinities to consequentialism, see Bobonich 2023a.

36. Cf. the supplement: this is a misunderstanding of the powers of Kallipolis’ philosopher rulers.

37. Immutable: E. Barker (1918 [1960: 342–52]), Klosko (2008), Stalley (1983: 82). Revisable: Bobonich (2002: 395–408), Marquez 2011, Morrow (1960: 165, 176–7, 201, 501–14, 570–1). In addition to the passages discussed above, see 2.656D-657B; 7.800C-801E; 8.828BC, 835AB, 840CE, 846BC; 9.855D; 12.957AD. Other discussions include Lewis (1998), Reid (2021).

38. Stalley suggests that the Athenian is convinced that he already possesses sufficient knowledge to guarantee that no revision is necessary (1983: 41), but as Balot (2020: 64) rightly points out the Athenian explicitly stresses the need to investigate some matters further to gain greater clarity (7.799CD, 803AB) and that some of the philosophers on the Dawn Council will possess equal or greater understanding (12.968D-969C).

39. Republic 4.445DE and 5.458BC prima facie suggest that significant legal change is nearly impossible, but this seems difficult to explain except as rhetorical exaggeration, since Socrates and his interlocutors set Kallipolis’ laws but, unlike Kallipolis’ philosopher-rulers, lack knowledge of the Form of the Good (Rep. 2.378E-379A, 6.506BC). Cf. Canevaro (2015).

40. To be clear: the conjunction of (1)–(4) is neither necessary nor sufficient for legal immutability, other factors, such as the following point about human psychology would have to be taken into account. But (1)–(4) are useful in indicating the outlines of a general strategy for arguing for such legal immutability.

41. Murphy (2006: 2, 10–18) defends this characterization; M. Moore 1994 criticizes it. Also see Plunkett 2019.

42. Bobonich (2022) which also discusses the Hippias Major and the probably inauthentic Minos.

43. For Plato on women, see Blair (2012), Cohen (1987), Harry and Polansky (2016), Kamtekar (2002), Samaras (2010), Saunders (1995), Vlastos (1989 [1995]). Newman (1887: 1.179–80, 195) argues that in the Laws the household has only a shadowy existence and sees Laws 7.794AC as promising, even in Magnesia as originally constituted, something like daycare for children over 3.

44. The notion of rational persuasion is hard to make precise. If one restricts rational argumentation to the sort of reasoning that would be found in the upper two divisions of the Republic’s Divided Line, then the preludes will not constitute rational persuasion. But then nothing, or almost nothing, in Plato’s dialogues would count as rational argumentation either. As a first approximation, something would count as intended to be rational persuasion to act in the way that a law requires if it appeals to considerations that Plato takes to be true and takes to provide good reasons to act in this way. Cf. Laks 2022: 216, n. 15.

45. Annas (2017: 91–105), however, persuasively shows that some preambles that are dismissed as merely rhetorical do appeal to considerations that Plato thinks are true.

46. Others seeing them as non-rational include Brisson (2000), Lane (2010), and Nightingale (1993). Those who do not see them as merely non-rational rhetoric include Annas (2017), Cooper (1999: 184–90), Irwin (1995: 349–53), and Schofield (2006: 319–21).

47. Laks arrives at a conclusion similar to the non-rational interpretations by a more complicated route. On his view, the recommendations about preludes in Book 9 are meant to apply to an ideal situation ( a “legislative utopia”) that is not possible for humans, that is, one in which laws no longer have penalties but are replaced by philosophical reasoning (Laks 2022: 107–35). Restricting our analysis to the text of the Laws itself, there is little if any support for such a reading. Plato never speaks of a “legislative utopia” or suggests that the Laws’ interlocutors are ever occupied with sketching the institutions appropriate for a city without laws. Indeed, he explicitly recognizes that laws are necessary for humans who are not heroes or children of gods (9.853AD). The only societies mentioned in the Laws that can make do without legislation (nomothesia, although they do have “ancestral laws”, patrioi nomoi ) are the small clans and family groups that are the survivors of the recurrent cataclysms that destroy civilization (3.676A-681D). Further, the interlocutors repeatedly endorse the use of preludes for the legal system that they are sketching (4.723B-724B, 6.772E, 9.858C-859B, 10.884A-907D, 11.916D, 923C, 925E, 930E, 932Α).

Fully evaluating Laks’ interpretation would require more discussion than can be provided here, since he thinks that the texts of the Republic and the Laws can only be properly understood through the lens of a highly imaginative and somewhat obscure theoretical construct centering on the notion of possibility that he has developed over the course of many publications. When viewed through Laks’ creative interpretive lens, he thinks that we can see that parts of the text that seem to be discussing our actual human situation apply only to ideal circumstances. Like Straussian readings, Laks’ interpretation requires us to have more confidence in the interpreter’s unique and inventive methodology than in the results of standard textual interpretation. Whether such confidence is justified in either case is a question that cannot be addressed here.

48. Cf. Tht. 176AB and Rep. 10.613AB. Also see Annas 1999 and Sedley 1999.

49. On this argument, see Carone (1994, 2005); Lee (1976); Mason (1998); Mayhew (2007); Menn (1995); Mohr (2005); Saunders (1991); Stalley (1983). On the longstanding controversy over whether Laws 10’s position that soul is the cause of all motion both orderly and disorderly is consistent with the apparent view of the Statesman and the Timaeus that some disorderly motion is not caused by soul, see Clegg (1976), Easterling (1967), Mason (2006), Robinson (1970), Vlastos (1939 [1965], 1965, 1975). On the number of gods, see Mayhew (2008: 209–10). A standard objection to such arguments is that there need not be a first mover. Further, the soul’s priority does not entail continued primary control of all other motions.

50. On the relation between the petteia-player and the Demiurge and the related question of whether the All is unimprovable, see Broadie (2008) and Mohr (2005). As part of ordering the All for the best, the petteia-player constructs a system of transmigration in which better souls automatically move to better places, while worse souls do the opposite in successive incarnations (10.903D–905C). This system resembles at a cosmic level the Distribution according to Virtue principle noted in section 6.3. Is this transmigration system justified simply by its contribution to the All’s happiness or does it have some independent normative force as a principle of merit? Does the transmigration system promote the well-being of those subject to it? Answering these questions will be important for understanding Plato’s penology. For one interpretation, see Bobonich 2023a.

51. E. Barker’s views and reasons are endorsed by Schöpsdau on 5.739B8–D5. Further, 7.807BC is a second passage that refers backs to 5.739–740. One might argue that 7.807B2–6 does not unambiguously claim that communism extends throughout the best city of 5.739–740. Although 7.807B2–6 at least very strongly implies that communism extends throughout the best city, 5.807BD makes it clear that the producer class is excluded from Magnesia (and thus also from the best city) because its members would be unable to pursue an active life of virtue. This points strongly in favor of communism extending throughout the best city.

52. Miller’s interpretation is facilitated by his mistaken translation of Rep. 4.423E6–424A3:

the rulers of his just and good city [i.e., Kallipolis] “will easily discover … how all … must be governed as far as possible [hoti malista] by the old proverb [kata tên paroimian] that friends share things in common [koina ta philôn]”.

This translation makes it appear that Plato is saying that all the citizens will be governed as far as possible by the principle that the things of friends are in common; the principle applies only “as far as possible” because common property and families do not apply to the third class. But this is a mistake, “all” is neither masculine nor feminine, but neuter (panta) and does not refer to the people or citizens of Kallipolis, but rather to the rules, principles or customs that will govern their behavior. An accurate translation shows that the passage does not support Miller’s interpretation:

For if they [the guardians and the auxiliaries] by being well educated become reasonable [metrioi] men, they will easily see clearly all these [panta tauta] things [i.e. the injunctions just given to the guardians by Socrates and his interlocutors such as that an inferior child of guardians must be demoted to a lower class] and others too [alla ge] which we are now leaving aside, as that the possession of wives and marriages and the procreation of children and all these things [tauta … panta] should be managed to the greatest degree possible [hoti malista] according to the old proverb that the things of friends are in common [koina ta philôn]. (Rep. 4.423E5–424A3)

Socrates here does not say that these principles apply to all the citizens or that they apply to them “to the greatest degree possible”. Indeed, the main practice that Socrates mentions in this passage is musical education (which is what makes the guardians and auxiliaries “well educated” at this point in the Republic before the introduction of the guardians’ higher education) and this applies only to the auxiliaries and the guardians. Further, Socrates’ speech (Rep. 4.424A5–10) that immediately follows Rep. 4.423E5–424A3 and Adeimantus’ enthusiastic assent to the principles that Socrates suggests (Rep. 4.424A4) links together the guardians’ and auxiliaries’ musical education with their procreative practices. Pace Miller, Socrates in the Republic does not apply the modifying phrase “to the greatest degree possible” to the principle that the things of friends should be in common in order to indicate communism will be practiced in only two out of three of the city’s classes. The phrase instead indicates the degree to which the things of friends are to be in common within the guardian and auxiliary classes. The “greatest good” for a city is a community of pleasure and pain (Rep. 4.464B), that is, when the citizens say “mine” and “not mine” about the same pleasures and pains so that the well-governed city is like a single human body. This condition is brought about by the communal family structure of the first two classes, but even within these classes success will not be complete, but only “as far as possible” (Rep. 5.464CD).