Plato’s Laws

First published Fri May 15, 2026

[Editor’s Note: The following entry replaces and is partially based on the former entry titled Plato on utopia.]

The texts of all great philosophers give rise to interpretative disagreements, but the extent of disagreement in Plato interpretation is greater than in most of the other philosophers in the Western canon. This is at least in part because Plato interpreters often employ different methodologies in arriving at their accounts. There are, for example, those who work in the tradition of Leo Strauss (1975), or Eric Voegelin (1966), those who give especially significant weight to the literary aspects of the dialogues (e.g., Kahn 2013), those working in the history of ideas tradition who emphasize the Laws’ connections with contemporaneous literary and historical texts (e.g., Nightingale 1993, Wilburn 2021), and those working in the Tübingen tradition (e.g., Gaiser 1963 [1998], Krämer 1982 [2001], and Reale 1993 [2000]).

This entry focuses primarily on the interpretative work in what might be called analytical history of philosophy that gives primary place to the analysis of the text’s arguments. But despite the marked increase in interest in the Laws since the 1990s, it remains the case that a greater proportion of the important work on the Laws is done by classicists, political scientists, and historians of ideas than is the case for most other Platonic dialogues. There are, for example, relatively few sustained interpretations of the second part of the Parmenides or of the analysis of false speech in the Sophist that focus largely on their literary features or their place in Greek history of ideas. So even within the study of Plato, differences of interpretation with respect to the Laws are especially great. This entry tries to give the reader a sense of what the main disputes and the prominent different interpretations are.

1. Authenticity and Chronology

In the philologically less conservative days of the nineteenth century, the Laws’ authenticity was rejected by various important scholars. Even the great Platonist, Georg Ast, held that

One who knows the true Plato needs only to read a single page of the Laws in order to convince himself that it is a fraudulent Plato that he has before him. (Ast 1816: 391; cited and translated by Harward 1928: 34; quoted in Guthrie 1978: 322)

Others held that the text was substantially revised by Philip of Opus. But Aristotle recognizes it as Plato’s (Politics 2.3 1264b26–7) and refers to it in a number of places. Today almost no serious scholar doubts its authenticity. Although some, such as W. K. C. Guthrie, accept its authenticity with little enthusiasm:

after a fairly close study of all the other dialogues, I feel no doubt that, to adapt the ancient critic’s verdict on the Odyssey, it is a work of old age, but definitely—even if (as the content may occasionally make one think) regrettably—the old age of Plato. (Guthrie 1978: 322)

On the question of chronology, two external pieces of evidence are valuable. First, Aristotle tells us that the Laws is later than the Republic (Politics 2.3 1264b26–7). Second, Diogenes Laertius (3.37) reports that “some say” it was unfinished at Plato’s death and the Laws’ text does show signs of incompleteness and lack of revision.[1]

Many, although certainly not all, Plato scholars think that we can—largely by means of stylometry (that is, the quantitative study of the features of Plato’s prose)—divide the dialogues into the following three groups.[2] The stylometric evidence does not, in general, allow us to order chronologically the dialogues within a given group (they are listed below in alphabetical order within each group). Such stylometric features most clearly separate the Group 3 dialogues from the rest, and relying on other evidence including that just noted for the Laws’ lateness, it is reasonable to see Group 3 as the latest and Group 1 as the earliest.

  • Group 3: Critias, Laws, Philebus, Sophist, Statesman, and Timaeus.
  • Group 2: Parmenides, Phaedrus, Republic, and Theaetetus.
  • Group 1: Apology, Charmides, Cratylus, Crito, Euthydemus, Euthyphro, Gorgias, Hippias Major, Hippias Minor, Ion, Laches, Lysis, Menexenus, Meno, Phaedo, Protagoras, and Symposium.

Given the Laws’ length (it is the longest dialogue and is, roughly 20% longer than the Republic), it seems likely that its composition overlapped with the composition of at least some of the other Group 3 dialogues.

This brings us to another important distinction among Plato scholars. Some accept that stylometric evidence establishes the above chronological divisions, but deny that Plato’s views changed (or, at any rate, that they changed significantly) over time (“unitarians”), while others (“developmentalists”) hold that Plato’s views do change significantly over time. This dispute is relevant to the interpretation of the Laws, since one recurring question in the literature concerns the relation between the Republic and the Laws.

Before turning to specific topics, it should be noted that those writing on the Laws have tended to treat it differently from other dialogues and, in particular, rarely draw extensively on the other late dialogues to aid in its interpretation. But developmentalists should be willing to draw freely on the other late dialogues and unitarians should be willing to draw equally on all the other dialogues. One reason for this isolation of the Laws is that scholars have often largely focused on its relation to the Republic. Certainly, from the time of Aristotle, the question of the relation of the two dialogues has been an important line of inquiry. But focusing almost exclusively on comparisons with the Republic may seriously distort our understanding of the Laws itself. The Laws states a number of important ethical, political, and psychological claims without justifying them. It thus seems natural to consider whether such claims can be justified by drawing on the relevant material from, for example, the Philebus and the Timaeus. It is difficult to provide a satisfactory principled justification for not doing so. One might, for example, hold that each dialogue is its own world and should not be interpreted by drawing on the resources of any other dialogue. But this is an extreme and implausible methodology that has few, if any, adherents. Or one might hold that the Laws’ ethical and political views are free-standing and do not rest on Plato’s epistemology, metaphysics (including his metaphysics of value), or psychology. Since most Plato scholars do not think that this is true of, say, the Phaedo, the Republic, or the Symposium, one would need to explain the anomaly. This entry will note such connections when they seem especially relevant.

2. Overview

The Laws comprises a conversation in 12 books, set on Crete, among three interlocutors: an unnamed Athenian Visitor (Plato’s spokesman in the Laws), Megillus, a Spartan, and Kleinias, a Cretan. The Athenian proposes that the three discuss constitutions (politeia, politeiai) and laws as they walk along the long road to the temple of Zeus. The first two books of the dialogue consider the proper goal or end (telos) of legislation, which turns out to be the virtue of the citizens. (A fuller account is in section 6.3.) They also discuss topics such as ethical psychology and education that will help them to understand how a city could achieve this goal.

The third book turns to a discussion of the origins of constitutions and of changes in those constitutions, and attempts to draw lessons for the lawmaker from the histories of various actual cities, including Persia, Sparta, Crete, and Athens. At the end of Book 3 (Laws 702BD), Kleinias reveals that he has a practical use for just the kinds of discussions they have been having: the cities of Crete have decided to found a new city, to be named Magnesia, in a long abandoned part of Crete, and he, along with nine others, is to be responsible for doing so.[3] (See Section 3.1.) He asks the Athenian to help in the construction of the new city’s constitution and laws. The Athenian agrees, and proposes that they use a new method of legislation—one in which preludes (prooimion, prooimia) that aim at persuading the citizens come before the laws themselves. Books 4–5 contain an argument for the use of preludes and the Great Prelude to the laws in general. The Great Prelude to the laws in general ends in the latter part of Book 5, after which the Athenian proceeds to sketch, often in considerable detail, the constitution, the political and social institutions, and the laws of this new city, along with the political and ethical principles that justify them.

A brief sketch of the content and structure of the twelve books of the Laws follows. After this sketch, the sections are organized topically.

Book 1

The dialogue begins with an investigation into the reasons for the laws and social practices of Sparta and Crete. The Athenian argues that laws should be justified not by the goal of victory in war—which is how both Megillus and Kleinias first attempt to justify the laws of their own cities—but rather by reference to what is best, which is complete virtue (that is, courage (andreia), justice (dikaiosunê), moderation (sôphrosunê), and wisdom (usually phronêsis), rather than courage alone.

In fact, the Athenian says that the complete virtue of the citizens as a whole should be the single goal of the legislator (1.630C; see also, e.g., 4.705D–706A, 12.963A).[4] The Athenian also claims that laws are correct laws insofar as they promote the happiness (eudaimonia) of the citizens (1.631B; see also 4.715B, 5.743CD). Immediately after he makes this latter claim, he draws a distinction between human and divine goods and tells us that the human goods—such as wealth and health—are conditional upon the divine goods, of which wisdom is first, then moderation, then justice, and finally courage. He later describes this conditionality by saying that the human goods are good for someone who is virtuous but bad for bad people (2.661BC, see section 4.2). This Conditionality Thesis helps Plato bring together the two characterizations of the goal of the laws in terms of the citizens’ virtue and happiness: if virtue is necessary for benefit and thus for happiness, promoting the happiness of the citizens will require making them virtuous. This Conditionality Thesis, as well as the dual characterization of the goal of the laws, raises but leaves unanswered questions about the precise relation between virtue and happiness,: for example, is virtue actually sufficient for happiness, or is it simply necessary? (See section 4.1.)

The remainder of Book 1 is concerned with ethical psychology and education: that is, with beginning the project of showing how a city could produce citizens who possess complete virtue. This discussion heavily emphasizes the importance of feeling pleasure and pain correctly. The Athenian, in fact, claims that

[For] human beings who inquire into laws almost their entire inquiry concerns pleasures and pains, both in cities and in private characters. These two springs flow forth by nature, and whoever draws from the one he should, at the time that he should, and as much as he should, is happy. (1.636DE)

This phase of the discussion begins with the Athenian announcing his intention to discuss the institutions that promote courage, which he quickly notes should cover the ability to resist pleasure in addition to the ability to resist pain. He proposes, to his interlocutors’ surprise, controlled symposia (drinking parties) as the institution that will train this ability to resist pleasure.

As this sort of training will serve as an important part of ethical education, this suggestion leads the Athenian to discuss education in general. Education involves the direction of a child’s pleasures, desires, and love towards his adult occupation. In the case of the citizens, education must draw their souls to a desire and love of being a perfect citizen who rules and is ruled in accordance with justice (1.643CD). Pleasure is clearly central to the account of ethical psychology and education in the Laws, and one important question is why this is so. Is coming to have the correct pleasures simply of instrumental value (insofar as it blocks one route to akratic action and vice or focuses the child on the things which he must come to find valuable), or are at least some pleasures good in their own right because of their contents? (See section 5.1).

The discussion of Book 1 closes with an image of the soul which, the Athenian says, will make it clearer what virtue and vice are, and will help us to understand what effects various sorts of educational practices, such as symposia, should have on the human soul (1.645C). The image is one of a puppet (thauma) made by the gods, possessing three cords, two, hard and iron, representing non-rational affections, and one, soft and gold, representing reason or calculation (1.644D). This image differs in noteworthy ways from the image of the soul as composed of a human, a lion, and a hydra-headed beast in Republic Book 9 and the charioteer and two horses of the Phaedrus. The three elements in the puppet image are affections rather than possessors of affections; and the most important division here is between the two iron cords and the golden cord, with no fundamental difference (of the sort that we see when spirit is called reason’s natural ally in the Republic) between the two iron cords. How to explain the differences in the model of the soul that we get here from the ones in other dialogues is another important question for interpreters of the Laws. (See section 5.2.)

Book 2

Book 2 begins by returning to the definition of education; the Athenian here tells us that education consists in training a child to feel pleasure and pain, and to love and hate, correctly, before he can understand the reason why (2.653BC). Education in music and gymnastics is crucial for the project of ethical education. Young children naturally desire to move and to make noise, and are naturally capable of taking pleasure in the order of movement and sound (2.653D–654A). One explanation for the centrality of music and gymnastics in the educational program, then, would appeal to the role of music and gymnastics in training this capacity to perceive and take pleasure in order. Book 2 focuses primarily on musical education and the standard of correctness in music. Book 7 returns to the topic of education in gymnastics, and lays out the rest of the educational program. These topics are discussed further in section 5.1 and section 6.7.

Part of the discussion of poetry in Book 2 deals with its content. The Athenian praises the Spartans and the Cretans for compelling poets to teach that the good man is happy even if he lacks many Conditional Goods and has many Conditional Bads and for giving no attention to the bad man. (Conditional Goods include, for example, health and wealth; Conditional Bads include sickness and poverty. For more on Conditional Goods and Bads, see section 4.2.) He also asserts that the poet should teach that human goods are conditional upon virtue and that the most pleasant life, the most just life, and the happiest (most eudaimôn) life coincide (2.662CE). This latter doctrine has great significance given that, as the Athenian says next, no one will voluntarily do anything unless it involves more pleasure than pain. This passage has also been thought to provide evidence that Plato remains a rational eudaimonist in the Laws. (See Irwin 1995: 343–5 and section 5.1.) The Athenian tells us that the views that the poet is to be compelled to espouse are both most true and most useful for persuading the citizens to live virtuously (2.664C).

Book 3

Book 3 abruptly moves to a discussion of the origin of government, beginning from the disorganized condition in which human beings would have been left after one of the great catastrophes which the Athenian takes to have destroyed human society over and over again. After describing how cities would have first come about out of this disorder, the Athenian discusses the histories of actual cities. He first focuses on Sparta, Argos, and Messene, with particular attention to the features of the Spartan constitution that saved it from the corruption afflicting its neighbors. This discussion highlights the destructive power of ignorance about what is to be valued (3.688C) and the danger of entrusting too much power to a single, corruptible, individual (3.691CD). The Athenian then turns to Persia and Athens and begins by reminding us that a legislator should aim at his city’s being free, wise, and a friend to itself (3.693B).

He then claims that there are two forms of constitution from which the rest are derived, monarchy and democracy, and attempts to show the virtues of the moderate forms, and the vices of the extreme forms, of each constitution by considering Persia’s development from a moderate to an extreme monarchy and Athens’s development from a moderate to an extreme democracy. The Athenian’s conclusion is that only a mixture of monarchy and democracy can allow a city to be both wise and free (3.693E)—a city that is strikingly characterized in the case of the earlier, more moderate form of Athenian democracy, as voluntary slavery to the laws (3.700A. On Plato’s use of history, and its relation to his political project in the Laws, see Schofield (2010); on the notion of slavery to the laws and its connection to virtue, see Annas (2010).) After this discussion has been completed, Kleinias announces that it has had a practical point: he, along with nine others, is to craft laws for a new Cretan colony. He asks for the help of the Athenian and Megillus in building up the laws and institutions of this new city, which is the project of the rest of the Laws.

Book 4

Book 4 opens by examining the ways in which the geographical location and features of the proposed city of Magnesia affect the ease or difficulty of creating a virtuous city. It then turns to consider the proposed city’s method of settlement, and the practical challenges of forming a group of settlers (whether they come from one or many cities) into a genuinely new society. Here, the Athenian suggests that the easiest way to form new and good institutions in a society is for it to be blessed with a good tyrant who wishes to create institutions conducing to virtue. The Athenian proceeds to ask what type of constitution they should form; he answers that the best ruler a city can have is god, and that they should imitate the rule of god by ordering their city in obedience to reason, the immortal element within themselves. These regulations set down by reason (nous) are to be called law (nomos, 4.714A).

The Athenian then imagines their address to the new settlers. He begins by emphasizing the power of god over human affairs and suggests that each man should therefore strive to become dear to god. The way to do this, he says, is to come to be like god (theôi homoios), that is, to become virtuous (4.716AE). After discussing the worship of the gods and the veneration of parents, the Athenian pauses to reflect on how the laws that he describes are to make the city happy (4.718B). He distinguishes between two methods of legislation, one appropriate to free men and another to slaves, illustrating this by means of a distinction between a slave doctor who simply prescribes what he thinks to be right to each of his slave patients, and a free doctor who investigates the ailment with his free patient and instructs him as to the nature of his disease as much as possible, prescribing a treatment only after having persuaded the patient (4.720AE). The analogous method in the case of legislation, the Athenian tells us, is to offer preludes to the laws that aim at persuasion, and it is this method that he proposes to follow in establishing the laws of Magnesia, condemning the alternative as the employment of mere force (4.722BC). After illustrating this “double method” in the case of marriage laws, the three decide to proceed systematically for the rest of the dialogue, giving first the preludes and then the laws. Issues about the preludes are discussed in section 6.7.

Book 5

Book 5 continues the Great Prelude to the laws in general which started with the discussion of gods and ancestors in Book 4. The Athenian begins this next phase of the address by telling the citizens that they should honor their souls above all their other possessions, since their souls are both most their own and the most divine of all their possessions. To honor one’s soul, he tells them, is to follow virtue and, in general, good things, rather than to allow it to satisfy whatever desires it happens to have and to enjoy any pleasures it might want. At the end of the discussion, this ability of the soul to follow the good is identified as what explains why the soul is to be so highly honored. Next on the list comes the body, which should honored by being put in a moderate state, as that is what best supports the good state of the soul; third are money and property, which also ought to be held in moderation, for the same reason. After a brief discussion of relations with friends and strangers, the Athenian turns to the character of the person who leads the finest (kalos, kallista) life. There, he describes various praiseworthy or blameworthy traits of character, before giving a general warning to all citizens to avoid excessive self-love as “the greatest of all bads” and “the cause of all of each man’s wrongdoings on every occasion” (4.731DE). (The rebarbative “bad” (kakon) for the opposite of the relational good (agathon) avoids the moralizing overtones of “evil”.) Instead, he encourages each citizen to love not himself or his own possessions but rather what is just, whether it belongs to himself or to someone else.

The prelude then moves from the “divine things” with which it has been occupied to the “human things”, chief among them pleasure and pain, explaining that “of necessity, every mortal animal is, simply, as it were, hung up and suspended from these in the most serious ways” (5.732E). The Athenian then sets out the types of pleasures and pains that characterize moderate and immoderate lives, with the aim of arguing that those that characterize the moderate life should be preferred and thus that the life of virtue is the most pleasant life. (See section 5.1.) This ends the Great Prelude to the laws in general, and the Athenian announces that they must now sketch the constitution of the city (5.734E). The rest of Book 5 is concerned primarily with the citizens’ properties—the number of households, the degree of variance in wealth that the citizens will be allowed to attain, and the way that the citizens should engage with money—and with justifying those precepts by reference to the citizens’ happiness. The rest of the Laws continues to describe and to justify the constitution and the laws of this new city.

Book 6

Book 6 begins with a division between two tasks we must take on in establishing a political regime: determining what offices there should be and what the rules are for selecting their occupants, and establishing laws for those offices (6.751AB; cf. 5.735A). The Athenian points out that there are special challenges involved in selecting the initial office-holders: the colonists will not know each other, and will not have been educated properly (not having been raised in Magnesia). If, somehow, the city can survive long enough for children reared under the laws to take part in the selection of office-holders, the Athenian thinks there is reason to hope that the city would be stable. He outlines a procedure for selecting the initial 37 guardians of the laws (6.753CD), as well as selection procedures for military officers (6.755C–756B) and for members of the Council (6.756CE). (The duties of the guardians of the laws and the Council are discussed in section 4.)

This last procedure is particularly noteworthy. There are to be 90 councilors from each of the four property classes, and while citizens in the higher property classes are to be punished with a variety of fines if they abstain from the votes, citizens from lower property classes face fines in fewer cases. 180 councilors from each property class are to be elected by vote and the 90 who will serve will be determined by lottery. The Athenian justifies this procedure by saying that it strikes a mean between monarchy and democracy (6.757A; cf. Book 3), and that this mean is valuable because it promotes civic friendship and prevents faction. On the one hand, treating unequals as though they were equals undermines civic friendship, but excluding the less virtuous from offices produces faction. The Athenian reiterates the point with the next offices he discusses, the supervisors of different parts of the city: here too some officeholders should be elected and others selected by lot (6.759B).

After this discussion of offices, the second part of Book 6 begins the task of establishing the laws. At 6.760B, the Athenian tells us that, as far as it is possible, nothing must be left unguarded, and discusses a variety of offices and office-holders, among them generals, military commanders, field regulators, and city and market regulators. The most important of the offices is the Supervisor of Education, discussed at 6.765D; he must be a man over the age of 50 with children of his own (ideally both male and female). Next comes rules of selection for judges (6.767A–768C), with a promise to pick up discussion of judicial matters in more detail at the end (768D). Finally, the Athenian points out that while the initial legislator will write the laws with as much precision as he can, he will inevitably have left material out. There must, then, be Guardians of the Laws to help fill in the outline, by looking to the goal of the laws—making the citizens good (6.769A–770E). (See section 6.4 on the possibility of changing the law.)

After this address to the Guardians of the Laws, the Athenians begins to give the laws themselves. We begin with the marriage laws, which contain a prelude encouraging citizens to make marriages that are in the best interests of the city (6.773AE); laws concerning slaves (6.776B–778A) and the built environment of the city (6.778B–779D); common meals for both men and women (6.780A–781D); and the procreation of children (6.783E–785B). Once we have established the laws regulating the procreation of children, it is time to proceed to the next topic—their education—in Book 7.

Book 7

Book 7 focuses on education—which, it says, is correct when it makes our souls and bodies as fine as possible (7.788C). The Athenian recognizes that it would be inappropriate to make precise laws surrounding family life, and thus offers his remarks as “instruction and admonition” (7.788AC). Nevertheless, this instruction is important:

Those in cities with the characters of masters and free men may perhaps listen, and so come to the correct understanding that unless the private household is managed in the correct way in cities, it is pointless to expect the laws established for communal affairs to have any stability. And when he understands this, he would make use himself of the laws mentioned just now, and, using them to manage his household and city well, achieve happiness. (7.790AB; cf. 7.793BD)

The basic principle governing early education, the Athenian argues, is that small children will benefit from being in motion at all times—“who are to live, if it were possible, as if they were always being rocked by the sea” (7.790C). This will benefit not just their bodies, but also their souls: rhythmic motion will help calm their fears and thus constitute training in courage. As children get older, their character will form through play (7.793E), and their games must be carefully regulated—in particular, they must not be allowed to vary their games, because this will train them to find pleasure in variety and novelty, and to grow up to be adults who want new institutions and laws (7.797A–798E). The educational program that follows emphasizes gymnastic training as well as training in poetry. For further discussion, see section 5.1 and section 6.7.

Book 8

Book 8 announces that the next task is to establish festivals—and, in fact, that there must be at least 365 festivals, so that there is always some official sacrificing to the gods on the city’s behalf (8.828B). There will be monthly festivals, featuring gymnastic contests and choral performances, in honor of the gods after whom the tribes are named (8.828C). Similarly, there will be daily military exercises without arms and at least monthly military exercises with arms (8.830D). These military exercises should have an element of genuine risk—enough for them to reveal the difference between the courageous and cowards, and to allow us to honor (or dishonor) each appropriately (8.830E–831A). The legislator, indeed, explicitly reasons that it is better for a few people to die than for fear itself to die: without military exercises that inspire genuine fear, we will have no way to distinguish the courageous from the cowardly, “and that would be a greater bad for the city than the other” (8.831B).

No current cities, however, train their citizens in this way. Why not? There are two causes—and neither, surprisingly, is ignorance (8.831C). The first cause is the overriding love of money: citizens will do anything they think will make them wealthy, and treat anything else as worthless (8.831CE). The second cause derives from a defect in current relationships of rule: rulers in existing cities need to rely on force to maintain their rule, because they do not rule over willing subjects. For this reason, rulers in existing cities do not want to cultivate their citizens’ military abilities (8.832CD). For this same reason, existing cities are not accurately called polities at all, but “faction-states”. It is the fact that Magnesia will be a true polity that allows it to properly cultivate its citizens’ military abilities.

The rest of Book 8 contains a detailed discussion of the athletic contests that the city will hold, always making reference to their usefulness in war (beginning at 8.832E); a discussion of competitions in the arts (beginning at 8.835A); a discussion of the role of religion, and of the belief that the victory over pleasure is the finest of all, in stopping citizens from giving into lust since in Magnesia young men and women will be “released from the excessive and unfree exertions that do most to quell hybris” (8.835D–841C); agricultural laws (842C); and laws about craftsmen, including prohibition against citizens practicing a craft (other than that of citizenship) and on foreigners having two crafts (846D).

Book 9

Book 9 discusses the consequences for violations of the laws—both what the punishment shall be and who the judges shall be. The Athenian begins by noting that it is in some sense shameful to even have to include such laws in a city such as Magnesia, which is organized around making its citizens virtuous. But he notes that the occasional citizen may have a nature that seriously resists ethical improvement, and that there is no shame in the law-code anticipating this possibility (9.853BC, cf. 9.880DE). Moreover, as the Athenian points out in his discussion of the penalties for temple-robbery, Magnesian laws must take into account the presence of slaves and foreigners as well.

Book 9 contains material that is relevant to understanding the rationale for punishment for Plato, as well as material that is relevant to understanding the nature of the preludes. At 9.854CE, the Athenian tells us that legal penalties aim at making the person more virtuous or less vicious, which suggests that reform—rather than, say, deterrence—is the key justification for punishment. It is worth noting, however, that other passages—e.g., 11.934AB—suggest that deterrence is also among Plato’s goals in establishing this law-code. The Athenian here also endorses the old Socratic paradox that no one does injustice voluntarily (hekôn) and tries to reconcile it with the apparently crucial legal distinction between voluntary and involuntary injustices (9.860D–864C; see Kamtekar 2019; O’Brien 1957; and Schofield 2012). He proceeds to draw distinctions among genuine injustices based on what caused the injustice. From 9.863E–864A he argues that injustice is mastery of soul by either (1) anger and fear; (2) pleasures and desires; or (3) hopes and opinions. And these distinctions can make a difference in the penal code: e.g., the penal code deals differently with involuntary killings (9.865A–866D), killings done out of anger (9.866D–869E), and killings done for the sake of pleasure or desire (9.869E–871D).

Another highlight of Book 9 is Plato’s return to the medical analogy for the preludes, at 9.857CE. The Athenian there describes the free doctors—who are analogous to the legislators who use preludes—as “giving arguments that come close to philosophizing”, providing some of the best textual support for the claim that the preludes aim to provide rational persuasion. Book 9, however, also contains some of the preludes that are most challenging to explain as instances of rational persuasion, including the preludes against temple robbing and murder. See section 6.7 for further discussion.

Book 10

Laws 10 contains the prelude to the impiety laws: because no one who has correct beliefs about gods voluntarily commits crimes (10.885B), this is a natural follow-up to the discussion of punishment in Book 9. This prelude takes the form of a conversation between the Athenian and three imaginary impious men—one of whom denies that the gods exist, one of whom accepts that the gods exist but thinks that they neglect human beings, and the third of whom accepts that the gods exist and pay attention to human beings but thinks that they can be influenced by prayers and sacrifices contrary to justice. Laws 10 is particularly central to the debate over the aims of the preludes, for two reasons. First, 10.885CE presents the young impious men as asking to be “taught” that there are gods by means of “adequate proofs”, and as promising to assess the Athenian’s arguments by their truth rather than their eloquence. Second, the material that follows is highly sophisticated—especially the argument for the existence of gods which takes place over 13 Stephanus pages and establishes the existence of gods from first principles about motion. These features make Laws 10 strong prima facie evidence that at least some of the preludes aim at rational persuasion. (See section 6.7 for further discussion.)

The Athenian’s arguments against the three forms of impiety he considers in this prelude build on one another. He argues against atheism by showing that only self-moving motion could be the first motion (10.895AB), and arguing that this kind of ruling, self-moving motion ought to be identified with soul (10.896AB). Since soul rules in everything that is in motion, it also rules in the heavens (10.896DE); the good souls that govern the motions of the heavenly bodies are gods (10.899AB). The Athenian then draws on this characterization of the gods as governors of the cosmos in arguing against the second form of impiety, the belief that the gods exist but do not care for human beings. He argues that, just as human craftsmen attend to the small things in their domain, so too the gods attend to the small things in their domains (10.900D–903A). Finally, the Athenian further draws on this characterization of the gods as good rulers in their domains in arguing that the gods cannot be persuaded to ignore injustice by prayers or sacrifices (10.905E–907B).

The chapter closes with a statement of the impiety law itself. Those who are convicted of impiety are to be imprisoned: those who have made a merely intellectual mistake are to be imprisoned in the “sound-mind center” (sôphronistêrion) for not less than five years and to be regularly visited by the Dawn Council who will attempt to instruct them. If, after being freed, one of these individuals is convicted of impiety again, he shall be punished by death. Those impious men who have poor characters and pretend to be able to persuade the gods, are imprisoned (it seems for life) in a jail in the middle of the country and are to have no further contact with free citizens of Magnesia.

Book 11

Laws 11 begins a discussion of business transactions, where the key principle is that no one ought to touch or move another’s goods without having persuaded him. This principle is justified at 913B, where the Athenian points out that I will not gain as much materially by taking someone else’s wealth as I will benefit with respect to virtue by refraining. What follows are detailed laws concerning a variety of business transactions, including the rules governing returns (11.916AD), prohibitions against adulterating goods (11.916D–918A), laws governing retail trade (11.918B–920C), and laws governing the sale of craft products (11.920E–922A). Next come laws governing the making of wills (11.922B–925D). The Athenian acknowledges that these laws may seem oppressive and harsh, e.g., if they order marriages that those to be married would rather suffer anything than undertake (11.925E). He thus proposes a system of arbitration, where either the Guardians of the Laws or a court composed of the best judges may determine whether to apply the law in this case (11.926D). Next come laws concerning orphans and their guardians (11.927A–928D), those concerning quarrels within families (11.928D–930D), the children of slaves (11.930DE), and the honors due to parents (11.930E–932D), harms due to non-fatal poisonings, theft, and violence (11.932E–934C), abusive speech (11.934D–935C), angry ridicule (934D–936B), begging (11.936BC), injuries (11.936DE), and testimony in judicial proceedings (11.936E–937D). Book 11 closes with a discussion of the penalties for bringing or supporting unjust lawsuits, which include death in certain cases (e.g., citizens who do so out of love of money, 11.937D–938C).

Book 12

A central concern of Book 12 is safeguarding the city’s institutions and laws. 12.945B–948A describes the process for auditing the office-holders, which, the Athenian stresses, will be both difficult and essential: difficult because it requires us to find better men than the office-holders to scrutinize them, and essential because without successful audits, we risk filling the city with faction, which will destroy it. The process requires the whole city to assemble to nominate and vote on auditors (12.946AC). These auditors will make their results public (12.946D), and office-holders may appeal the decision if they wish (12.946DE). The auditors themselves can also be accused of having become corrupt by any citizen; if so, they will be judged by a court composed of the guardians of the laws, the other auditors, and the select judges (12.948A).

The laws concerning travel also aim at safeguarding the city’s institutions. The Athenian points out that experience of bad people and bad laws can reinforce the city’s confidence in its own laws—and that there will be the occasional person of divine nature born in a bad city, conversation with whom may help improve Magnesia’s laws (12.951BC). Exemplary citizens who are older than 50 may go on missions to observe other cities’ institutions (12.951CD); when they return—after no more than 10 years, and before turning 60—they must report their findings to the “Dawn Council” (12.951D).

This Dawn Council is another element of the city aimed at safeguarding its institutions. The extent of its political power has given rise to considerable controversy. Section 6.4 discusses it in more detail.

3. A “Second-Best” City and the Identity of Magnesia

3.1 A “Second-Best” City

In what is perhaps the best known passage in Plato’s Laws, the Athenian claims that the constitution they are currently constructing is second best.

Nonetheless, to anyone making use of rational calculation and experience it is evident that a city is likely to be established in a way that is second to the best [deuterôs … pros to beltiston] … that city and constitution [prôtê … polis te esti kai politeia] is first, and the laws are best, where the ancient saying holds as much as possible throughout the entire city [hopou to palai legomenon an gignêtai kata pasan tên polin hoti malista], that the things of friends really are common. (5.739AC)[5]

The Athenian then describes the differentiating features of this “second best” constitution and gives his reason for not pursuing the arrangements of the first or best constitution.

But now what do we say this [second best] constitution is and how does it come to be such? First, let them divide up the land and the households, and not farm in common, since such a thing would be too much [meizon] for the birth, nurturing, and education that have now been described. (5.739E–740A)

The traditional and still most common interpretation of these passages is that Plato claims here that Kallipolis (the ideal city described in the Republic) and its constitution and laws are the best and that Magnesia (the ideal city described in the Laws) is “second best”, and its constitution (and presumably its laws) are also “second best”.[6] This reading of the above passage is also often accompanied by the further assumption that this judgment about the best and the second best city shows that Plato’s ethical and political philosophy, psychology, and whatever aspects of his epistemology and metaphysics support his value theory and psychology remain unchanged with the possible exception of becoming more pessimistic about human nature both with respect to the possibility of accepting the community of women and children and the possibility of exercising autocratic rule without becoming corrupted. A further common assumption is that this pessimism is a result of the failure of Plato’s efforts to bring about political improvements in Sicily. These failures are thought to lead him to reject the possibility of virtuous autocratic rule.

But the traditional interpretation is highly questionable and the two further assumptions are yet more unsatisfactory. To begin with the latter, even if both when writing the Republic and the Laws, Plato would think that Kallipolis was better than Magnesia, it does not follow that the principles on which the judgment is based are the same. Many different and even incompatible premise sets can entail the same conclusion, so the first inference is just an affirmation of the consequent. The second inference is yet more dubious.

Gregory Vlastos (1957 [1981: 216]), for example, suggests that in the Laws Plato came to think that no one, not even a fully virtuous philosopher, could hold autocratic power without being corrupted because of Plato’s own final encounter with Dionysus the Younger in Sicily. But even if Plato had thought that Dionysus was well-brought up, fully virtuous, and possessed full philosophical understanding, it would be rash to generalize from this one case to all possible cases. But Plato thought that Dionysus was badly brought up (Epist. VII 332CD) and had a low opinion of his philosophical knowledge (Epist. VII 338D–339B, 340B–341B, 344D–345C). (This grants, for the sake of the argument, the dubious assumption that the Seventh Letter is genuine and that it gives us direct insight into Plato’s state of mind. See Annas [1999: 72–7], and Burnyeat and Frede [2015].) It would thus be irrational for Plato to generalize from his experience with Dionysus to the capacities of all human beings. Dion would come closer to Plato’s ideal (although his early upbringing must have been somewhat defective, Epist. VII 327B) and Vlastos (1957 [1981: 216, n. 29]) plausibly suggests that Plato did not think that Dion was an autocrat corrupted by power, but was a good man who came to grief because of his associates’ villainy (Epist. VII 351DE).

But let us turn to the standard interpretation’s central claim.[7] The above passage asserts that the best city is one “where the ancient saying holds as much as possible throughout the entire city, that the things of friends really are common” (5.739C1–3), that is, “women are common, and children are common, and every sort of property is common” (5.739C4–5). The standard interpretation identifies this city with Kallipolis. The first dissenter seems to be Paul Natorp who in 1895 clearly stated the essential point: in Kallipolis communism extends only to the first two classes, the third class, the producers, have private property and families. (Natorp [1895] notes that von Pöhlmann [1893] comes very close to making this point.) Thus the best city would not be Kallipolis, but one in which communism extended throughout the city. Natorp also points out that (1) 5.739E8–740A2 holds that in the best city land is held and farmed in common. This is certainly not true in Kallipolis where the producers hold and farm land privately, and (2) in the above passage, the best city is inhabited by “gods or children of gods” and children of gods do not require laws to keep from them wrongdoing (9.853C). Whatever one may think of the auxiliaries and guardians of Kallipolis, this is an impossible way to describe the producers or the moneymakers.

About a century later, first André Laks and then Christopher Bobonich remade Natorp’s point (Laks 2001, 2022; Bobonich 2002: 10–12). The large majority of those who continue to hold the traditional interpretation simply do not discuss the above discrepancies or justify their preference for it.[8] The supplement examines the extant attempts to justify the traditional interpretation. Section 3.2 and section 6.1 discuss some possible implications of the revisionary interpretation of 5.739E–740A, which holds that (1) as the text says, the best city is one in which communism extends throughout the entire city, and (2) the best city is not Kallipolis. The revisionary interpretation has significant consequences. First, on it, the Laws directly rejects the claim that Kallipolis in Plato’s view is the best city. Second, it at least calls into question whether Plato’s political philosophy has remained unchanged in its essentials from the Republic to the Laws. Finally, it leaves open and calls attention to the question of whether when writing the Laws, Plato thought that Kallipolis was a better city than Magnesia.

3.2 The Identity of Magnesia

Although for ease of exposition, this entry speaks of “Magnesia” and its constitution, the question of exactly what constitution is presented in the Laws is surprisingly complicated. In Book 3, Kleinias reveals that Knossos has appointed him and nine others to give laws to a new colony that is to be established in an abandoned part of Crete (702BD).[9] The city’s name (4.704AB, 12.969A), will depend on facts about the city’s location and its colonists (5.745E–746D). The Athenian never explicitly refers to this city as “Magnesia”, but does call it “the city of the Magnesians” (9.860E, cf. 8.848D, 11.919D, 12.946B). To a first approximation, the rest of the Laws sketches this city’s constitution and laws. Borrowing the term from Klaus Schöpsdau, let us call “the Laws draft” the constitution specified in the interlocutors’ conversation. But there are complications.

  1. 5.739A and 739E seem to say that the dialogue’s participants will go on to sketch the second best constitution and this is supported by 7.807BC (cf. 9.853C). The Athenian also claims that they will state what the third best constitution is, and leave the choice among them to those with the task of actually setting up the city (5.739AB). This intention does not seem to be fulfilled in the text of the Laws. (Rashed 2018 is a dissenting opinion.)

  2. The Athenian (and most commentators) talk as if there is a unique best constitution, a unique second constitution, and a unique third best constitution. But this is a problematic assumption. If we take the criterion for ranking constitutions to be the degree of unity (5.739BD) that they produce in the cities governed by them, then the first constitution must be the one that is maximally unified and the second best is that which comes next and does not (as we have seen) involve a community of women and children.[10] But even leaving aside the issues discussed below about the determinacy of the Laws draft, this draft and any similar description of a constitution refers to many different laws and many sorts of political offices and social institutions. Even in principle, it is far from clear how to determine for any given description the ordinal degree of unity that its laws produce and it seems wholly impossible in practice. There are simply too many possible permutations for it to be plausible to think there is a (fairly) determinate description of the constitution that comes next after the best constitution. (Similar worries would also attend a description of the best constitution). It would be much more reasonable to think of the best constitution as picking out something like a kind containing a range of possible constitutions (all of which involve communism throughout the city), the second (and third) best as also picking out the same sort of generic kind. If the best constitution has communism throughout the entire city, it would also seem possible to have constitutions—not necessarily that of Kallipolis—which had limited communism and might be more unified than a second best constitution with no communism. (Mutatis mutandis, the same is true if one thinks that Kallipolis is the best.)

    But the Athenian’s claims here about the excellence of constitution must be considered together with his criterion for correct laws and institutions (see section 6.3) which is the same in the Republic and the Laws, that is, the correct set of laws and institutions is that which maximizes the overall happiness of the citizens. It seems clear that that this is affected by factors other than unity. First, a city might be unified in the Republic sense—which involves the citizens including other citizens’ well-being in their own—even if the citizens had a mistaken conception of virtue and happiness (at least for some range of mistaken beliefs about this).[11] Second, even if the Republic’s conception of unity does involve more or less true beliefs about virtue and happiness, laws and institutions will differ to the degree that they, for example, conduce to the city’s stability or it ability to acquire and retain the material resources needed to allow the citizens to undertake the education required for developing virtue and the leisure to engage in virtuous activity. So it seems that, depending on its other laws and institutions, a city with a greater extent of communism could be worse than one with a lesser extent of communism. Trying to find more or less fully determinate specifications of the first, second and third best constitution thus seems to be a fruitless endeavor.

    The best solution seems to be that we understand the first, the second, and the third constitutions and so on not as a fully determinate constitutions, but rather as something like generic kinds having different species. This doesn’t solve the problems noted above that would make it difficult to draw the boundaries of the kinds exactly or to rank their species, but it does allow us to see the project of ranking constitutions as a sensible one and, in particular, gives reasonably good sense to the ranking of Magnesia as second best without the very implausible assumption that the best and second best constitutions are fully determinate constitutions that can be ranked next to one another with no variants coming between them.

  3. There may also be a gap between the Laws draft and the city established: (a) the Athenian and his interlocutors will make whatever adjustments are needed once they see the city’s site, the surrounding locale, and learn about its neighbors (5.737D), and (b) the Athenian and Megillus (the Spartan interlocutor) have, of course, no actual authority with respect to the city to be founded and the final decision on the Laws draft will rest with Kleinias and his nine fellow commissioners (3.702BD).

  4. But there is also indeterminacy simply with respect to the Laws’ draft.

    1. The Athenian and his interlocutors may make revisions in light of the opposition of the colonists and sometimes a specific alternate is mentioned (6.779AB, 7.820E, 8.840E[12]).
    2. The Athenian and his interlocutors postpone a final decision until the entire conversation is finished although the matter is not returned to in our text (7.805AB).

    3. Finally, in Book 5, the Athenian considers a possible objection to the way that he has been proceeding:

      namely, that all the things we have just described may never meet with such opportune circumstances as would allow all of them to come about in accord with our argument—men who will not be unable to put up with this way of living together, who will tolerate prescribed and measured limits on property throughout their entire life, the mode of having children that we have ordained for each, being deprived of gold and of the other things that the legislator must clearly prescribe, based on what has been said just now … It is pretty much as if he were telling dreams, or molding, as it were, a city or citizens from wax.

      In certain respects, of course, it was not bad to speak in that way, but the legislator must revise it with an eye to the following considerations … in the case of each thing that is to exist in the future, I think the most just way to proceed is this: the one presenting the model [paradeigma] of what must be attempted is to omit nothing of what is finest and most true [tôn kallistôn te kai alêthestatôn]; but if one of these things turns out to be impossible [adunaton] to bring about, this one he is to omit and not implement, but contrive to implement instead whichever of the remaining things comes closest to this, and is by nature most closely akin to what is fitting. One must allow the legislator to put a finish to his intended model, then, only when this is done, join with him in investigating which of his proposals is beneficial and which part of the legislation he has described is too arduous. (5.745E–746C)

If the psychological impossibility referred to here were of the sort that rendered full communism ineligible, it would risk blurring the distinction between the first and second constitutions. This worry at 5.745E–746C about citizens not accepting the relevant restrictions should not be construed as exceptionless, since it is intuitively implausible that it is entirely psychologically impossible for any group of humans to accept them, although a lawgiver might well be faced with groups of people who are highly recalcitrant. It also seems reasonable to prefer a set of laws and institutions that would produce less unity than some others if the latter runs serious risks of engendering non-compliance and thus endangers the city’s long-term stability. It is better to have a citizen body that is highly compliant with and supportive of moderately unifying laws than a city with highly unifying laws that are frequently broken and poorly supported.

What, then, is the philosophical significance of this indeterminacy? The basic point was clearly grasped by Trevor Saunders and his statement of it has not been bettered. It is a fallacy

to suppose that Magnesia is an exact blueprint, fixed in all its details; and that if something is unclear we have only to inspect the text closely enough to discover a precise Platonic provision lurking between the lines. That is not so: Magnesia is a shifting structure. Plato is to some extent his own worst enemy in this respect … His denunciation of change (797aff.), can all too readily give the impression that Magnesia’s institutions are inflexible, to be taken or left as a whole, without any modification at all. But in fact he makes it very clear that they simply stand at one point on a sliding scale of political maturity … Hence the structure he sketches is, like all political structures, capable of improvement; it embodies aspirations … [Plato’s] laws about sexual conduct envisage that both a higher and a lower standard than the one he sketches are possible (841a–842a). He is apparently prepared to undertake sociological investigation to discover the ingrained moral and social views of prospective and actual Magnesians. Such information will enable him to frame laws embodying the best possible standards of conduct, laws which are not arbitrary, but, if circumstances change, not fixed either. Finally, Magnesia is not a “closed” society: it has arrangements to enable it to learn from foreign sources how to improve itself (Saunders 1995: 603, emphasis in the original; cf. Saunders 1986: 207–8).[13]

4. Ethics

4.1 Virtue and Happiness

The two most important notions in Plato’s ethics and in Greek ethics generally are those of virtue (aretê) and happiness (eudaimonia). “aretê” is a common word in ancient Greek and is used more widely than we now tend to use “virtue”. “aretê” applies to people, but also straightforwardly applies in ordinary Greek to other living creatures such as horses and dogs and to artifacts such as knives. “aretê” is a term of commendation and is probably etymologically connected with the most common word for “good”, agathos (Beekes 2009). The appropriate or specific or peculiar virtue of a thing is what makes that thing a good member of its basic kind. The virtue of a knife is the group of properties that, say, enable it to cut (or ground its cutting) efficiently or effectively and this is to cut “well” (eu, the adverb of agathos) and “finely” (kalôs from kalon). A knife that possesses this virtue is “a good knife”.

So, it is the possession of a thing’s appropriate virtue that constitutes its goodness as the kind of thing it is, that is, its attributive goodness. For example, possession of the virtue appropriate to a dog makes Sophie a good dog and the possession of the complete set of the appropriate human virtues makes someone a good human being.

In humans, virtues are psychic dispositions or powers and the Laws holds to Plato’s standard view that there are exactly four human virtues: wisdom (epistêmê, sophia, or phronêsis), courage (andreia), moderation (sôphrosunê), and justice (dikaiosunê). Wisdom is knowledge of what is overall best for the person (this is presumably based on, but not reducible to, knowledge of what is good in general for humans).[14] Courage, the Athenian insists against his Spartan and Cretan interlocutors, is not only a disposition to resist pains, but also to resist inappropriate pleasures. Moderation, on the Laws’ primary account, is a kind of consonance between one’s non-rational desires and emotions and one’s knowledge of the good and one’s rational desires for it. The virtues of courage and moderation ensure that one’s non-rational motivations support (or at least do not interfere) with one’s knowledge of what is good for the agent (the relational good) and rational desires for it. Justice is the composite disposition consisting of wisdom, courage, and moderation (1.631CD). Finally, in the Laws as throughout his career, Plato accepts “The Reciprocity of the Virtues”, that is, the claim that a person has one virtue if and only if she has all the virtues.[15]

“Eudaimonia” is a compound of “eu” and the noun “daimôn” (divine being or force). So, etymologically, to be well-off or successful with respect to divine forces is to be in a good way with respect to such beings or forces, that is, to be in a relation to them that is beneficial to oneself.[16] The reference to the gods fairly quickly ceases to be built into the very meaning of being “happy”, although most ancient Greeks would have thought that maximal well-being involved, in some way, being favored by the gods. As a first approximation, “being happy” comes to signify living a life that is overall best for oneself; it is possess maximal well-being. Although this entry uses the standard translation, “happiness”, it can be misleading in two ways. First, there is the by now standard concern that in current usage, “being happy” is understood as meaning “feeling content”, or “being pleased”, or “being satisfied”. Although Greek ethicists might think that being eudaimôn did involve such satisfaction, such satisfaction is not built into the very meaning of “eudaimôn”, and Plato certainly thinks that being happy has further content.

A more serious concern is that “being happy” could be restricted to the optimal point of well-being (the unimprovably best) or be applied to different levels of well-being that are sufficiently close to optimal. On the latter understanding, it’s possible that X is happier than Y although X is happy and Y is happy. Matters are made worse by the fact that in ancient and modern Greek, modern English and the large majority of natural languages, a comparative or superlative adjective does not typically entail the positive degree. (E.g., “Saturn is smaller than Jupiter” is a perfectly idiomatic and true English sentence and neither entails nor suggests that Saturn is small.) So, X could be happier than Y even though neither is happy nor even enjoys positive well-being (cf. Phd. 81D–82B).[17] Which conception of happiness is used makes a considerable difference with respect to, for example, the claim that the virtuous person is always happy.

In the Laws, as throughout his career, Plato is a Rational Eudaimonist, that is, he holds that for every person the ultimate end of all her rational actions is her own (greatest) happiness. In the early dialogues, Plato was also a Psychological Eudaimonist, that is, he held that at the time of action, an agent cannot try to perform or perform action A while knowing or believing that some other course of action is open to her and is overall better for her than A. As section 4.2 shows, however, the Laws rejects Psychological Eudaimonism and accepts the possibility of akratic action (Bobonich 2002: 209–10, 450–73).

A central ethical concern for Plato throughout the dialogues is the relation between virtue and happiness. The three most important options to consider are the following.

  1. Virtue is necessary for happiness. (Necessity)
  2. Virtue is sufficient for happiness. (Sufficiency)
  3. Virtue is the only component of happiness. (Identity)

Sufficiency can come apart from Identity, since on either the scalar or optimizing conception of happiness, happiness can have as components final goods other than virtue.

In the Laws, the Athenian insists on Necessity and on its being taught by the poetry allowed in Magnesia (2.660A–661E). The evidence concerning Sufficiency is more controversial. Several early dialogues endorse Sufficiency as does Republic Book 1. But the challenge to Socrates at the beginning of Republic Book 2 is to show that the just person is always happier than the unjust person and in the rest of the Republic, Plato does not clearly endorse or reject Sufficiency. In the Laws, the dispute centers over the following passage.

The good man, since he is moderate and just, is happy and blessed, whether he is large and strong or small and weak, and whether or not he is wealthy, whereas the unjust man, even if he is richer than Cinyras and Midas, is miserable and lives miserably. (2.660E)

Some interpreters think that Plato here conversationally implies a universal generalization of the point, so that a just or good person is happy no matter what other goods she lacks or what other bads she has, that is, that he is endorsing Sufficiency because he accepts Identity. But it seems rash to infer so radical a thesis on such slender grounds. Moreover, such an inference is incompatible with the claim that the Athenian shortly goes on to make that goods other than virtue are “extremely good” for just people and “extremely bad” for the unjust (2.661BD) while bads other than vice are bad both for the just and for the unjust, although for the unjust they are less bad than the corresponding good. (For example, the bad of sickness is bad for unjust people, but less bad for them than the “corresponding good”, that is, health.) Second, such a claim makes the Laws a rigoristic anomaly inconsistent with the Republic’s and the Philebus’ position that some pleasures are final goods.

It seems preferable to hold that even if there is a conversational implicature that generalizes beyond the specific goods and bads mentioned, this generalization is not fully universal and that it falls short of endorsing Sufficiency. The passage only allows us to draw the somewhat vague conclusion: if S is just, then S is happy even if S has many bads independent of vice and lacks many goods independent of virtue. In order to see why Plato makes these claims about the differential effects of goods and bads on the just and the unjust and why he rejects Identity, we must turn in the next section to his Conditionality Theory of Goods.

4.2 The Conditionality of Goods

In the Laws (1.629C–632D, 2.660B–662A), Plato gives a long and detailed statement of a Conditionality Theory of the relational good. This theory is similar to, but not the same as, that found in the Euthydemus (278C–282C, 288C–293A) and the Meno ( 87C–89A).[18] The following are the main claims of the Laws’ Conditionality Theory.

C1:
All goods not having virtue as a proper or improper part are Conditional Goods. All bads not having vice as a proper or improper part are Conditional Bads.
C2:
G is a Conditional Good if and only if G is a good for a virtuous (just) person and G is a bad for an unvirtuous (unjust) person. (Plato uses “agathos” as the adjective of “aretê”, e.g., 10.899B5, Rep. 1.347B7.)
C3:
B is a Conditional Bad if and only if B is bad for both a just and an unjust person, but is less bad for an unjust person than the corresponding Conditional Good would be.
C4:
G is an Unconditional Good if and only if G is good for a person regardless of what else she possesses. Vice is bad for a person regardless of what else she possesses.

Being just and being unjust are obviously mutually exclusive, but are they jointly exhaustive? (Rep. 6.491D4–5 may recognize a tertium quid.) The relevant Laws passages (1.631BC, 2.660E, 661C) make being just a necessary condition of benefiting from Conditional Goods. So a tertium quid’s existence may not in this respect matter greatly: perhaps for those lacking virtue, but not unjust, Conditional Goods sometimes harm and sometimes are neutral.

A first question is what is the relation between the Conditionality Theory (the conjunction of C1–C4) and the theses about virtue and happiness discussed in section 4.1? The Conditionality Theory quickly yields Necessity, since an unjust person has only bads: injustice is in itself a Bad, and all her Conditional Goods and Conditional Bads are bad for her. Indeed, it seems clear that the unjust person is miserable (cf. 2.660E). (This understands being miserable (athlios) as the polar contrary of being happy and both as scalar properties. Although strictly speaking, C4 does not make any claims about how great an Unconditional Good virtue is or how great an Unconditional Bad vice is, it is clear from other passages that they are, apart from being joined with anything else, great final goods and bads.)

The Conditionality Theory does not, however, entail Sufficiency.[19] Even accepting that (a) C2 entails that virtue is sufficient for benefiting from one’s Conditional Goods and (b) virtue is a great final good, the just person may lack almost all Conditional Goods and have many Conditional Bads. Thus, there is an asymmetry here: the final goodness of Conditional Goods is conditional on virtue, but the badness of Conditional Bads is not conditional on vice, although vice makes them worse.

The Conditionality Theory strongly suggests the rejection of Identity, since Conditional Goods become good for the just person. It does not, however, strictly speaking, entail it since neither the optimizing nor the scalar conception of happiness entails that happiness must contain all final goods or even any final good besides virtue. If virtue is a sufficiently great final good, it is logically possible that it is the only constituent of happiness. But this is just a bare logical possibility, since it is difficult to imagine what could rule out the possibility that Conditional final Goods could at least be tiebreakers.

Finally, the conjunction of (i) everything that an unjust person has is bad for her, (ii) virtue is a great final good, (iii) vice is a great final bad and (iv) a just person’s Conditional Goods benefit her, does not entail that a just person always has greater well-being than an unjust person, but it would make exceptions, if possible, exceedingly rare.[20]

The Laws’ Conditionality Theory has received little attention in itself, but there has been considerable discussion of the Euthydemus version. The questions that most need to be answered are (A) why is knowledge necessary for benefiting from Conditional Goods?, (B) why is knowledge sufficient for benefiting from Conditional Goods?, (C) why is knowledge an Unconditional Good? In the Euthydemus, all the examples concerning the relation between goods and knowledge are drawn from the arts. A carpenter’s tools and materials, for example, are not beneficial unless they are correctly used and knowledge of carpentry is what produces correct use. Interpreters have tried to show that the productive analogy can explain (more or less) (A) and (B), but have not discussed (C) much.

These attempts, however, have not been successful. (B) has been the most discussed claim and it is obvious that an artisan’s knowledge cannot guarantee the successful production of the art’s end. Impoverished circumstances and other sorts of bad luck can prevent this. But (A) also faces serious problems: even without knowledge, good luck can result in the attainment of the art’s end. Worse, a foolish person could achieve great or even full success by slavishly following the instructions of a knowledgeable artisan. (Anyone who knows the basic rules of chess could easily enter the world’s top 5 if allowed to have Magnus Carlsen’s move-by-move advice.) Finally, the problems arising for (C) are the worst of all, since productive craft knowledge is a paradigm of an instrumental good. The end of medicine is health, not skillful doctoring and, as Aristotle puts it, the things coming to be from the arts have their good in themselves, so it is sufficient that they are in a certain condition (Nicomachean Ethics 2.4 1105a27–8).

This is not the place to review the Euthydemus literature, but the standard move that commentators make is to weaken radically the conclusions that Socrates draws, for example, to see him as only arguing that a knowledgeable artisan is usually more successful than one lacking all knowledge of the art (Jones 2013; Reshotko 2016: 2–18, 98–103, 115–55, 177–92; Smith 2021). These interpretations do not help much with (A) and simply do not address (C). Although they are motivated by trying to provide a commonsense substitute for Socrates’ claim (B), the very attempt to reconcile Socrates’ claims with ordinary commonsense intuitions about benefit may cause more problems than it solves. Since knowledge of the good is complete virtue in the early dialogues, allowing that the person having such knowledge, that is, the virtuous person is only typically or usually better off or happier than the person lacking it, that is, than the unvirtuous person is radically inconsistent with Plato’s views throughout his career.[21]

These interpretations treat the Euthydemus passage as simply another piece of Socratic dialectic that tries to argue soberly for a modest conclusion. This, however, ignores the passage’s genuine oddity. Socrates repeatedly backtracks in it, flaunts the shocking nature of his claims, and announces his most outrageous conclusion that is meant to be based on their previous agreements as follows:

In the end, we agreed, although I do not know how, that, in sum, the situation was this: if a person has wisdom, she has no need of any good luck in addition. (Euthdy. 280AB)

Plato is clearly drawing our attention to the fact that something odd is going on and one plausible explanation is that he recognizes that at the moment he has no sufficient justification for the passage’s strong claims.

If this is right, then it is plausible that we only find an attempt to provide a more satisfactory justification for these claims in Plato’s later dialogues, since they require a grounding in his epistemology and metaphysics. In particular, seeing the requisite wisdom as involving an intelligent appreciation of what makes the correct use of Conditional Goods fine and good will ground (A) and (C) and will help considerably with respect to (B).

5. Psychology

5.1 Pleasure

Plato’s Laws has long been thought to be more favorable, or at least more accommodating, to pleasure than the middle-period dialogues. George Grote, for example, claims that it “recede[s] from the lofty pretensions of … the Republic” and endorses Epicurean hedonism (Grote 1865: 332, cf. Guthrie 1978: 326). Section 4 showed that Plato is not an ethical hedonist. But Grote was a discerning scholar and is responding to genuine features of the text. More than any other dialogue, except perhaps the Republic, the Laws gives pleasure a fundamental place and explores its connections with ethics and politics. (The Philebus examines pleasure, but almost ignores ethics and politics.)

This section focuses on what is most fundamental to the Laws’ discussions of pleasure, that is, the relations among the just life, the pleasant life, and the happy life. First, with respect to virtue and happiness, section 4 showed that Plato accepts that Vice is Sufficient for Misery.

If S is unjust, then S is miserable. (2.660E)

But section 4 also showed that Plato does not endorse Sufficiency, although he accepts something like the following claim about Virtue and Happiness.

If S is just, then S is happy even if S has many Conditional Bads and lacks many Conditional Goods. (2.660E)

Much of Book 2 is concerned with various aspects of pleasure. Section 4 showed that Plato accepts a Conditionality Theory of goods and it seems that at least some pleasures should be Conditional Goods (1.631BD, 2.661AE, 5.732DE). In Book 2, while describing the education of Magnesian citizens, the Athenian asserts several strong claims about pleasure and virtue.

P1
If S is unjust, then S lives unpleasantly (aêdôs, 2.662A).
P2
The most just life available to a person S is the most pleasant life available to S. (2.662D, cf. 663D, 663D, 664BC.)
P3
The most pleasant life available to person S is the best and the most just life available to S. (2.662E–663A)

His interlocutors reject P1—a reaction which both then and now would be common. 2.660E allowed that a just person may lack many Conditional Goods and have many Conditional Bads. Thus, one might expect that her life is overall painful or at least lacks significant surplus pleasure. Is this compatible with being happy? P1 is consistent with an unjust person lacking all Conditional Bads and having all Conditional Goods. One might again expect that her life is overall pleasant or at least contains significant surplus pleasure. Is this compatible with being unhappy? To undermine these reactions, Plato should endorse some of the following.

  1. The just life’s pleasures are greater and more numerous, or its pains are smaller and fewer than it pre-reflectively seems.
  2. The unjust life’s pleasures are smaller and fewer, or its pains are greater and more numerous than it pre-reflectively seems.
  3. There are qualitative differences among the pleasures and pains of just and unjust lives that affect their pleasantness and painfulness in ways that are not pre-reflectively obvious.

We should distinguish here pleasures that are essentially connected with virtue (“aretaic pleasures”) from other pleasures that just (and perhaps unjust) people can have. The former include pleasure taken in performing virtuous actions because they are virtuous, pleasures involved in recognizing one’s own (or others’) virtuous actions, anticipating and remembering them, and so on. The latter would include, for example, the pleasures of good health that might result from moderation.

Before considering what the Athenian actually does, P2 must be clarified since it can be understood in stronger and weaker ways. If, for example, it only meant that the most just possible human life is the most pleasant possible human life, it would, at least in itself, have little practical significance since few could attain this life. P2 extends most widely if the superlatives do not entail the positive degree, so that even if all available lives are unjust and unpleasant, P2 would hold that the least unjust life is the least unpleasant. (“L1 is more just than L2” entails that on a scale from most vicious on the bottom to most just on the top, L1 is higher than L2; mutatis mutandis, for “more pleasant”.) Plato has no reason to prefer a narrower reading. Second, generality is maximized by construing lives as time spans: life L for S is the time span between t (some time in S’s life) and t + n (a time after t that is equal to or less than the time that S dies). So, for any time span in S’s life, the most just option is the most pleasant. Third, although it is not obvious, P2’s wide applicability requires cardinal and not merely ordinal information about pleasure and pain. For example, knowing only that L1’s pleasures and pains are both greater than L2’s, one cannot determine which is more overall pleasant, but one could with cardinal information.

P2 is very strong, but both the Republic and the Laws show that Plato wants to keep a life’s justice, pleasantness, and well-being tightly connected. The challenges facing P2 are now clearer. First, the just choice’s costs can be very high in foregone pleasures (both aretaic and ordinary since it can swiftly lead to death) as well as increased ordinary pains. Plato never suggests that the just are immune to ordinary pains, so aretaic pleasures must greatly outweigh ordinary pleasures and pains. It thus seems that Plato must appeal to “higher” pleasures. Such pleasures differ in quality so that even if two pleasures are equal in duration, the higher quality one is overall more pleasant. Higher pleasures are often held to involve discontinuities such that no amount of lower pleasures could be more pleasant than any amount of a higher one, but Plato does not need so strong a claim, although qualitative differences must overcome great differences in quantity and duration.

Second, P2 holds not only that just lives are more pleasant than unjust lives, but that if two lives are just and L1 is even slightly more just than L2, then L1 is more pleasant. But could qualitative differences overcome great differences in quantity and duration in all such cases (mutatis mutandis, for unjust lives)? Cases where the more just life quickly leads to death and the less just life involves eventually regaining virtue are especially challenging. (But such cases are also problematic for the claim that the more just life is always better for the person.) Plato does not unequivocally endorse P2, and its challenges are great enough that he might have allowed some exceptions. But the Laws emphasizes that our motivations to pursue pleasure and avoid pain are sufficiently strong (5.732D–734E) that Plato has reason to go far in P2’s direction and higher pleasures greatly facilitate this.

How, then, can Plato defend P2? There are several strategies.

  1. Fallibilism about one’s pleasures and pains supports (A)–(C) and Plato can appeal to the Philebus’ account of false pleasures, since unjust people seem prone to all four sorts of Phileban false pleasures.[22]
  2. The most pressing task in defending P2, however, is showing that the just life has great pleasures and by the far the philosophically most satisfying way to do so is by appealing to higher aretaic pleasures. Although the Laws has no explicit theory of such higher pleasures, it clearly points to the need for them.
  3. Material in the Philebus and the Timaeus, however, can be used to develop such an account although neither actually offers a theory of higher aretaic pleasures and the material in the Philebus and the Timaeus is not by itself sufficient to vindicate P2. More specifically, these dialogues suggest (without explicitly asserting) a theory of higher pleasures that are higher because (a) they are pleasures taken in, for example, the finemaking and goodmaking order found in music and other kinds of motion and (b) involve some appreciation of the finemaking and goodmaking properties of such items. Music and dancing play important roles throughout Magnesian citizens’ lives from childhood to adulthood. Harmonies (harmoniai) for Plato, are systems of attunement that provide the basis of a melody for stringed instruments (A. Barker 2013: 415 n. 4. See 2.654A–660A, 664B–671B, Rep. 3.398C–402C. On rhythms and dance, see Pelosi 2010: 33–50). Such harmoniai can be (a) the ultimate bearers of value properties such as fineness, (b) representations of virtuous psychic states, activities and actions, and (c) perhaps themselves the bearers of virtue properties (A. Barker 1989 [2004: 14–17]; 2007: 45–7, 245–52, 308–27; 2013; Fine 1993: 145–7; Pelosi 2010: 30–67; Scott 2020: 65–70, 212–8).

This account can be extended to make room for higher aretaic pleasures that are taken in virtuous action. Doing so is especially important, since the argument at 5.732D–734E is not nearly strong enough to vindicate P2 especially since it does not hold that the virtuous have great pleasures. (For an attempt to develop such an account, see Bobonich forthcoming.)

5.2 Parts of the Soul

There has been a longstanding debate over the parts of the soul in the Laws. In 1975, William Fortenbaugh claimed that

concerning the Laws there is little need to argue that Plato works primarily with an implicit or unformulated bipartite psychology. This is almost a commonplace among scholars today. (1975: 23)

In opposition, Trevor Saunders argued

the bipartite analysis can never exclude the tripartite. Tripartition always presupposes bipartition and bipartition is always capable of expansion into tripartition. (1962: 37)

Both claims, however, are much harder to establish than it seems. The notion of “part” in these claims about tripartitioning and bipartitioning is intended to be the same as that occurring in Republic Book 4’s famous argument for tripartitioning the soul.

In Republic 4, however, the notion of a part is not simply drawn from our ordinary intuitions about parts and wholes, but is instead implicitly characterized by the well-known Principle of Contraries:

The same thing cannot do or undergo contraries with respect to the same thing and in relation to the same thing at the same time. (Rep. 4.436B)

The basic idea is that when what seems to be one thing, say a soul, seems to suffer or do contraries, such cases can be made consistent with the Principle of Contraries either (Case 1) by showing that the contraries are not, in fact, with respect to the same thing and in relation to the same thing and at the same time, or (Case 2) when the contraries are with respect to the same thing and in relation to the same thing and at the same time, each of these non‐coinstantiable contraries is assigned to one of two distinct subjects, with the result that what initially seemed to be one thing is in fact a composite of at least two different things.

So, to establish that a bipartite entity cannot be divided further, one would have to show that neither of the two parts contained contraries that fall under Case 2. To show, on the other hand, that an apparent bipartition can be expanded into a tripartition one would have to show that one of the two parts contains contraries falling under Case 2 and that neither of the resulting subparts or the other part of the initial bipartite entity can be subdivided by further application of the Principle of Contraries. It is not clear how to show either of these things and there is no reason to believe that all bipartite entities can be further subdivided.

Starting with the seminal work of Annas (1981), the Republic argument has received a great deal of highly sophisticated analysis. The same has not been true, however, of the apparent partitionings of the soul in other dialogues. In 2002, however, it was suggested that in the Laws we find neither a bipartite nor a tripartite soul, but a unitary soul and that this changed conception of soul has important ethical and psychological consequences (Bobonich 2002: 216–373).

The fundamental argument for this new unitary interpretation rests on claims about developments between the Republic and the Laws in Plato’s epistemology (especially his understanding of perception and of Recollection) and his conception of the soul as a self-mover. This entry is not the place to examine these issues and to discuss the various interpretations extant in the secondary literature.

The Laws does, however, provide reasons for taking seriously the possibility that in it the soul is unitary. First, a number of early dialogues implicitly reject the possibility of weakness of will or akrasia and the early dialogue the Protagoras gives a lengthy argument that tries to show that akrasia is impossible. It is in the Republic that Plato first explicitly recognizes akrasia and there the acceptance of parts of the soul is essential to Plato’s explanation of its possibility. In the Laws, we find an explanation of akrasia that does not involve psychic parts (1.644D–645B, Bobonich 2002: 260–88).

Second, the Laws tries to clarify motivational conflict by means of its famous puppet image.

Consider each of us living beings to be a divine puppet, whether put together as the gods’ plaything or for a serious purpose, we do not know. But we do know this, that these affections in us [pathê] like strings or cords, draw us along, and being contrary to each other, pull against one another towards contrary actions, in the very region where virtue and vice lie distinguished. For our argument says that there is one of these pulls that each of us must always follow, never letting go of it, and pulling with it against the other strings. This one is the golden and sacred pull of calculation, also called the city’s common law. The others are hard and iron and resemble all different kinds, but this one is soft since it is golden. One must always, then, assist the finest pull, that of law, since calculation, though fine, is gentle rather than forceful, so its pull needs assistants so that the golden kind within us will win out over the other kinds. (1.644D–645B)

This image—unlike, for example, Republic 9’s image of the divided soul as a composite of a human, a lion, and a many-headed beast (588CD)—has no room for parts of the soul: all that it recognizes are the person herself and her affections.

Both of these two facts give us reason to take seriously the possibility that the soul is unitary in the Laws. But the unitary interpretation does not claim that they are decisive evidence and it ultimately relies upon the line of thought described above. The following is a brief sketch of its main points.

  1. The Republic partitions the soul into three parts—the Reasoning part, the Spirited part, and the Appetitive part—that are agent-like, that is, they are the ultimate subjects of psychological powers, states, and activities that are typically attributed to the person as a whole. In particular, all three parts have beliefs and desires.
  2. Establishing that some of the items in these parts are contrary to each other in the Principle of Contraries Case 2 way requires that these items have conceptual and propositional content. This content comes from perception and is thus sensible. It does not come from the Recollection of Forms.
  3. In the Theaetetus, Plato rejects his earlier view that perception in itself includes belief. All belief requires some sort of grasp of the non-sensible property of Being.
  4. The soul is unitary because of the need for a single judgment-maker that applies, in some way, non-sensible properties.
  5. We find a recognition of this line of thought in a remarkable passage in the Timaeus that holds that the Appetitive part does “not share at all in belief” and attributes this incapacity to the fact the Appetitive part is “wholly passive” and does not possess any “inherent motion of its own” (Tim. 77BC). But Laws 10 defines the soul as a self-mover (or perhaps as self-motion, 893B–896C, cf. Phdr. 245CE). The Timaeus’ account of the Appetitive “part” thus excludes it from being a self-moving psychic thing or subject and allows it to be at most a group of moved bodily motions or of moved psychic motions (affections or pathê).

These claims are controversial and a satisfactory evaluation of them would require a careful examination of a number of dialogues, including the Cratylus, the Phaedo, the Phaedrus, the Philebus, the Republic, the Theaetetus, and the Timaeus. Obviously, this would be out of place in this entry, but the appended references provide some starting points.[23] It is worth stressing how much is required to come to an adequate evaluation of these issues, since a common response to the unitary interpretation is to claim that the Republic’s tripartitioning is retained in the Laws because Plato there distinguishes rational desires from appetitive desires and spirited emotions (e.g., Brisson 2000 and Laks 2022: 169–76). But this misses the point of the interpretation’s claim. This interpretation denies that the Laws continues to accept the agent-like soul parts of the Republic, not that psychic states, powers, and activities can in some way be divided into three groups. These are very different claims with very different implications.

6. Political Philosophy

6.1 The Boundaries of the City

Although the issues discussed in section 3 are important, they have tended (along with issues about the preludes discussed in section 6.7) to monopolize recent discussions of the relations between the Republic’s political philosophy and that of the Laws. This is unfortunate, since it has resulted in slighting what is the most obvious difference between the Republic and the Laws and the one that is of the greatest importance for understanding Plato’s political philosophy.

By far the largest group of citizens in Kallipolis, that is, those in the class of producers, have been excluded from citizenship in Magnesia. Magnesia has a different criterion for citizenship that reflects a different understanding of the political association. (Or more precisely, the Laws’ explicit criterion for citizenship differs greatly from the Republic’s implicit criterion.)[24]

In Book 7, after criticizing Sparta for failing to train its female citizens in the same pursuits as men, the Athenian poses the fundamental question about Magnesia and its citizens. Given the economic and social arrangements that have been sketched, “What way of life [tropos … tou biou] should these people live?” (7.806D, cf. Gorg. 481C, Rep. 1.344DE).[25]

There is a job [ergon] left, we say, for people living in this way, and no very small or trivial one either, but the greatest of all jobs that a just law assigns them. For compared to a life that yearns for victory in the Pythian or Olympic games and is entirely lacking in leisure for all other jobs [ergôn], the life of a person who is occupied with the care for the body in all respects and for the soul in respect of virtue—the life that is most correctly called “life”—is doubly or yet more than doubly lacking in leisure. For no side job, in the form of other jobs, must hinder him from giving his body its fitting exercises and nourishment, or his soul its studies [mathêmatôn] and habits. The entire night and day are scarcely sufficient for the person who doing this to get the complete and sufficient benefit from these things. (7.807CD)

The Athenian draws the crucial implication of this fundamental principle a little later.

No citizen of the country is to work at any craftsman-like art, nor any slave of his. For a man who is a citizen possesses a sufficient art, that needs long practice and many studies [mathêmatôn], in the keeping and conserving of the public structure of the city [ton koinon tês poleôs kosmon], which he must not practice as a side job.[26] (8.846D)

The Laws thus not only excludes those engaged in trade and manufacture from citizenship, but even prohibits citizens from setting their slaves to such tasks under their supervision.

This passage from the Laws continues to echo and revise the Republic.

Human nature is pretty much not capable of working with exactness in two pursuits or arts, nor to practice one sufficiently oneself and supervise another who is practicing a second. So the first thing that must be laid down in our city is this: No metalworker is at the same time to be a carpenter, nor is a carpenter to supervise others who are metalworkers instead of practicing his own art … rather, each single individual in the city is to have one art and from this to acquire a living. The City-Wardens must work hard at maintaining this law, and if one of the citizens of the country turns aside to some art other than the practice of virtue, they are to punish him with reproaches and dishonors until they restore him to his proper course. (8.846D–847A)

The contrast with the Republic is unmistakable: there the principle of specialization regulates the entire citizen body. It is precisely by performing the art of the metalworker or carpenter that the citizens of the producer class fulfill their political job (ergon). In Magnesia, both metalworkers and carpenters are excluded from citizenship and the citizens are required to practice the art of keeping and conserving of the public structure of the city which involves caring for their bodies and cultivating the virtues. The work done by the Republic’s producer class is assigned either to aliens or to slaves for the simple reason that their corruption does not directly harm the city (11.919CD).

A producer class of citizens simply no longer exists in Magnesia. For Magnesia to be virtuous, it is not sufficient that each of several functionally defined classes is doing its own job, and thus it is not sufficient that the members of one class perform military service while each of the members of another performs a single art. The entire law code of the city aims at fostering all the virtues in the whole citizen body. Each citizen is required to be virtuous and the boundaries of the political community are constituted by the capacity for and dedication to virtue. As 8.846D–847A quoted above shows, this conception of the city and of citizenship is part of the citizens’ own self‐conception.[27] (All citizens will study the text of the Laws, 7.811C–812A.)

Plato thus expects all citizens in Magnesia to have sufficient leisure necessary to engage in a demanding life of citizenship and virtue; the city is one that “dwells in the greatest leisure” (8.832D). Certainly how much leisure the citizens would have who lived in an actual city founded in general accordance with the sketch of Magnesia would depend on their geographic and economic circumstances. But Plato intends all citizens to have considerable leisure time to devote to non‐economic activities and does not think that such a possibility is excluded by the ordinary social and economic facts of human life. And even if external circumstances are unfavorable and reduce the time available for non‐economic activities for many citizens, they still have the capacity to benefit from leisure time. The bar to their engaging in and benefiting from non‐economic leisure activities would lie in external circumstances, not in their own natures.[28]

We can now better see why the question asked at the end of section 3.1—whether Kallipolis or Magnesia is the better city—is indeed a live and pressing question. Since in both the Republic and the Laws the legislator’s ultimate end is the (greatest) happiness of the city and this is reducible to the happiness of the citizens, one reasonable way to try to answer the question is to consider which city is happier. Philosophers in both cities should be extremely happy and Plato thinks that at least some members of the Dawn Council, if properly educated as he intends them to be, will be highly accomplished philosophers (12.969C). There is no obvious way to compare the number of philosophers in each city, but Plato cannot expect them to be a large group in either city (e.g., Stsmn. 292D–293A, 297BC). This is not the place to compare the happiness of Kallipolis’ auxiliaries with that of Magnesian citizens. But because producers would be excluded from Magnesia because of their inability to be virtuous, we can at least infer that by far the largest part of Kallipolis would be considerably less happy than Magnesian citizens are expected to be. (Of course, both cities will contain some failures who are very far from being virtuous. But there is no reason to expect such failures to be greater in Magnesia than Kallipolis.) This does not settle the question of which city is happier, but it shows that the answer is much less clear than many may have thought.

6.2 Magnesia’s Social and Political Institutions

This section provides a brief overview of Magnesia’s basic social and political institutions.[29] Magnesia will be located in a part of Crete that was left empty by an ancient migration and will be about ten miles from the sea. The site is basically self-sufficient in resources without having much excess to export. Plato sees this unsuitability for active commerce and distance from the sea as advantages: they discourage the maritime and commercial activities that corrupt cities by fostering a love of money-making in the citizens and by allowing close contact with foreigners who bring innovation and have not received the good ethical education afforded to Magnesians (4.704A–707D).

The city will be relatively populous: its number of households is to remain permanently at 5,040.[30] Immigration and emigration policies are designed to avoid population excess and deficiency. Each household will have an allotment consisting of two plots of land: one nearer the city’s center and one nearer its borders. Each household’s allotment is intended to be equally productive and to support a comfortable, although not luxurious, life for the household’s members (5.737C–745D). The households and land are not owned or farmed in common, but each shareholder must consider his share to be at the same time the common property of the whole city (5.740A). Part of the sense in which the lot is common is that it is inalienable and cannot be divided or aggregated: the lot’s assignment to a household is intended to support the household throughout the generations. (There are also restrictions on the use of the land.) Further, each household will help, out of its own resources, to fund Magnesia’s system of common meals.[31] There will be four property classes: the members of the first class have assets worth between three and four times the value of the lot (and the tools and animals needed to farm it), the second class between two and three times this value and so on.[32] Anything accumulated over the highest amount will be confiscated by the city (5.744D–745A). Such assets do not include gold and silver, since these may be possessed only by the city; Magnesia will have only a token currency (5.742AB).

The lot holders or heads of households are citizens, but citizenship is not restricted to them and owning land is not a necessary condition of citizenship. The sons and heirs of lot holders are also citizens and are liable to military service at age 20, can participate in elections at that age and can serve in office at 30 (Morrow 1960: 112–3). They will not inherit the household lot, however, until their father dies. What of women? Section 6.6 discusses their role in Magnesia which is different than in Kallipolis, since private families are not abolished in Magnesia. Many of Magnesia’s inhabitants, however, are not citizens. There is a considerable slave population (including both public and private slaves) and they, of course, are not citizens. Also found within the city are transient foreigners and resident foreigners (metics) who may stay for twenty years. Slaves and foreigners are an economic necessity for the city for they carry on the trading, manufacturing and menial occupations that are barred to citizens (1.644A, 5.741E, 743D, 8.846D).

As for the political system or constitution, Magnesia has a rich variety of offices, but the main ones are: the Assembly (koinos sullogos, ekklêsia), the Council (boulê), the magistrates, especially the guardians of the laws (nomophulakes), the courts and the Dawn Council (nukterinos sullogos). The Dawn Council is discussed in section 6.4.

The Assembly is the city’s main electoral authority; it is composed of all citizens, or more precisely, all those who have served or are serving in the military. The Assembly is responsible for electing most of the city’s officers and magistrates. The other functions explicitly given to it are:

  1. a role in judging offenses against the public,
  2. making awards of merit,
  3. extending the term of residence for metics, and
  4. passing on proposed changes in the laws, at least those regarding dances and sacrifices.

It may also have other responsibilities in connection with foreign affairs (Morrow 1960: 156–65, 174–6, 229 and Piérart 1974: 89– 121).

The Council is composed of 90 members chosen by election from each property class for a total of 360 members. Men are eligible for office at age 30, women at age 40. Members serve one-year terms. The Council exercises ordinary administrative powers, such as calling and dissolving the Assembly, receiving foreign ambassadors, supervising elections and so on.

The guardians of the laws are composed of 37 citizens, at least fifty years of age who serve from the time of their election until age 70 (6.755A). There are four ways in which the nomophulakes guard the laws:

  1. Although they seem to lack the authority to discipline other magistrates, they are assigned the general task of supervising them and are expected to bring appropriate cases to the attention of the proper officials.
  2. They exercise wide supervisory powers over citizens in general and, for example, are charged with fining those who spend excessively, with granting permission to travel abroad, and with overseeing the care of orphans.
  3. They possess various judicial functions and are in charge of especially important or difficult cases involving the family, property, and the abuse of laws (Morrow 1960: 195–215 and Piérart 1974: 152–208).
  4. Perhaps their most important task is the revision and supplementation of the existing laws. The revision of laws is discussed in section 6.4.

Finally, there is an extensive system of courts in Magnesia, both public and private. One of Plato’s major innovations, compared with Athenian law, is the elaborate structure of appeals in judicial cases. It is worth noting that Plato holds that citizens, in virtue of their standing in the political community, may legitimately expect to have a share in the administration of justice (6.767E–768B).

6.3 The Goal of Law

It is certainly not the case that the Laws consists only of proposed statutes and remarks about legislation (cf. Aristotle Politics 2.3 1265a1–2). Nevertheless, law is its primary topic. Thus the question of what the decisive criterion for the adoption of a law (or set of laws) is deserves more attention than it has received. The most straightforward suggestion is the following.

H:
(i) A set of laws, L, that governs city C is correct (orthos) if and only if L produces the greatest possible happiness for C’s citizens, and (ii) the correctness of a set of laws is a decisive reason for enacting it.

Let us note some clarifications.

  1. It is the criterion of correctness that Plato presents as decisively determining what the legislator should do. (Section 6.5 on Natural Law discusses correctness further.) He also intends legislators to use it as a decision procedure.

  2. It is important to see that H characterizes a fundamental evaluative and normative property of laws and institutions, not of individuals, and is justified by maximizing all the citizens’ happiness, not that of any particular person. As noted in section 4.1, Plato, throughout his career, is a Rational Eudaimonist. Although this principle should play an important role in justifying the correctness criterion of laws, it does not entail it. To do so, it would have to be supplemented by principles about the evaluative standards for laws and institutions and principles connecting the two.

    It is also important to realize that we cannot assume that the maximal happiness of the citizens to which H refers is an instance of relational goodness in the way that what is good for a given person is an instance of relational goodness. This is certainly one important way in which the notion of being good for some group has been understood. But this assumption needs justification. Some have, for example, rejected the idea that the notion of relational goodness genuinely applies to the notion of being good for a group on the grounds that relational goodness only makes sense when it is the well-being of some genuine individual and that groups are not genuine individuals. We might then see the notion of goodness invoked in H as (i) an instance of attributive goodness because it is really ranking outcomes as better or worse or (ii) an instance of goodness simpliciter or non-relational goodness (as some consequentialists do). Settling this question is important for understanding what conceptions of goodness Plato uses. ((ii) may be preferable if we do not think that outcomes provide the sort of kind that is relevant to attributive goodness.)

  3. H applies to both the Republic and the Laws. It construes the city’s happiness as reducible to the citizens’ happiness, but even if one adopted an “organic” conception of the city’s happiness, H would remain a maximizing principle.[33]

  4. The Laws mentions other goals for laws (1.628C, cf. 2.664A), including inculcating all the virtues in the citizens (4.705D–706A, 12.962B–963A), and the trio of goals of making the city free, friendly to itself, and wise (3.693BE, 701DE). But these other goals are justified by their instrumental or constitutive contribution to maximizing the citizens’ happiness.

  5. H is restricted to the happiness of C’s citizens.

H has significant affinities with consequentialism. Act-consequentialism, for example, specifies some principle for ranking overall states of affairs from best to worst from an impersonal point of view and then requires each agent to bring about the best available outcome. Act-consequentialism and H differ in that the former is a criterion for actions’ moral rightness, while H is a criterion for laws’ correctness. But consequentialism is a highly general principle of evaluation and can (and has been) applied to many things that have consequences, including motives, character states, and rules.

H and act-consequentialism do, however, share two features that are plausibly thought to be constitutive of a consequentialist outlook: they both rank outcomes impersonally or agent-neutrally (at least within a target group) and require that the best one be chosen. H does have one very important difference with modern forms of act-consequentialism in that the latter’s ranking typically takes at least all humans equally into account while H’s ranking is far more restricted, that is, to a particular city. Section 7 discusses this issue further.

This claim of affinity has faced several objections. The most common is that Plato cannot accept consequentialism because he is a Rational Eudaimonist.[34] This objection, however, is confused. H applies to laws while act-consequentialism applies to individuals’ actions. More specifically, act-consequentialism is a theory of right action: it is not a theory about what agents have most reason to do. H and act-consequentialism concern different domains and do not directly compete. Other objections include the following.

  1. Welfarist consequentialism’s goal is bringing about overall happiness, but Plato does not think that one person can bring about happiness for another. Happiness requires having a certain character and using one’s goods correctly, and one person cannot directly bring these about in another.

  2. Julia Annas has raised several objections (Annas 1993: 38, cf. 274, 334, 447–8).

    1. Ancient ethics never develops a maximizing conception of rationality.
    2. Ancient ethics, unlike consequentialism, does not aim at the maximizing states of affairs.
    3. A form of consequentialism that aimed at maximizing virtuous actions would require agents to perform many wrongful actions in order to maximize their opportunities for acting virtuously.

  3. M. M. McCabe objects that consequentialism is inconsistent with Plato’s ethics because consequentialism denies that actions are good or bad in themselves and holds that they are only instrumentally valuable in producing outcomes (McCabe 2005).

  4. Some make the related objection that consequentialism must rank outcomes independently of all ethical considerations.

These objections deserve further examination although further analysis suggests that they are not successful. But despite what Plato says, he might not fully realize and accept all the consequences of his commitments. More discussion is required on the following topics among others.

  1. Consequentialism is highly demanding. Does Plato accept the demandingness of H and how does he justify it? Does he accept, in some way, the requirement that the well-being of some citizens must, if need be, be sacrificed in order to maximize overall well-being?

  2. Consequentialism, famously, rejects the do/allow distinction. Plato may not explicitly recognize this distinction, but are his judgments about specific cases consistent with rejecting it?

  3. Does Plato accept consequentialism’s notorious commitment to doing bad things in order to bring about the best overall outcome?

  4. Is Plato an absolutist, that is, does he think that certain actions are forbidden no matter what the consequences are? In the Republic Book 1’s elenchus with Polemarchus, he agrees with Socrates that it is never just to harm anyone in the sense of making her character less virtuous. Is this a principled reason to reject consequentialism?

  5. The principle of “political justice” (6.756E–758A) distributes political offices in direct proportion to virtue. In this Book 6 passage, Plato says that this principle of political justice must sometimes be infringed in order to prevent faction within the city. Does this show that Plato accepts principles of political justice whose normative force does not derive from maximizing the citizens’ happiness (even if the latter trumps, at least sometimes, these principles of justice)?[35]

6.4 The Dawn Council and Changing the Law

The political institution in the Laws that has generated by far the greatest controversy is the Dawn Council (nukterinos sullogos) which is so-called because it meets daily from dawn until sunrise when everyone has the most leisure from public and private activities (12.961B). This Council is first explicitly mentioned in Book 10 (but is alluded to earlier at 1.632C and 7.818A) where it is assigned an educational function. Those who have violated Magnesia’s impiety laws due to ignorance, rather than bad character, are to be imprisoned for five years. During their imprisonment, the members of the Dawn Council meet with them in order to reform their beliefs by teaching (10.909A).

The Dawn Council’s membership seems to include the following.

  1. The ten oldest guardians of the laws.
  2. The current supervisor of education and his predecessors.
  3. The examiners (officials who check the qualifications of those entering office and audit them when they leave office) and other citizens who have won awards of honor.
  4. Certain citizens, over 50 years of age, called “observers” (theôroi) who have traveled abroad under official auspices to learn from and about the outside world. When they return, the Council’s current members examine them to see whether their travel has corrupted them and to learn from them any discoveries they have made that are relevant to laws or to education (12.952BD). Some of the observers may then be invited to participate in the Dawn Council.
  5. Each of the above members is to nominate for membership a younger associate between the ages of 30 and 40 (whose acceptance is subject to approval by the other members, 12.951DE, 961AB). (See Morrow [1960: 503–4] on why the small differences in the two accounts have little significance.)

The main controversy about the Dawn Council concerns the extent of its powers. In Book 12, the Athenian describes this Council as an essential “salvation” (sôtêria) for Magnesia without which the city would be incomplete and imperfect (12.960BC). It is a salvation insofar as it possesses knowledge of the goal of legislation (12.962BC). The requisite knowledge will be of how each of virtues, the fine, and the good are both many and one and this involves knowing their essences and being able to define as many of them as can be defined (12.965C–968A). The members are also expected to have similar knowledge about the gods, the soul, and the motions of the stars. As an essential part of this, they will also need extensive knowledge of music and mathematics (7.817E–818E). This knowledge is to be applied to Magnesia’s laws and its practices for forming ethical character (12.967DE). The Athenian leaves unspecified the exact course of the Council’s studies, but it is clear that it includes a broad range of fundamental philosophical topics concerning reality and value as well as studies of more empirical matters, such as the law codes of other cities. Given the methods of selection, not every member of the Council will be a proficient philosopher, but a number will attain a sophisticated understanding of the above topics. And some, it seems, will be fully accomplished philosophers (12.969C).

The Athenian, however, does not explain how the Council is to give effect to its knowledge and this is the source of controversy. The following passage has encouraged some to hold that the Council is given very great, or even unlimited, political and legal powers.

If this divine council does come into being, dear friends, the city must be handed over to it [paradoteon toutôi tên polin]. (12.969B, cf. 960BE, 961C)

Some scholars have held, on the basis of these passages, that Plato intends the Dawn Council to be the main political authority in Magnesia. On this view, either it will have the same powers as did the philosopher kings in the Republic to change laws and institutions as it sees fit or the extent of its powers will simply be left to the Dawn Council itself to determine (E. Barker 1918 [1960: 406–10]; Klosko 1988, 2008).[36] Such an interpretation has, however, high costs. As its main contemporary proponent concedes, it requires us to see the Laws as massively inconsistent: the earlier provisions of political authority to various offices are incompatible with assigning such unlimited powers to the Dawn Council (Klosko 1988: 85). Further, such a grant of power is at least in serious tension with one of the Laws’ basic political principles which is that allowing any magistrate or political body unchecked authority runs too great a risk of the abuse of power. Such a risk is still too great even if the possessors of power have genuine knowledge: even those with full knowledge are subject to corruption in such circumstances (9.875AC, cf. Morrow 1960: 521–43).

Other interpreters, such as Glenn Morrow, have suggested that the Dawn Council’s role is primarily informal (1960: 500–18). The Council is to possess various sorts of knowledge and it must also educate its own members. Even without possessing powers beyond those explicitly assigned to it, the Dawn Council should exercise considerable influence on Magnesia’s governance. Its members include some of the city’s most important officials. Plato would certainly expect that these officials’ administration of the laws and revision of them—if this is permitted—to be informed by their studies. Perhaps even more important, the younger associate members of the Dawn Council will come to fill many of the city’s offices and will exercise an informal, but still significant, influence on other citizens in the deliberations that play such an important role in Magnesia’s system of government.

There is, however, a third option. Morrow adopts his “informal” interpretation in part because Plato does not explicitly assign to the Dawn Council any powers beyond those just noted. But the Laws is not intended to provide a fully determinate blueprint of the second best city and one should allow for a range of ways of implementing its basic structure (cf. the supplement). For example, Plato appears to assign to the “guardians of the laws” some important role in revising Magnesia’s laws. In his Book 12 discussion, Plato describes the members of the Dawn Council as “those who will really be guardians of the laws” (12.966B). The members of the Dawn Council will, if properly educated, be “made into guardians whose like, with respect to the virtue of safekeeping, we have not seen come into being in our lives previously” (12.969C). One need not see these claims as a volte-face on Plato’s part, if one allows for a range of ways to realize the outline of Magnesia sketched that fall between excluding the Dawn Council from any political role at all and seeing them as philosopher kings in disguise. One can thus allow the Dawn Council to have genuine political influence going beyond its explicitly stated responsibilities that still falls well short of autocratic power without expecting the Laws’ text to make the nature of its influence and authority fully determinate.

Another longstanding controversy concerning the Laws’ political theory concerns the possibility of changing Magnesia’s laws. This controversy arises because there are passages in the Laws that suggest that the law code will, perhaps, after a limited period of experimentation, become immutable or nearly so, while other passages suggest the permanent possibility for revision, and both sets of passages give rise to interpretive disputes.[37] This entry is not the place for the detailed analysis of specific passages, but there are general reasons to think that some revision of the laws is possible.

  1. At 6.769A–772D, the Athenian observes that their current proposed constitution will contain omissions and deficiencies that require correction (cf. 9.859C) and that if their constitution is going to constantly improve, some provision must be made for knowledgeable supplementation and revision of the laws and he suggests a procedure for doing so (6.772CD). The need for such revision is permanent.

  2. As has been seen, the rationale for the institutions of the Dawn Council and of the observers explicitly presumes that Magnesia’s laws may need supplementation or revision and allows for them. The permanent salvation of the Magnesia and its constitution is to be attained not by rendering the law code itself permanent and immutable, but by insuring that there is an institutional framework in the city that allows for learning new high‐level truths, taking account of changing circumstances, and revising the laws accordingly.[38]

  3. Even a staunch advocate of the immutability interpretation admits that it conflicts with (1) and (2) and that makes the Laws deeply inconsistent (especially with respect to the Dawn Council) on one of the most fundamental points of its political philosophy (Klosko 2008). This is a high cost for any interpretation.

  4. The passages that the immutability interpretation appeals to can be accounted for by acknowledging that Plato is highly sensitive to the costs of change (7.797A–799B) which include encouraging a corrupting desire for novelty.[39]

Much of the recent secondary literature on the Laws has been devoted to discussions of the powers of the Nocturnal Council and of the possibility of changing the law in Magnesia. This work has been valuable in providing more detailed analyses of standard passages and in bringing new passages into the discussion. But unless these debates are connected to broader and deeper philosophical issues, they become increasingly arid. There are a number of such possible connections, but two are especially straightforward.

First, what would Plato have had to believe if he accepted legal immutability? One route to justifying such immutability is epistemic. Perhaps Plato could argue for it if he thought that at the time of writing the Laws, he (1) had full knowledge of all general philosophic truths that were relevant to legislation, (2) was certain that he had stated the best possible set of laws in light of these general truths, (3) possessed full knowledge of all possible changing circumstances that might affect which laws were best, (4) was certain that he had stated the best possible set of laws in light of his knowledge of (1)–(3).[40] How well do these assumptions fit in with Plato’s other views?

As noted in several contexts, Magnesia’s actual laws are intended to depend on what laws humans are capable of accepting and successfully living under. Another route to legal immutability would be to argue that Magnesia’s laws are the most demanding laws that are compatible with human nature. But Magnesia’s first citizens are colonists drawn from other Greek cities of the time and the Laws stresses that all other Greek cities (a) are highly defective, (b) provide an extremely defective education to their inhabitants, and (3) that early childhood training establishes a character that is highly resistant to any improvement. Legal immutability might be plausible if Plato thought that Magnesian education even continued over several generations could not produce characters any better than those, that is, any better at accepting greater ethical demands. Or that if the future citizens were capable of better laws and institutions and could recognize this, that the slightest change would produce so great a desire for worse novelties in them that the long-run consequences would be worse. If such claims were true, they would be extremely important (as well as extremely surprising) discoveries about Plato’s views about human psychology. Nor would allowing for a brief period of experimentation make a significant difference.

Similarly, it would be worth exploring the broader implications of holding that the Dawn Council is intended to possess all political authority and exercise absolute rule.

In Book 6, Plato states a principle of political justice.

Distribution according to Virtue. A distribution of honors and political offices (timai) to citizens is just if and only if it distributes offices to persons in direct proportion to each person’s virtue. (6.757AD)

This principle is presented in the first instance as a principle of desert and thus the ethical capacities of citizens are not seen as merely providing an instrumental justification for their political participation, but rather as constituting a claim of merit. Not all forms of political participation will require, for example, a full grasp of first principles. Even if they do not possess knowledge and virtue at the highest levels, citizens are still entitled to an important kind of political participation and Magnesia allows for many forms of political activity.

But this principle also suggests that Plato in the Laws, like Aristotle, thinks of holding political office and, more generally, engaging in political activity as a good, and not a burden. In Book 6’s context, Plato has political offices especially in mind, but the principle should apply more widely to other honors and it is clear that such appropriate honors are good for their virtuous recipients and not burdens. This distributive principle does not, however, tell us why sharing in political activity is good. (We need not think, for example, that its only benefit is that it is an honor to participate.)

This question is particularly pressing in light of the Republic. There Plato stresses philosophers’ reluctance to engage in ruling. Cities will not be well governed until it is clear that those who are the rulers could have a better life doing something other than ruling and, notoriously, philosophers must be “compelled” to return to the Cave and rule the city. Since the Republic aims to show that the just person is always better off than the unjust person, Plato must hold that ruling does not involve an overall sacrifice by the philosopher rulers of their happiness although it is not easy to find a compelling justification of this claim. Nevertheless, the Republic’s tone makes salient the issue of how political activity benefits those engaging in it.

Section 6.1 showed that the Laws requires all citizens to develop the virtues as much as possible and assigns to them the exclusive job of practicing the single art of keeping and conserving the public organization of the city. These two points clearly are related: developing the virtues as much as possible improves citizens’ abilities to practice their art and we should see practicing such an art as an expression of their virtue. As such, it will be a prominent component of, and not just a means to, their well-being. Even without advanced theoretical knowledge, most citizens will have some grasp of correct ethical principles and will cooperate with each other to realize a genuine common good. Since they value virtue for its own sake, they will also value these activities for their own sake.

This idea that political activity benefits citizens insofar as it is an expression of their virtue and a way of further developing it has significant political consequences. If such activity did not benefit the citizens engaging in it, then minimizing the political activity of some (or perhaps excluding them entirely from political life) would not be a cost to be accounted for in the reckoning of overall benefit. Those deprived would not be deprived of a good. But if political activity is good for those engaging in it, then in deciding upon the distribution of political powers and functions we have to take into account the fact that excluding some citizens deprives them of a good. This line of thought gives Plato additional reason both to reject legal immutability and not to make the Dawn Council Magnesia’s sole source of political authority that merely issues to the rest of the citizen body commands that must be unreflectively obeyed.

6.5 Natural Law

Another fundamental question about law in Plato that deserves more attention than it has received concerns his relation to the natural law tradition (Finnis 1980: 363, 407–8; Hall 1956; Stalley 1983). This section sketches the two most detailed but incompatible interpretations of the Laws’ relation to this tradition. As is the case with most philosophical concepts, the content of the notion of “natural law” is controversial. To help fix ideas, let us understand a natural law theory as one holding that unless laws’ content is ultimately at least partially grounded in ethical facts, then those laws are not genuine laws or at least they are defective qua laws.[41] Let us call the claim that laws failing this criterion are not genuine laws, the “strong” natural law view, and the claim that at least some laws failing this criterion are still laws although they are defective qua laws, the “moderate” natural law view.

The first account holds that the Laws endorses a moderate version of natural law theory.[42] Section 6.2 showed that the Laws’ most fundamental term for the evaluation of laws is “correctness”. Determining correctness definitively settles what laws to adopt and other goals for laws are valued just insofar as they conduce in some way to correctness. The following passage from Book 4 might seem to endorse the strong natural law view.

[In some cities] where offices are fought over, and the victorious take over the city’s affairs so completely that they give no share of rule at all to the defeated … These we certainly would now say are not constitutions [politeias], nor are any laws correct [orthous] that are not established for the sake of what is common [tou koinou] to the entire city; where they are for the sake of some, we say that these consist of “partisans” [stasiôtas] not citizens [politas], and that when they declare these laws to be the just ones, they are uttering empty words. (4.715B2–6)

Section 6.3 argued that “what is common” to the city is the common good understood as the citizens’ maximal happiness. But on the Laws’ usage of “correct”, an incorrect F does not necessarily fail to be an F (e.g., 2.659D, 668B, 3.696C, 5.743C, 7.815B) and the Laws speaks of “incorrect F’s” (1.627D, 8.836BD, cf. Rep. 1.339C, “incorrect laws”). The Statesman explicitly allows that regimes that are not genuine constitutions, but mere “faction-states”, can have genuine laws and that some of these laws are better than others (Horn 2021).

The Laws states no ethical necessary conditions for being a law, although it seems that it could. One might deny that extreme failures are F’s and the passages about art and understanding discussed below make this a plausible option. Perhaps the Laws deemphasizes the cases in which unjust laws fail to be laws because of Plato’s increased appreciation of the value of even highly defective law codes (Stsmn. 297B–303D).

In the Laws, correctness is a teleological notion: an activity is correct when it attains its intended goal (2.667B–668B). This goal is internal to the activity in that it helps to constitute the activity’s identity and specifies what counts as its successful completion. Section 6.3 showed that law’s correctness consists in achieving the goal of maximizing the citizens’ happiness. This is an internal standard for laws, so incorrect laws fail to achieve their goal and thus are defective as laws.

The Laws classifies legislation (nomothesia) as an art and law is properly the product of the legislative art (nomothetikê, 4.709AD, 10.889CE with 892B, Stsmn. 294A). As such, legislation is governed by the general norms applying to arts. These are norms of practical rationality that are essential to art as such and they apply to both the Demiurge’s making of the kosmos and the legislator’s making of laws. Art as such necessarily seeks to provide what is best for what it is set over and because ruling is an art it also aims at what is best for what it is set over (Gorg. 501A–504B, Rep. 1.345DE, 346E, 347D). Political science thus aims at what is best for the city, that is, what is best for the citizens (Stsmn. 293DE, 296D–297B, 300CD, 311BC). It follows from this conception of an art that a product that fails to attain the relevant standard of goodness is defective precisely as the kind of thing that it is.

Finally, the Laws claims that reason “strives to become law” (8.835E, cf. 1.644D) and that “law” is the name given to “the distribution ordained by understanding [tên tou nou dianomê]” (4.713E–714A). Laws should be expressions of understanding and those that are not correct are not such expressions (12.957C, cf. 10.890D, 892B). The Timaeus supports this reading. In its original and best state, the human soul consists solely of the reasoning part or aspect and the circles of the Same and the Other of which it consists maintain their proper circular motions (Tim. 42BD, 43A–44C). The soul then judges truly and is intelligent (emphrona, Tim. 44B). When these psychic motions are distorted by motions coming from outside, the soul is foolish (anoêtoi, Tim. 43E–44A). Thus, laws that are incorrect by expressing ethical falsehoods are defective instances of understanding.

A second incompatible interpretation deserves equal attention (Hatzistavrou 2018). On this account, the Laws presents a positivist account of law, that is, one that

denies both the existence of a non-trivial, necessary link between the content of legal norms and the content of objective moral norms and the intrinsic moral merit of the rule of law

and that instead

grounds the existence of law on social facts. (Hatzistavrou 2018: 210)

To begin, this interpretation appeals to the account of law’s origin in Book 3 (676A–683B) that identifies it by reference to social facts, not objective moral norms. Second, it distinguishes two senses of “constitution” in the Laws: (a) a broad sense in which it refers to any type of political arrangement (e.g., 3.689A, 693D–694A), and (b) a narrow sense in which it refers to a political arrangement that has an order due to written law (9.875D, 1.632D, 6.780D) and that meets the standard of instantiating freedom (eleutheria), friendship (philia), and wisdom (phronêsis), or soundness of mind (sophrônein) or reason (nous) (3.693BE, 701C). If these three criteria are understood, for example, as requiring that the laws foster the four virtues, this would plausibly be a form of natural law theory.

But according this interpretation, the narrow standard is presented in Books 3 and 4 as being satisfied at times by Sparta, Crete, Persia, and Athens (3.693E–694A, 4.712E). The standard that these regimes satisfy is instead “a more mundane” one that is attainable by significantly ethically flawed constitutions. In particular, the standard is satisfied by the prevalence in a city of an ideology that effects a compromise between the political values of the subjects’ freedom and of their subordination to the rulers (3.693D–694A). More generally, law is identified with norms of public conduct that express conclusions of what this interpretation terms “enkratic civic reason”, that is, (a) views of a lawgiver about what is overall good for the whole city which (b) have been accepted by the subjects, and (c) have effective authority over the rulers.

Such a disconnect between law and ethics may seem a surprising position to attribute to Plato, but this interpretation provides a motivation for Plato’s positivism. This view of law analyses it from the viewpoint of an ordinary planning agent who is primarily concerned with his perceived overall long-run well-being and not necessarily with the virtues. This perspective allows Plato to justify the value of law to a much wider audience because it shows law’s value in enabling long-run human planning in general. Such an audience can realize that accepting law’s authority is rational

because one is more likely to satisfy at least some of one’s perceived long-term interests by subordinating them to law than by relying on the power of one’s own reason to control one’s desires for short-term benefits. (Hatzistavrou 2018: 225)

But this account can also appeal to rulers by showing them that their own adherence to such a system of laws prevents them from developing the self-defeating akrasia of absolute autocrats (9.857AB). Such benefits can be recognized from many different perspectives and the development of such self-restrained attitudes in both subjects and rulers is an important precondition for the development of virtue. These benefits, however, do not support the natural law interpretation because unless these attitudes are accompanied by true beliefs about the good, they lack ethical value for Plato.

6.6 Women in Magnesia

In Magnesia, private families, marriages, and households are reintroduced albeit in highly regulated forms. As Susan Okin has argued, this tends to reduce women’s roles in some important social and political activities in comparison with those of women in Kallipolis’ first two classes (Okin 1979). In Magnesia, for example, women lack an independent right to own property, and are excluded during their childbearing years from certain social and cultural activities, apparently on the assumption that they are to stay at home (e.g., 6.785B). (Of course, no citizen in the auxiliary or ruling class had a right to own property, but the Laws establishes a difference based on sex.) They participate, however, in military training and service and attend their own common meals (6.780D).

This entry cannot examine all the aspects of women’s political and social roles in Magnesia, but the following are the most fundamental issues. In Magnesia (as well as Kallipolis) women are citizens (7.814C) and the laws are intended to promote their virtue and happiness just as they do for men. In the Laws, Plato seems to hold that there is a single virtue for humans that makes both men and women virtuous and good (6.770CD, cf. 7.805A). Since they have a single virtue, women must share in the same education as men (7.804D3–805D). Plato also seems to think women are on average capable of more or less the same degree of virtue and happiness as men (7.806C). And there are passages that suggest that women share in eligibility, roughly equally, with men for participating in the selection of officeholders and in holding political offices (e.g., 6.785B).

But some scholars have argued that the Laws has a more pessimistic view of women for the following reasons.

  1. The Laws’ disparages women often enough to undermine the more optimistic passages (e.g., 6.781AB, although the Republic also has similar disparaging passages, e.g., Rep. 3.387E–388A, 5.469DE).
  2. Some argue that the Laws excludes women from almost all political offices because they are inferior in virtue.
  3. The Timaeus holds that women are reincarnated men who have lived badly (42BD, 90E–91A) and that the soul’s original and best state is male (41D–42B).[43]

Settling these disputes would require detailed examination of many passages. But the passages that support (1) and (2) are offhand remarks and it seems preferable to interpret them so as to be consistent with the above emphatic passages that claim that men and women share a single human virtue and that they are more or less equally capable of attaining virtue and happiness. If the Timaeus holds that women can only attain a vastly inferior form of virtue, it is inconsistent with both the Republic and the Laws.

Finally, in evaluating Plato’s views on women and the differences between Kallipolis and Magnesia, it is important to try to take into account the often significant differences between our contemporary background ethical views and those of Plato. For example, Magnesia’s denial to women of an independent right to own property may seem to us to diminish women’s well-being by excluding them from various property-related activities that they might otherwise choose to engage in and value and by preventing them from controlling sufficient economic resources to give effect to their choices about how to live. We may be right about this. But we must remember that Plato does not consider property management to be an especially valuable activity and that he does not accord the same value to a free choice of careers that we do.

Julia Annas memorably criticized Kallipolis’ proposals about women by claiming that they

are justified entirely by the resulting benefit to the state and not at all by women’s needs or rights … Plato is not interested in the rights of women, not in freeing women (or men) from the bonds of the family. What he is passionately interested in is the prospect of a unified and stable state in which at least some of the citizens work solely for the state’s good. The proposals about women and the family are means to that end … Plato the feminist is a myth. (Annas 1976: 320–1)

This criticism only has real force if we think that Plato has an organic conception of the city’s well-being such that it is independent of the citizens’ well-being. But as section 6.3 showed, this is not Plato’s view in the Laws (or the Republic) and the Laws’ rejects different education for men and women because

a lawgiver must be complete, and not half a lawgiver; letting the female indulge in luxury and expense and follow disorderly pursuits, while supervising the male, is to leave the city with only about half of a completely happy life, instead of double that. (7.806C)

The supervision and education of women (and men) is not a causal means to the independent outcome of a happy city. Such supervision and education is, Plato thinks, the best way to ensure that both develop virtue and attain happiness. The fact that the citizens’ happiness constitutes the city’s happiness is best explanation of why such education and supervision for women as well as men produces a completely happy life for the city.

6.7 Preludes and Education

In Plato’s own view, one of the most important innovations in the Laws’ political theory is the requirement that good legislators try to persuade the citizens and not simply issue commands to them by means of laws (4.722BC). In a series of passages from Books 4, 9, and 10, Plato introduces the notion of a “prelude” (prooimion) which is a way of achieving such persuasion.

He begins in Book 4 by appealing to a contrast between a free doctor who treats free people and slave doctors who treat other slaves. The latter, unlike the former, acquire the art of medicine by experience and not by studying nature. The slave doctors treat their slave patients simply by giving them orders, “like a tyrant”. Free doctors first try, as far as possible, to “teach” their free patients and do not give them orders until they have persuaded them (4.720BE). Plato unequivocally condemns the method of the slave doctor as “the worse and more savage of the two” and Magnesia must instead follow the model of a free doctor treating free people. It is obvious that the legislator cannot fully adopt the free doctor’s method and refrain from giving commands until he has persuaded the citizens to obey. The free doctor, of course, has no choice but to adopt this method. Neither Athens nor Magnesia (nor any other Greek city) allowed doctors to compel free adult citizens. Laws, however, must be enforced against those break them (cf. Rep. 8.557D–558C). In any analogy, the objects analogized will not have all the same properties. This difference in no way undermines the idea that the moral of this passage is that the legislator should follow the free doctor’s method to the extent of trying to persuade the citizens rather than merely compel them.

The Athenian distinguishes two kinds of prelude. First, he claims that the preceding books of the Laws constitute a general prelude to Magnesia’s legal code and he later requires that the entire Laws be read by all the citizens (7.811C–812A). Second, individual laws, other than minor ones, will receive their own preludes: in addition to the body of the law which specifies the offense and the attendant penalties, citizens will receive an account of why they should act as the law prescribes (4.720E–723D). It is important to note that the explanation we have just received of why persuasion and thus preludes are necessary is not merely a claim about what would be desirable in some ideal circumstances that will not obtain in Magnesia. Rather they are intended to justify and regulate the actual use of preludes in Magnesia.

Drawing on Plato’s programmatic remarks in Books 4, 9, and 10 the preludes should have the following features.

  1. What the person who is to be persuaded is asking for is to be “educated” or “taught”, that is, to be given good epistemic reasons for thinking that the principles supporting the law are true (9.885DE). At least some of them will use “arguments that come close to philosophizing” (9.857CE).
  2. What the legislator and the preludes actually do is characterized as “teaching”, that is, giving reasons to the citizens and bringing it about that they “learn” (4.718CD, 720D, 723A, 9.857DE and 10.888A).
  3. The preludes are thus designed to be instances of rational persuasion, that is, attempts to influence the citizens’ beliefs by appealing to considerations that are good reasons for the law that they are to follow. They are not intended to inculcate false, but useful beliefs, or to effect persuasion solely through non-rational means.[44]
  4. The preludes are meant to provide quite general ethical instruction. The legislator is to be a primary source of instruction about what is fine, just, and good (9.858D–859A). Thus the citizens will learn why the laws are fine and just and should also learn why following the laws and, more generally, acting virtuously is good for them. They are to receive a true and reasoned account of what is good for human beings.

But examination of the preludes that Plato provides shows that some seem to be instances of rhetorical persuasion that work primarily by appeal to shame and others—those to laws pertaining to murders that are especially heinous in that they are fully voluntary and committed out of desire for pleasure, or envy, and so on—work primarily by rhetorical means or by appeal to myths that Plato did not accept as literally true (e.g., 7.870D–871A).[45]

How are we to explain such a divergence? This is a fundamental choice point for the interpretation of Plato’s programmatic remarks and, more generally, for his intentions in the Laws. For Straussian interpreters, of course, it is simply Plato’s standard practice, on many basic issues, to write in such a way that the text’s easily accessible exoteric content conveys an edifying message for the masses and the vast majority of readers while the esoteric content, accessible only to a few, is very different. But the idea that Plato is engaged in deliberate deception is surprisingly common among more mainstream scholars. Karl Popper dismisses the preludes and Plato’s description of them as “largely lying propaganda” (1945 [1962: ch. 8, note 5 [139, 270]]), Laszlo Versenyi agrees that Plato’s account of the preludes is simply “deceptive” (1961: 69–70), and Glenn Morrow thinks that what Plato really is advocating in the Laws is “the suppression of reason” (1953: 244). (Nightingale 1993 is similar.) Richard Stalley more charitably suggests that “deliberate deceitfulness” is not the only option—we might equally well explain the divergence by “a waning of Plato’s own rational powers” (1994: 171 n. 65).[46]

There are two main lines of interpretation here. First, some scholars hold that Plato’s programmatic remarks do not accurately describe any of the text’s actual preludes (some allow a few rare exceptions) or other related social and educational practices.[47] Not all such scholars are as unrestrained in their evaluations as those noted above, but if the actual preludes rarely, if ever, accord with the programmatic remarks, then it is hard to avoid attributing to Plato the intent to deceive. This has significant implications for how to read Plato, but it specifically has important implications for the Laws’ political philosophy. Since Magnesian citizens are supposed to read the Laws itself and accept its claims as true, the intentional deception of its citizens is as such a fundamental feature of the Magnesian constitution. Attributing such deception to Plato is a high cost to pay, but determining its overall acceptability would require a comprehensive account of its other costs and benefits.

The other main interpretive option involves two claims.

  1. There are a variety of preludes in Magnesia and they vary in the degree to which they accord with the programmatic remarks.
  2. The programmatic remarks attribute an educational purpose to the preludes, so we must also consider the entire education of Magnesian citizens. This education, it is argued, is intended to develop true ethical beliefs that are supported by good epistemic reasons.

With respect to (1), there are at least three different kinds of preludes in the Laws.

  1. Those attached to specific laws.
  2. The great imagined preliminary address to the incoming colonists in Books 4 and 5 (723D–734E, called a prelude at 734E3).
  3. At 4.722C7-D2, the Athenian describes the entire preceding discussion that constitutes the dialogue itself as a prelude. At 7.811C–812A, the Athenian requires that the text of the Laws be read by all the citizens, so one might reasonably count the Laws itself as a prelude.

Interpretations of the preludes have focused almost exclusively on (A), but this is misleading and (A)–(C) vary in the degree to which they accord with programmatic remarks. To begin with (A), although the preludes are in general addressed to all the citizens, they often seem to have in mind those who are not in the best state with respect to the law. This condition might range from those who will gladly obey the law, but whose beliefs and desires are such that without the law they would have acted in a way that is inconsistent with it to those who are very strongly inclined to break it (7.823C–824A, 9.853D–854C, 11.922B–923C, 925D–926A). This is a wide range of conditions, but those in them are in some way defective and this will impede their being rationally persuadable. An example of a prelude that is directed to the highly defective is that to the laws concerning murders springing from the desire for pleasure or from envy. Here the Athenian recommends repeating stories from the mystery rites claiming that such wrongdoers will suffer the corresponding fate in a future reincarnation: parricides will be killed by their sons and so on. But as Trevor Saunders (1991: 210–11) perceptively notes, these stories follow a long and discursive prelude appealing to the value of virtue as opposed to external goods (9.870AD). These stories are directed to the worst of the Magnesians and are anomalous preludes. Persuasion by means of preludes has been contrasted with commands backed up by the threat of sanctions which gain compliance through fear of these sanctions. But these myths are mere threats in a more distant future and are explicitly intended to induce fear (9.870E).

Such cases do not show how all preludes operate, but Plato is sufficiently practical to realize that not all citizens will act rightly for the right reasons. He also thinks that people are psychically less badly off if they refrain from grievous wrongdoings out of fear of a penalty than if they commit them. Committing them only fosters their bad desires while refraining may even make them more amenable to better forms of persuasion. This does not undermine the idea that Plato intends to use preludes, as far as possible, to fulfill the programmatic goal of bringing citizens to do the right thing for the right reasons.

The Book 10 prelude contains sophisticated arguments. It is sometimes dismissed as anomalous and as the sort of rational argumentation that Plato would prefer to omit. But it is described as “the finest and best prelude for all the law” and it shows what preludes aspire to and can be (10.887BC). In Book 9, the Athenian’s second set of programmatic remarks (856B–859B) are immediately followed by a lengthy and sophisticated discussion of one of the most important issues in Plato’s penology, that is, how to reconcile the Socratic paradox still accepted in the Laws that no one is voluntarily (hekôn) unjust with the distinction essential to criminal law as a whole between voluntary and involuntary wrongdoing (859B–864C). It is not explicitly called a prelude, but given its position it serves as a prelude to criminal laws in general. The great prelude in Books 4 and 5 discusses the vital ethical issue of the relation between our human desire for pleasure and our desires for virtue and happiness. It distinguishes the features of pleasure and pain that are relevant to choice (their number, size, and intensity) and draws upon the Philebus’ understanding of false pleasures to argue for the superior pleasantness of the virtuous life (5.732E–734E).

The second main claim of this interpretation is that we must understand the preludes in the context of Magnesia’s general educational practices. Plato’s innovation in using preludes in the Laws merits the extensive discussion it has received in the literature. But in at least one important respect, this debate is misguided. The preludes are not the main source of Magnesian citizens’ ethical education. The study of the Laws’ text and especially of the Book 10 impiety prelude plays a vastly more important role than the other preludes occurring in the text. But by the far the most important role is played by the general education provided to the citizens.

Early in the Laws, the Athenian claims that well-educated children will turn out to be good people and thus that it is of great importance for a city to educate its citizens well (1.641B). Magnesia’s educational program begins with gymnastics, music, and dancing. Music and dancing play a lifelong role in citizens’ lives and from age six onwards, all citizens belong to one of the city’s choruses (2.664CD, Pageau-St-Hilaire 2023). Choral performances and their elements, such as postures and melodies, are imitations of characters (2.655D–656A). By taking pleasure in choral elements that are imitations of virtuous characters, a person becomes assimilated to such characters (2.656B). The approved poetry proclaims fundamental ethical truths, but distinct from the words, the orderly structures of some forms of music can both have or represent value properties. Fineness is what makes music correct, (2.667C, 668D), and fineness is understood in terms of the mathematical properties of the sound’s structure (2.668BE, 670B–671B, Phil. 17BE, 25D- 26C). Correct music thus gives citizens a first grasp of value properties that is refined by the rest of their education.

In addition to music and dance, children are given a literary education, are taught to play the lyre, and learn arithmetic, geometry, and astronomy (7.809C–810A, 817E–818D, 820E–822D, 12.967D–968A). In arithmetic and geometry, the Athenian emphasizes how shameful it is for the citizens to be ignorant (as so many Greeks then were) of the incommensurability of magnitudes (7.819E–820D). The situation is even worse in astronomy: there, the common belief that the planets wander rather than travel the same circular path is not only shameful but also impious, since it is a mistake about the gods’ nature (7.821A–822D). In grasping incommensurability, citizens grasp a non-sensible property that is essential for coming to grasp genuine value properties. The application of this geometrical knowledge in astronomy plays a crucial role in the Book 10 prelude. Grasping that the movements of the heavens are mathematically orderly is an essential step in the argument for the claim that the heavens are moved by virtuous gods.

It is unfortunate that those holding the first interpretation of the preludes rarely discuss Magnesian education and largely ignore its ethical philosophy. On the first interpretation, the unintellectual nature of the preludes shows that Plato simply intends to train Magnesian citizens by means of simple non-rational appeals to praise and blame and shame and honor so that they become steadfastly habituated into unreflectively holding and approving of commonsense ethical opinions. But the Conditionality Thesis which makes the value of all other goods conditional on virtue and which is the foundational principle of the Laws’ ethical theory is hardly an ethical banality that is endorsed by either ancient Greek or contemporary ordinary commonsense. Nor is the claim that the unjust person must live unpleasantly. All Magnesian citizens are to educated to accept both claims. The clash between these fundamental ethical claims in the Laws and commonsense ethical opinions is emphasized by the fact that the Athenian’s interlocutors initially reject them (2.659C–671A).

Finally, it is in the rationally most sophisticated of the preludes to specific laws, that to the impiety law in Book 10, that we find for the first time in the history of Western philosophy the claim that there is a single goal for humans as such that includes the happiness of all other humans. This is most decidedly not an opinion shared by most ordinary Greeks. Nor, on the other hand, is Magnesian education which includes, among other things, reading the text of the Laws, studying the Book 10 cosmology, and learning the geometry and astronomy required to grasp that the movements of the heavens are orderly plausible necessary means to bringing about unreflective acceptance of ordinary commonsense ethical views.

7. Theology and Ethics

7.1 Three Theological Theses

The Athenian opens the dialogue by asking Kleinias and Megillus whether god or some man is responsible for their laws, and they answer that, for each of them, it is a god (Zeus for the Cretans and Apollo for the Spartans). God is thus presented from the very start of the dialogue as the appropriate source of law and human institutions. (As many have noted, “god” is the dialogue’s first word.) This notion of god as the lawgiver or ruler for a city returns in Book 4, when the three are considering what sort of constitution to give to their new city: there, the Athenian claims that the best ruler for a city to have is god, and that they ought to imitate the rule of god by ordering their society in obedience to the immortal element within themselves, namely reason, which here will have the name of law (714A, cf. 6.762E, where service to the laws is said to be service to the gods).

God is also presented as the appropriate model for a human life. In the address to the new settlers, they are told that they ought to become like god, and that to do this is to become virtuous; in fact, the Athenian claims that god is the measure of human affairs, where this means that god, by possessing the virtues, embodies the standard at which we should aim (5.716CD).[48]

In the Laws’ early books, the Athenian often refers to the Olympian gods (e.g., 4.717A). But Book 10’s sophisticated theology takes up god’s existence and nature (especially the aspects of his nature relevant to ethics). The bulk of Book 10 is a prelude to the impiety laws, and consists of arguments against the following three beliefs that are the characteristic causes of impiety.

  1. The gods do not exist (10.885BC)
  2. The gods do not care for humans beings. (10.885BC)
  3. The gods can be influenced, contrary to justice, by prayers and gifts. (10.885BC)

The argument against (1) is at 10.886A–899C, that against (2) is at 10.899D–905D, and that against (3) is at 10.905D–907B. The argument against (1) has attracted by far the most attention. It begins with Kleinias offering brief versions of the teleological argument and the argument from universal consent for the existence of gods. The Athenian notes that there are “modern wise men” who reject these arguments and claim that alleged gods—the stars, the sun and the earth—are just material bodies (10.886A, see Sedley 2013). He proceeds to offer a version of the cosmological argument for the existence of gods, but the argument is much richer than standard cosmological arguments, since the Athenian first develops a detailed account of the particular atheistic position against which he will argue. Although his argument is intended to refute any denial of the existence of gods, it is aimed a specific form of such denial.

The argument tries to establish that there must be a first mover and that this first mover is a self-moving motion which the Athenian identifies with soul. Soul, however, is not merely the first mover of bodies (which are not self-movers), but continues to manage the motions of bodies. Given the mixed nature of the kosmos, some of which is orderly and some of which is disorderly, there must be at least two kinds of soul. The motions of the heavens are orderly and in this resemble the motions of intelligence (nous). From this similarity, the Athenian infers that the soul or souls in control of the heavens are good and completely virtuous (the other sort of soul that is responsible for disorder is bad). He then infers that the souls in control of the heavens are gods.[49]

The second sort of impiety—believing that the gods do not care for humans—is by far the least bad of the three impieties considered in Book 10. Those holding it accept the existence of the gods—because they have some kinship with the divine (10.899DE)—but come to believe that the gods do not care for humans when they see that unjust people and their descendants apparently flourish (10.899E–900Β, cf. Rep. 2.365D–366B). The refutation of this impiety is simply a matter of drawing the appropriate conclusions from the points established in the prior proof of the gods’ existence. There it was established that the gods care for the greatest things in the kosmos and that they are good and entirely virtuous. A craftsmen caring for the object of his art could neglect the small things while caring for the great things for only one of two reasons. First, he might think that the small things’ condition makes no difference with respect to the condition of the whole. But good human craftsmen know that this is not true and the gods’ understanding is much greater than that of humans. The other possibility is that the craftsman knows that neglecting the small things will make the whole worse, but does not care for the small things out of cowardice, idleness, self-indulgence, or because he acts akratically. All of these possibilities are excluded by the gods’ virtue. The Athenian leaves open here the extent of the gods’ power, since he explicitly notes that failing to supervise things that are not within one’s control is not a form of neglect (10.901C). (On this argument, see Meadows 2024.)

The third impiety is by far the worst (10.907B), and is quickly refuted, since the gods’ complete virtue is obviously inconsistent with their being bribed contrary to justice.

7.2 Theological Ethics

In the course of his defense of the claim that the gods care for humans, the Athenian addresses an imagined young man who holds the second impious belief and describes to him how the transcendental god has ordered “the All”, that is, the kosmos. In both Laws 10 and the Timaeus, the entire kosmos is a single Living Animal (zôion) that is a god. The ethical implications of this account have not been noticed, but are far-reaching. (This transcendental god who is identical with the Timaeus’ Demiurge is called “the petteia-player” in Laws 10 (petteia is an ancient Greek board game) because he has established a transmigration process for human souls).[50]

He [the petteia-player] who cares for the All has put all things in order for the whole’s salvation and virtue, and each part of it suffers and does what is befitting, as far it can. For each of these, rulers have been set up for every occasion over their suffering and activity down to the smallest aspect, and they have achieved their end to the last detail. [I] And one of these is your part, stubborn one, and it always strives and looks towards the All, although it is entirely small. But this very thing has escaped your notice, that all generation comes into being for the sake of this: that a happy existence might belong to the All’s life—it does not come into being for your sake, but you for its sake. [II] For every doctor and every skilled craftsman does everything for the sake of a whole, he creates a part that strives for what is best in common, for the whole’s sake, and not the whole for the part’s sake. [III] But you complain, ignorant of how what concerns you turns out to be best for the All and for you, by the power of common generation. (10.903BD, Roman reference numerals added.)

The petteia-player’s telos or ultimate end in ordering the All and its parts is the All’s best overall condition, that is, the All’s having a happy life and being virtuous (10.903B–904B). (Comparison of this goal with the legislator’s goal of maximizing city’s happiness shows that maximizing the good is fundamental to Plato’s conception of practical rationality.) Platonic teleology is intentional, so this telos applies to each part of the All and its actions. The above passage commits Plato to:

A1
For each human, the petteia-player has established for all her actions the telos of the All’s best condition, and
A2
The Coincidence: For each human, the same outcome is overall best for her and overall best for the All.

[I] and [II] support A1. [I] describes the telos as the All’s happiness. [II] and [III] understand this in an optimizing sense and [III] supports A2.

A1 is clearly a form of consequentialism. The All’s best condition provides a fully agent-neutral end: it is the same not only for every Magnesian, but for every human (and for every part of the All, including the stars). Plato here for the first time explicitly establishes a single goal for humans as such and eliminates the possibility that the ethical and rational standards applying to different individuals and groups might conflict. To see how novel this is, consider Richard Kraut’s rejection of similarities between Plato and Aristotle and modern teleologists:

neither Plato nor Aristotle are cosmopolitans … it never enters their heads that everyone should maximize the good, whether the intended beneficiaries … are fellow citizens or not … they always assume that a good person benefits fellow citizens. (2005: 450; Kraut’s position has changed, but this view remains widespread.)

There is much to examine here, but two issues are especially worth considering. First, does A1 suggest that Plato has abandoned Rational Eudaimonism and instead thinks that every human should make her ultimate end, not her own happiness, but rather the happiness of the All? This does not seem to be the case. The Athenian’s discussions of the Coincidence recognize the individual’s existence as a distinct part and the individual’s viewpoint which is concerned with what is best for herself (10.903C–905D). He never suggests that this viewpoint is mistaken because it is partial and never suggests that a fully rational person should transcend it and promote instead the All’s best condition.

Second, why does the Coincidence obtain and what difference does accepting A1 and A2 make to individuals? The Coincidence obtains because of the power of “common generation”. Unexplained here, this refers to the Timaeus’ idea that human souls originate from a less pure form of the same “stuff” as the World Soul (41DE), although they do not form a “group” soul with it or perish by absorption into it. Human souls retain their individual identities throughout all their transformations (10.903D–905C). Given their common origin, human souls and the All’s soul have similar natures and thus similar goods. Indeed, the All’s virtue and happiness are partially constituted by the virtue and happiness of its human parts (10.904B, cf. 902A–903A).

The Coincidence entails that the best outcome for me is always part of the All’s best outcome. So, the course of action recommended by Rational Eudaimonism and that required by my telos are always the same. Further, Book 10 presents this not merely as a striking theoretical finding. It is, rather, a central part of citizens’ education, and so must be intended to shape how Magnesians think of themselves. By grasping A1, a person comes to see that her innate constitution includes a tendency to strive for the All’s best state. By also grasping A2, she comes to see this as an innate tendency to strive for what is best for herself.

The Athenian’s statement of A1 and Book 10’s emotive descriptions of the All seem intended to encourage citizens to value the All’s best condition for its own sake and, since this is partially constituted by the good condition of all other humans, also to value their good condition for its own sake. We may be able to reconcile this with Rational Eudaimonism adopting a strategy used to argue for the compatibility of Rational Eudaimonism with valuing virtue for its own sake. On such a view, the person would count as part of what is best for her the disposition to act to advance the All’s best condition for its own sake. Living virtuously is necessary for contributing optimally to the All’s best condition, and seeing it as choiceworthy because you value the All’s best condition for its own sake can be part of what it is to be happy in the same way that seeing virtue as good for its own sake can be part of what it is to be happy. This gives the person a new way of seeing her virtue and a new and additional motivation for being virtuous which is still compatible with believing that virtue is good in itself for her. (For further discussion, see Bobonich 2023a.)

There is a final important way in which the Book 10 prelude is supposed to affect how the virtuous person sees herself. Since the petteia-player and the intracosmic gods aim at the virtue and happiness of the All for its own sake and, as we have seen, the reflective virtuous person does so as well, living virtuously is to share a common goal with the gods in advancing cosmic virtue and happiness (10.906AB). Book 10’s theology is not necessary for showing that virtue is good in itself for its possessor: the Conditionality Theory does so without any theological premises. But this theology does show that just people and their virtue not only play a role in god’s plan, but that this role is significant in its aim and its nature.

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  • Zimmerman, Michael J. and Ben Bradley, 2019, “Intrinsic vs. Extrinsic Value”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Spring 2019 edition), Edward N. Zalta and Uri Nodelman (eds), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/spr2019/entries/value-intrinsic-extrinsic/>.

C. Other Bibliographies

  • Brisson, Luc, 2023, “Bibliographie Platonicienne 2022–2023”, Études Platoniciennes, 18. doi:10.4000/etudesplatoniciennes.2910

    [Brisson publishes comprehensive Plato bibliographies yearly. The one cited here was the most recent as of the December 2025 update.]

  • Saunders, Trevor J. and Luc Brisson, 2000, Bibliography on Plato’s Laws (International Plato studies 12), Sankt Augustin: Academia Verlag. Revised version of an earlier edition by Trevor J. Saunders; completed with an additional Bibliography on the Epinomis by Luc Brisson.
  • Schofield, Malcolm, 2016, “Plato’s Laws”, Oxford Bibliographies in Classics, R. Scodel (ed.), New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/OBO/9780195389661-0214.

Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

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Katherine Meadows <meadows@iu.edu>

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