Arguments for the Traditional Interpretation of 5.739E–740A

1. Ernest Barker in 1918 offered a reply to Natorp’s revisionary interpretation of 5.739E–740A.

   The passage seems to me to refer to the scheme of the Republic. The language may be loose; but it is hardly possible that Plato should mention incidentally, in one passage of a later work, a system entirely different from that of the Republic, and mention it, too, as a higher ideal … I cannot conceive that he should have casually mentioned a different ideal [i.e., different from Kallipolis] in a few words in an isolated passage of the Laws. Recognizing, as he now does, that the communistic ideal is one for gods or the sons of gods (739 B), Plato simply colours it more in retrospect than he had done in reality when he was writing the Republic … when he was hoping to see communism realized among men. The reference to ‘common farming’ in 740A seems to imply that in the scheme of the Republic land was to be held and farmed in common; while, as a matter of fact, Plato’s proposal [in the Republic] was that land should be owned and farmed in severalty by the farming class. Plato’s reference to the Republic would appear to be loose. (1918 [1960: 251 n.1 and 370–1 n.1])^[51]

   But it simply is not true that 5.739E–740A is in an incidental and casual context. It is part of the great and solemn prelude to the entire legal system of Magnesia (5.726A–734E) and it establishes a crucial part of the basic framework of Magnesia and of the Laws itself. Barker’s other point is simply that he cannot conceive taking the Laws seriously in comparison with the Republic and so he finds various ad hoc reasons to read away what the text clearly says. But the limitations of Barker’s imagination do not constitute an argument.

2. Charles Kahn offers several reasons for thinking that the Laws’ best constitution is that of Kallipolis.

   1. First, 5.739E–740A’s rationale for communal property and families in terms of unity is the same as the criterion for excellence in the city in Republic 5.462A–464E (Kahn 2013: 237). But it is obviously invalid to infer from the fact that unity is the supreme criterion of excellence in both the Republic and the Laws that the same constitution or city is ranked as best in both works. Indeed, since the community of property and families is presented in both the Republic and the Laws as the primary way to bring about unity, a city in which communism extends throughout it should be better than Kallipolis.
   2. Kahn’s second and third arguments consist of pointing to two other passages in the Laws in which the Athenian refers to Magnesian arrangements as second best and which Kahn takes to rank Kallipolis’ constitution as best. In the first, the Athenian claims that private property and family are a second best (7.807BC). But this no reason to think that Kallipolis is the best city, since it, of course, allows private property and families in what is by far the city’s largest class, the producers.

   3. Finally, in the third passage that Kahn points to, the rule of law is said to be “second” (deuteron, 9.875D3) with respect to the possibility of there being a human who knows what is best and is willing to do it in all circumstances, in particular, even when possessed of autocratic power:

      he would not need any laws ruling over him. For no law or order is stronger than knowledge, nor is it right for understanding to be subordinate, or a slave, to anyone, but it should be ruler over everything. (9.875CD)

      Kahn apparently thinks that the philosopher rulers of Kallipolis are such autocratic rulers unbound by any law and free to change any law. But this is a mistake as Julia Annas has convincingly shown (2017: 16–22; Rep. 4.445DE, 5.458BC). Insofar as the best city is one in which philosophers rule autocratically, it is not Kallipolis, but better than Kallipolis. This passage is thus further evidence that Kallipolis is not the best city of the Laws.

3. Mitchell Miller (2013: 15–16) has proposed that in Kallipolis “the ancient saying holds as much as possible throughout the entire city” because it applies to the first two classes. Miller appeals to Rep. 4.423E6–424A3 to justify this claim. But this evidence depends on a mistranslation of the Republic passage.^[52] In any case, although Miller’s reading of 5.739E–740A is grammatically possible, it is extremely awkward and unnatural. Also as Laks points out, the scope of the community of women and children is not presented “as a necessary limitation imposed upon a potentially universal principle … but as a consequence of the function of guardianship itself” (Laks 2022: 61). Further, even if we accept Miller’s reading of 5.739E–740A, this does not remove the inconsistency between the traditional interpretation and (a) the claim at 5.739E8–740A2 that in the best city land is held and farmed in common, and (b) the claim that the best city is inhabited by “gods or children of gods” (5.739D).

None of these arguments provides good reason to accept the traditional interpretation.