The Rule of Law

First published Wed Jun 22, 2016; substantive revision Wed Jun 17, 2026

The phrase “the rule of law” has to be distinguished from the phrase “a rule of law”. The latter phrase is used to designate some particular legal rule like the rule against perpetuities or the rule that says we must file our taxes by a certain date. Those are rules of law, but the rule of law is one of the ideals of our political morality and it refers to the ascendancy of law as such and of the institutions of the legal system in a system of governance. It speaks to the political demand of mutual subordination of ruler and ruled to law and legal institutions.

Over the past two millennia, rule of law thought has developed from its classical expression as an alternative to ‘the rule of men’ to an association with principles of a formal and procedural character that address the way in which a community is governed. The formal principles concern the generality, clarity, publicity, stability, and prospectivity of the norms that govern a society. The procedural principles concern the processes by which these norms are administered, and the institutions—like courts and an independent judiciary—that their administration requires. On some accounts, the rule of law also comprises certain substantive ideals like a presumption of liberty, respect for private property rights or observance of human rights guarantees. But these are much more controversial. And indeed as we shall see there is a great deal of controversy about what the rule of law requires and how those requirements are best articulated, honored and enforced.

1. One Contested Ideal Among Others

The rule of law is one ideal, or value, within liberal political morality: others include democracy, human rights, social justice, and economic freedom. The plurality of these values seems to indicate that there are multiple ways in which social and political systems can be evaluated, and these do not necessarily fit tidily together. Some legal philosophers (e.g., Raz 1979 [1977]) insist, as a matter of analytic clarity, that the rule of law in particular must be distinguished from democracy, human rights, and social justice. Theorists sometimes confine the focus of the rule of law to formal and procedural aspects of governmental institutions, without regard to the content of the policies they implement. But the point is controversial. As we shall see, some substantive accounts have been developed and championed which amount in effect to the integration of the rule of law with some of these other ideals.

The basic demand of the rule of law is that people in positions of authority should exercise their power within a constraining framework of well-established public norms rather than in an arbitrary, ad hoc, or purely discretionary manner on the basis of their own preferences or ideologies. It insists that the government should operate within a framework of law in everything it does, and that it should be accountable through law when there is a suggestion of unauthorized action by those in power.

But the rule of law is not just about government. It requires also that citizens should respect and comply with legal norms, even when they disagree with them. When interests are conflicting and plural, citizens should accept legal determinations of what their rights and duties are.

Another idea is that the law should be the same for everyone, so that no one is above the law and everyone has access to the law’s protection. There are two senses in which the requirement of access is particularly important. First, law should be epistemically accessible: it should be a body of norms promulgated as public knowledge so that people can study it, internalize it, figure out what it requires of them, and use it as a framework for their plans and expectations and for settling their disputes with others. Second, legal institutions and their procedures should be available to ordinary people to uphold their rights, settle their disputes, and protect them against abuses of public and private power. All of this in turn requires the independence of the judiciary, the accountability of government officials, the transparency of public business, and the integrity of legal procedures.

Beyond these generalities, it is controversial what the rule of law requires. Certainly, how best to specify the principles constitutive to the rule of law is highly contested: it has been labelled an “essentially contested concept” for that reason (Waldron 2002 & 2021). These controversies arise at least in part from how the rule of law is a working political ideal, as much the property of ordinary citizens, lawyers, activists, and politicians as of the jurists and philosophers who study it. The features to which ordinary people call attention are not necessarily the features that legal philosophers have emphasized in their academic conceptions. Legal philosophers tend to emphasize the following formal elements of the rule of law: rule by general norms (rather than particular decrees); rule by norms laid down in advance (rather than by retrospective enactments); rule by norms that are made public (not hidden away in the closets of the administration); and rule by clear and determinate legal norms (norms whose meaning is not so vague or contestable as to leave those who are subject to them at the mercy of official discretion). But these are not necessarily what ordinary people have in mind when they call for the rule of law. They often have in mind the absence of corruption, the independence of the judiciary, and a presumption in favor of liberty.

Contestation about what the rule of law requires is partly also a product of the fact that law itself comprises many things (see further §7.3), and people privilege different aspects of a legal system. For some the common law is the epitome of legality; for others, the rule of law connotes the impartial application of a clearly drafted statute; for others still the rule of law is epitomized by a stable constitution that has been embedded for centuries in the politics of a country. The classical opposition of the rule of law to the rule of men was founded on the opinion that “a man may be a safer ruler than the written law, but not safer than the customary law” (Aristotle, Politics 1988 [c. 350 BC], 1287b). More recently, others have been at pains to distinguish the rule of law from the rule of legislation, identifying the former with something more like the evolutionary development of the common law, less constructive and less susceptible to deliberate control than the enactment of a statute (Hayek 1973: 72 ff.). There is also continual debate about the relation between law and the everyday mechanisms through which the work of government is done. For some, official discretion is incompatible with the rule of law; for others it depends on how the discretion is framed and authorized (see further §7.2). For some the final determination of a court exemplifies the rule of law; for others, aware of the politics of the judiciary, rule by courts (particularly a politically divided court) is thought to be as much an instance of the rule of men as the decision of any other junta or committee (see Waldron 2002 for a full account of these controversies).

The fact that the rule of law is a controversial idea does not stop various organizations from trying to measure its application in different societies. Groups like the World Justice Project assemble criteria and indexes of the rule of law, against which the nations of the earth are ranked. Countries like Denmark and New Zealand rank at the top of the Rule-of-Law league and countries like Venezuela and Afghanistan at the bottom (see Other Internet Resources). The methodologies informing these indexes are contentious at best, but measures of this kind are tools used regularly by businesses when assessing country risk for foreign investments (see Barro 2000: 215ff; Ginsburg & Versteeg 2021). For these observers, the rule of law means the presence of functioning judicial institutions capable of enforcing contractual and other legal rights.

2. History of the Rule of Law

The rule of law has been an important ideal in our political tradition for millennia, and it is impossible to grasp or evaluate modern understandings without fathoming that long historical heritage. However, it is important too to appreciate that significant contributions to that heritage invariably were tethered to particular political, economic, social, cultural and geopolitical contexts. Still, in very broad brushstrokes, it is possible to tell the story of the rule of law ideal as one that begins with the ancients (Aristotle c. 350 BC), proceeds through medieval custodians who sought to distinguish lawful from despotic forms of kingship (Sir John Fortescue 1471), and is refined further in the early modern period in works of English (John Locke 1689; James Harrington 1656) and European (Niccolò Machiavelli 1517; Montesquieu 1748) political thought. Debates informing the foundations of American constitutionalism marked further significant contributions, as also did nineteenth-century theories of English constitutionalism (A. V. Dicey 1885). These developments in turn influenced twentieth-century conceptions of the rule of law that came to be associated with the emerging political philosophy of neoliberalism (F.A. Hayek 1944, 1960, and 1973). Analytic philosophers led the development of conceptual analysis of the ideal in the late twentieth-century (Joseph Raz 1977; §5), largely in response to secular ‘natural law’ interventions that laid the foundations for the now widespread practice of theorising the rule of law by reference to its constitutive principles (Lon Fuller 1964; §3). That scene of argument in turn catalyzed a range of other important trans-Atlantic interventions in the final decades of the twentieth century (John Rawls 1971; John Finnis 1980; Michael Oakeshott 1983; Ronald Dworkin 1985), again straddling political and legal thought.

The life of the rule of law in the twenty-first century is every bit as entangled with this heritage of exposition and argument (or aspects of it) as was its twentieth-century sibling. With a view to comprehending where have arrived—and why—some key themes within the trajectory just sketched should be highlighted.

2.1 Ancient Wisdom

Ancient thought on the rule of law posed the foundational political question of whether it was better to be ruled by the best man or the best laws. Yet even in Ancient Greece there was recognition this question did not admit of a universal answer: it depended not only on the type of law one was considering but also on the type of regime that enacted and administered the law in question (Aristotle Politics 1282b). Still, the argument was put that law as such had certain advantages as a mode of governance. Laws are laid down in general terms, well in advance of the particular cases to which they may be applied. There was recognition also of the association between the making of generally applicable laws and deliberation:

laws are made after long consideration, whereas decisions in the courts are given at short notice, which makes it hard for those who try the case to satisfy the claims of justice. (Aristotle Rhetoric 1354b)

Ancient rule of law thought acknowledged that some cases were so fraught with difficulty that they could not be handled by general rules. These cases required the focused insight of judges who were practitioners of epieikeia (sometimes translated as ‘equity’). But it was thought that reaching for this justice beyond the justice of the general law should be kept to a minimum, and legal training and legal institutions should continue to play primary a role in the way in which cases are disposed. Ancient consideration of the general desirability of rules and the role and practice of epieikeia continue to influence modern jurisprudence (see Scalia 1989 and Solum 1994).

2.2 On Arbitrariness and Property

Rule of law thought in the late seventeenth-century emphasised the importance of governance through “established standing Laws, promulgated and known to the People” as a contrast (and antidote) to rule by “extemporary Arbitrary Decrees” (Locke 1689: §§135–7). The term “arbitrary” and more specifically “arbitrary power” has been a staple of rule of law discourse since. The term “arbitrary”, of course, can mean many different things, as indeed recent scholarship has shown (Krygier 2019; Ahmed 2024). But when the rule of settled standing laws was distinguished from arbitrary decrees, the sense of arbitrariness in play was the arbitrariness of extemporary action: power exercised without notice, as if the ruler just figures it out as (invariably) he goes along. The central worry was unpredictability, not knowing what you can rely on, and being subject to someone’s

sudden thoughts, or unrestrain’d, and till that moment unknown Wills without having any measures set down which may guide and justifie their actions. (Locke 1689: §137).

This preoccupation with unpredictability famously informed the use in seventeenth-century political thought of the device of the ‘state of nature’ and the existential misery of being subject to others’ incalculable wills and opinions therein. The thought here was that your thinking might be different from my thinking, and it might turn out that your view of the relation between your interests and my interests and your property and my interests might be quite different from my view of the matter and quite different again from the view of the next person along. The whole point of moving from a state of nature to a situation of positive law—a system in which the declared law applies generally to all—was to introduce some predictability into this picture.

But note the entry also of property, specifically private property, into this picture: “The Supream Power cannot take from any Man any part of his Property without his own consent”, and any law that purports to do so is of no validity (Locke 1689: §138). Herein emerges the complication. The theory that property rights are prepolitical—that they precede entry into a political condition of the rule of general law(s)—was far from uncontroversial. Whether in the seventeenth-century or today, people disagree about the rival claims of labor and occupancy, they disagree about the background of common ownership, and they disagree about how much anyone may appropriate and how sensitive that appropriation must be to the needs of others (Nozick 1974; Tully 1980: 64 ff; for Locke’s awareness of the controversies, see Waldron 1999: 74–5).

By insisting that positive law is subject to a substantive constraint in favor of respect for private property, therefore, this particular strand of rule of law thought is irretrievably entangled with disagreement and robust argument. Because the idea of a natural right of property was controversial, so too has been the administration of any substantive legal constraint designed to advance and protect that position, then and now. And because this substantive constraint in its original rendering was supposed also to affect the validity of positive law (Locke 1689: §135), it would come to foster also disagreement about which positive rules of property are valid and which are not.

2.3 Separating the Powers

Those who engage with the ideal of the rule of law as an animating principle of constitutionalism often do so through the lens of the separation of powers—specifically, the separation of judicial power from executive and legislative authority (Montesquieu 1748: Bk. 11, Ch. 6). This important eighteenth-century contribution to rule of law thought insists the judiciary has to be able to do its work as the mouthpiece of the laws without being distracted from fresh decisions made in the course of its considerations by legislators and policy-makers. That the judiciary must also be independent from these other branches is another key tenet, especially to protect the ruled against the aggressions of those who rule (Shklar 1987: 4). This theory of the importance of the separation of legislative, executive and judicial powers had a profound effect on the American founding (see especially the work of James Madison, Federalist Papers, §47), and on the development of modern constitutional theory more generally.

These arguments about constitutional design were accompanied also by reflections on the value of legalism. In contrast to despotic governments, which tend to have very simple laws that are administered peremptorily and with little respect for procedural delicacy, it was thought that legal and procedural complexity could foster respect for people’s dignity. One formulation of this point, associating the latter with a monarchy ruling by law as opposed to despotism, put it in these terms:

In monarchies, the administering of a justice that hands down decisions not only about life and goods, but also about honor, requires scrupulous inquiries. The fastidiousness of the judge grows as more issues are deposited with him, and as he pronounces upon greater interests. (Montesquieu 1748: Bk. VI, ch. 1, p. 72)

This eighteenth-century emphasis on the value of complexity—the way in which complicated laws, particularly laws of property, provide shelter from the intrusive demands of power—has continued to fascinate modern theorists of the rule of law (e.g., Thompson 1975: 258–69). In that modern debate we hear echoes also of the doctrine that “things that depend on principles of civil right must not be ruled by principles of political right” (Montesquieu 1748: Bk. 26, ch. 15, p.510) . “Civil right”—or, in its modern equivalent, private law—is “the palladium of property” that should be allowed to operate according to its own logic and not burdened with the principles of public or political regulation. A failure of the rule of law in this specific regard, the argument goes, is likely to lead to the impoverishment of an economy as expectations collapse and owners’ incentives for production and enterprise are undermined (Montesquieu 1748: Bk. V, ch. 14, p. 61).

2.4 The Rules of (English) Constitutionalism

In the late nineteenth-century the division of constitutional labor just discussed was developed in an explicit rule of law—and English—direction. The catalyst was the growth in government itself, and with that growth the expansion of governmental power and forms of administrative law. These developments, one vocal opponent bemoaned, marked decline in respect for the rule of law; specifically, the retreat of the proud commitment of English constitutionalism to legal equality:

[W]ith us no man is above the law [and] every man, whatever be his rank or condition, is subject to the ordinary law of the realm and amenable to the jurisdiction of the ordinary tribunals. (Dicey 1992 [1885]: 114)

It is hard to argue with the principle of legal equality as a fundamental tenet of the rule of law ideal. However, this late nineteenth-century appeal for government officials and private citizens to be subject to the same “ordinary law” dispensed by the same “ordinary tribunals” rested on a denial of the differences between the two. Government officials are and often need to be treated differently in law than the ordinary citizen. They need certain extra powers and they need to be hemmed in by extra restrictions to ensure they can be held accountable for the actions they perform in the name of the community. For the ordinary person, by contrast, the rule of law generates a presumption in favor of liberty (§4): everything which is not expressly prohibited is permitted. For the state and its officials, however, we may want to work with the contrary presumption: that both may act only under express legal authorization (Waldron 2015; Merrill 2022).

Insistence on the rule of the “ordinary law” through the “ordinary courts” was directed also to specification of the conditions in which individuals could be denied their liberties of person and property. According to this view, the first principle of the rule of law was:

[N]o man is punishable or can be lawfully made to suffer in body or goods except for a distinct breach of law established in the ordinary legal manner before the ordinary Courts of the land. (Dicey 1992 [1885]: 110)

This demand seems uncontroversial if we are talking about the imposition of criminal sanctions. But “made to suffer in … goods” can be read also to connote the imposition of legal restrictions on the use of personal or corporate property, or the giving or withholding of licenses, grants, and subsidies to pursue certain commercial activities. So understood, this claimed first principle of the rule of law could be read as precluding any form of discretionary regulation of property and commerce. The discretion point here is important: it was this late nineteenth-century formulation of what it means to have the rule of law (in England) that fostered the enduring preoccupation of modern theories of the ideal with the apparent perils of administrative discretion (§7.2). But is it really possible to do without discretion in modern governance? And should it always be cast as the villain of rule of law thought and practice as leading rule of law theorists of the nineteenth and twentieth centuries thought it should? Some modern scholars of administrative law have denounced theories of the rule of law that insist on the inherent arbitrariness of administrative discretion as “extravagant”, “absurd”, and pernicious versions of the ideal (Davis 1969: 27–32). Nonetheless, these prescriptions for the rule of law have remained remarkably resilient, especially in the polities of England’s former colonial empire.

2.5 On Rules, Judges and Markets

The trajectory of thought that aligns the rule of law ideal with the rule of “ordinary” (or common) law administered by courts—and which is suspicious of discretionary governmental interventions of all kinds—developed in a series of influential directions in the middle decades of the twentieth-century. The first found expression in the argument made towards the end of World War II that the kind of administrative governance to enable total mobilization and management of society’s manpower and resources needed in wartime must not be allowed to extend to peacetime (Hayek 1944). According to that argument, in normal times a society should be governed—and its people largely left to their own devices—within a framework of general rules laid down in advance. These rules would operate impersonally to protect people from one another, not being aimed at any person or situation in particular and not being dependent for their operation on any expectation on the part of government as to what the specific effects of their application would be. Any lack of particular knowledge on the part of the government would be offset by the fact that rules would provide a framework of predictability for ordinary people and businesses. The condition achieved would be one in which all would know that they would not be molested by the state, provided they operated within the parameters of the general and impersonal rules.

This was and is not a conception of human freedom that precludes all state action. However, it does require that state action be calculable. At least in its earlier formulations, these commitments led to an uncompromising, even polemical, view of the requirements of the rule of law. Commitment to the ideal in this version means that:

government in all its forms is bound by rules fixed and announced before-hand – rules which make it possible to foresee with fair certainty how the authority will use its coercive powers in given circumstances and to plan one’s individual affairs on the basis of this knowledge (Hayek 2007 [1944]: 117)

This overly simplistic but rhetorically powerful account of what it means to have the rule of law was toned down somewhat in the later decades of the twentieth-century. The focus remained on the implications of the rule of law for liberty (see further §4), but attention shifted to the work of (common law) judges and courts and the way that legal principles emerge incrementally through successive judicial decisions (St-Hilaire & Baron 2019: 10-16). The evolution of legal principles through this method was lauded also for a reasonableness superior to the deliberate imposition of rules by a legislator. Articulated rules, the argument ran, are “often a very imperfect formulation of principles which people can better honour in action than express in words” (Hayek 1973: 118). Moreover, the legislative mentality is inherently managerial, oriented in the first instance to the organization of the state’s own administrative apparatus rather than to the liberty of the individual or the wisdom of markets.

The thread uniting this trajectory of twentieth-century rule of law thought is the view that government (typically legislative) intervention into social and economic conditions is antithetical to the pursuit of freedom and a free people. The rule of law, on this view, is a critically important constraint on that encroachment. It takes little to see how this way of thinking about the rule of law and its essential demands became foundational to “neoliberal” versions of the same, standing opposed in-principle to “welfare state” policies and institutional arrangements and in favour of market-based solutions to the challenges of government (see further §7.1).

2.6 Eight Desiderata

Carrying forward aspects of traditional natural law thought into a twentieth-century secular jurisprudence, a further pivotal contribution to the development of rule of law thought as we now know it emerged from a project concerned with the formal, procedural and relational conditions in which law can possess the authority to rule. This project is associated also with certain claims about the incompatibility between such rule and the pursuit of injustice and oppression. This was and is not a conceptual claim about law as such, but rather a call to notice the tensions between legal processes and institutions on the one hand, and oppressive political pursuits on the other.

This argument met with controversy because the conventional wisdom of the by then dominant philosophy of law, legal positivism, was and is that laws can be impeccably drafted and even-handedly administered yet still be hideously oppressive and unjust: antebellum slave law in the United States and apartheid law in South Africa are often cited as examples. Resisting that conclusion, the thought advanced was that in practice there would be at least some reluctance to use the forms of state-source enacted law—general and public norms—to embody and inscribe injustices of this kind. At its most robust the argument put was that “coherence and goodness [had] more affinity than coherence and evil”: history had shown that bad things were more likely to happen in the dark than in the sunlight of legality, and that “even in the most perverted regimes there is a certain hesitancy about writing cruelties, intolerances, and inhumanities into law” (Fuller 1958: 636–7).

This link between legality and justice was tentative. And as already noted, it was controversial. But whether or not this connection held in practice, its most insistent proponent argued that a complete absence of respect for formal and procedural principles of legality might deprive a system of power (such as that seen in Nazi Germany) of its status as a legal order:

When a system calling itself law is predicated upon a general disregard by judges of the terms of the laws they purport to enforce, when this system habitually cures its legal irregularities, even the grossest, by retroactive statutes, when it has only to resort to forays of terror in the streets, which no one dares challenge, in order to escape even those scant restraints imposed by the pretense of legality—when all these things have become true of a dictatorship, it is not hard for me, at least, to deny to it the name of law. (Fuller 1958: 660)

The pathologies referenced in this passage were ultimately expanded and distilled into eight principles—or “desiderata”—for governing through enacted rules: namely, that such rules be general in scope and application, public, prospective, coherent, clear, stable, practicable, and there be congruence between official action and declared rule (Fuller 1969: 39). Though not described in those terms at the time, these eight desiderata quickly became synonymous with the basic requirements underlying the ideal of the rule of law (Rundle 2021; see further §3 and §5).

An often overlooked nuance in this foundational exposition of the conditions necessary for governing through law is that these eight principles speak to the particular legal form of enacted general rules. Yet law in that form might not be suitable to every task of governing. In the kind of complex administrative apparatus that has been part and parcel of government in polities across the world for many decades, enacted general rules and the adjudicative processes associated with their application and contestation might give way to other forms of ordering, including “managerial direction” (Fuller 1969: 207–213). In the 1960s when this thought was developed, as now, movements in political economy introduce challenges of institutional design that demand critical thought about choice of legal form. Law, in its most orthodox forms, is not good for everything. Though still at best an undercurrent in contemporary rule of law theory (see further §7.3), this invitation to critical thought reminds us that inquiry into the forms and limits of the law that does the ruling is an essential part of assessing what it means to have the rule of law, in theory and practice alike.

3. Specifying the Demands

Rule of law theory from the mid-twentieth century onwards has been closely associated with what are sometimes called “laundry lists” of its essential principles. These principles are of disparate kinds, but very often fall into three categories: those that address the formal aspects of governance by law, those that address its procedural aspects, and those that embrace certain substantive values.

3.1 Formal Aspects

Formal conceptions of the rule of law specify the form of the norms that are applied to our conduct. Perhaps the most familiar assemblage of formal principles are the demands of generality, publicity, prospectivity, intelligibility, consistency, practicability, stability and congruence (Fuller 1964; §2.6). This mid-twentieth-century list is widely regarded as foundational to subsequent attempts at specifying the formal demands of the rule of law, which have built upon or modified its eight desiderata (see Raz 1979 [1977]: 214–18; Finnis 1980: 270–1; Rawls 1999: 208–10; Waldron 2008: 19–36; Raz 2019: 3–8; Sunstein 2024).

The requirement that laws be general in character rather than aimed at particular individuals, for example, is purely a matter of form and its operation. Proponents of formal conceptions of the rule of law are quick to point out that generality on its own does not guarantee justice: it can be compatible with invidious discrimination so far as the substance of law is concerned. But that partly reflects the fact that justice and the rule of law work as separate criteria for evaluating a political system, rather than justice being a principle of the rule of law.

Generality is however an important feature of legality in other ways connected to notions of fairness or justice. For example, the longstanding constitutional antipathy to Bills of Attainder—where a legislative act is directed to a single individual or group rather than applicable generally—contains in it an association of sorts between generality and fairness. But generality has its limits too: law cannot work without particular orders, as indeed is demonstrated many administrative state arrangements that enliven and enforce legislation. But even here, the generality requirement is usually taken to mean that “the making of particular laws should be guided by open and relatively stable general rules” (Raz 1979 [1977]: 213). These operational rules also should operate impersonally and impartially.

Besides the form of the rules themselves, formal conceptions of the rule of law also address the nature of their presence in society. The rule of law envisages law operating as a relatively stable set of norms available as public knowledge. It requires that laws be public and that they be promulgated well in advance of individuals’ being held responsible for complying with them. These are features that flow partly from the fact that laws are supposed to guide conduct, which they cannot do if they are secret or retroactive. But this is not just a matter of the pragmatics of governance. It is important to see that laws face in two directions: (i) they impose requirements for ordinary citizens to comply with; and (ii) they issue instructions to officials about what to do in the event of non-compliance by the citizens. Laws that are secret and retroactive so far as (i) is concerned may still operate effectively in respect of (ii). So the rule-of-law requirements of publicity and prospectivity have an additional significance: they require that citizens be put on notice of what is required of them and of any basis on which they are liable be held to account.

The requirement of clarity is also an important formal principle of the rule of law. Laws must be public not only in the sense of actual promulgation but also in the sense of accessibility and intelligibility. True, much modern law is necessarily technical (Weber 1968 [1922]: 882–95) and the lay-person often will require professional advice as to what the law requires of them. Additionally, for some, it is also an important part of the rule of law that there be a competent profession available to offer such advice and that the law must be such as to make it possible for professionals at least to get a reliable picture of what the law at any given time requires. The nineteenth-century utilitarian philosophers leveled sharp criticism at customary law in general, and common law in particular, for failing to satisfy this requirement (Bentham 1782: ch. 15 and 1792). To their eyes the sources of law in the common law system were hidden in obscurity, leading to the charge that (appeals to precedent notwithstanding) much of the law was just made up by the judges as they went along. The utilitarians’ strong advocacy for legislated rather than judicial law-making, accordingly, comes as no surprise.

3.2 Procedural Aspects

The rule of law is frequently also identified with procedural specifications that complement the formal principles just discussed. We might say, for example, that no one should have any penalty, stigma or serious loss imposed upon them by government unless certain procedures such as the following (adapted from Tashima 2008: 264) are observed:

  1. a hearing by an impartial and independent tribunal that is required to administer existing legal norms on the basis of the formal presentation of evidence and argument
  2. a right to representation by counsel at such a hearing
  3. a right to be present, to confront and question witnesses, and to make legal argument about the bearing of the evidence and the various legal norms relevant to the case; and
  4. a right to hear reasons from the tribunal when it reaches its decision, which are responsive to the evidence and arguments presented before it.

Procedural principles of this kind arguably afford a distinct kind of legal agency—at once limiting and enabling—to those who interact with their prescriptions. Arguably, such principles matter more in the ordinary person’s conception of the rule of law than the formal criteria addressed in the previous section. When people worried that the American detention facility in Guantanamo Bay was a “black hole” so far as legality was concerned, for example, it was precisely the lack of these procedural rights that they were worried about. What the Guantanamo detainees demanded, in the name of the rule of law, was an opportunity to appear before a proper legal tribunal, to confront and answer the evidence against them (such as it was), and to be represented so that their own side of the story could be explained. No doubt the integrity of these proceedings would depend in part on the formal characteristics of the legal norms that were supposed to govern their detention, whose application in their case they could call in question at the hearings that they demanded. It is difficult to make a case at a hearing if the laws governing detention are kept secret or are indeterminate or are constantly changing. Even so, we miss out on a whole important dimension of the rule of law ideal if we do not also focus on the procedural demands themselves which, as it were, give the formal side of the rule of law this purchase. Each needs the other.

Some procedural requirements are also more institutional than strictly procedural in character. For example, consider the requirement that there must be courts and there must be judges whose independence of the other branches of government is guaranteed. This side of the rule of law connects to the constitutional principle of the separation of powers (see §2.3). That principle is sometimes justified simply on the ground that it is unhealthy for power to be institutionally concentrated in society. But it also has a rule of law justification inasmuch as it assigns distinct significance to distinct stages in the making and application of laws (Waldron 2013).

3.3 Substantive Theories

Although many jurists think that the rule of law is a purely formal/procedural ideal, cautioning that we must not equate the rule of law with the rule of good law (Raz 1979 [1977]; Tasioulas 2020), others believe the ideal is best specified as including substantive content on top of formal and procedural demands of the kind just reviewed. Proponents of substantive conceptions of the rule of law do not think it is possible to disentangle our political ideals in the way analytic philosophers propose, where the goods served by the rule of law (§5 below) belong to a different conversation than the one about specifying its core principles or demands. At the very least, they say, the formal/procedural aspects generate a certain momentum in a substantive direction. For example, the foundational demand of generality—proceeding according to the application of a general rule—is often said to contain the germ of justice (Hart 1961: ch. 8). And stability, publicity, clarity, and prospectivity suggest a strong, even fundamental, connection between the rule of law and conditions of liberty (see further §5).

The strongest version of the argument that the rule of law as such demands more than adherence to certain formal and procedural principles introduces respect for human rights into the ideal’s basic requirements. A system of positive law that fails to respect fundamental human rights, proponents of this view say, should not be dignified with the term “the rule of law”. It is very common to see jurists—especially those who have served as judges—fill out the formal/ procedural principles of the rule of law with additional human rights specifications in this way, and many liberals are inclined to follow them in that. Indeed, the human rights-inclusive specification of the core principles of the rule of law is dominant in the work of some non-government organizations, which often treat the rule of law and human rights observance as essentially interchangeable (see Other Internet Resources).

Respect for human rights however is not the only additional specification to appear in substantive theories of the core principles of the rule of law. Others make connections between the rule of law and a presumption of liberty, the principle of human dignity, or democratic institutions like the right to vote. Others believe that “[a] critical aspect of the commitment to the rule of law is the definition and protection of property rights” (Cass 2004: 131), while others again accept that “[a]nalytically, the rule of law is … a separate conception from private property” (Epstein 2011: 10). But they think nevertheless that a contingent connection between the rule of law and private property can be established by showing that the forms of regulation about which defenders of private property are concerned tend to be forms of regulation that the rule of law, even on a more austere conception, prohibits. Any such claim to the special affinity between the rule of law and the vindication and support of private property is however just one contestable position among a plurality of others, each equally concerned to attach a deeper value to the rule of law ideal. That is, we have to be careful to distinguish between allegedly substantive requirements of the rule of law and specification of the deeper values that underlie and motivate the ideal, even in its formal and procedural requirements. This is in part because those deeper values are themselves likely to be plural and contested.

The analytic philosophy response to efforts to comingle the rule of law’s formal and procedural specifications with demands on the content of laws and the commitments of legal systems—to which we return in §5—is to object that the rule of law “is just one of the virtues which a legal system may possess and by which it is to be judged” (Raz 1979 [1977]: 211). We should not try to read into it other considerations about democracy, human rights, and social justice, they contend, because to do so would be to propound “a complete social philosophy” in the name of the rule of law. Given this view, it is unsurprising that rule of law scholarship in the late twentieth and early twenty-first century was heavily preoccupied with whether the ideal could be theorised adequately through the lean offerings of the analytic philosophy method. This pushback generated a range of views. Some argued for a “thick” definition that explicitly embraced the protection of human rights within its core principles. A state “which savagely represses or persecutes sections of its people”, one forceful interjection argued, cannot “be regarded as observing the rule of law, even if the transport of the persecuted minority to the concentration camp or the compulsory exposure of female children on the mountainside is the subject of detailed laws duly enacted and scrupulously observed” (Bingham 2010: 67). Others have offered a more nuanced variation of this position, insisting that if substantive content in the law is to be uncovered and mobilized by those in need of its protection—for example, in legal systems renowned for their discriminatory and structurally oppressive treatment of particular persons or groups—adherence to the formal and procedural principles of the rule of law is necessary to excavate it (Dyzenhaus 2010; 2026). Appraising the extent to which a given legal order realizes the rule of law—and how—is not a definitional exercise that can occur at a distance from how that legal order (or parts of it) works in practice.

Again, those concerned with conceptual clarity and distinctions say this. Once we open up the possibility of the rule of law having a substantive dimension in its own right, we inaugurate a sort of competition in which everyone clamors to have their favorite political ideal incorporated as a substantive dimension of the rule of law. Those who favor property rights and market economy will scramble to privilege their favorite values in this regard. But so too will those who favor human rights, or those who favor democratic participation, or those who favor civil liberties or social justice. The result is likely to be a general decline in political articulacy, as people struggle to use the same term to express disparate ideals.

4. The Value and Values Underlying the Rule of Law

Even if the principles of the rule of law address no more than the formal and institutional architecture for governing through law, we don’t value those principles solely for formalistic reasons. As just gestured to, a wide variety of claims can be and have been made about how and why the rule of law is valuable, in its own right (Sevel 2024). Most fundamentally, people tend to value the rule of law because it takes some of the edge off the power that is necessarily exercised over them in a political community. So much is clear from the message underlying the claimed distinction discussed above between the rule of law and rule by law. In various ways, being ruled through law means that power is less arbitrary, more predictable, more impersonal, less peremptory, less coercive even. Being so ruled establishes a mutuality of constraint between the ruler and the ruled, mitigating the asymmetry that political power otherwise involves (Fuller 1964: 39–40). It frames the relationship between ruler and ruled in a particular (and, many would argue, permissible) way.

The most common value pointed to in association with the rule of law is freedom. Observance of the rule of law, it is said, establishes an environment that is conducive to individual liberty (see further §2.5 above). On one formulation of this view, we value rule of law requirements like generality and impersonality because they free us from dependence upon others’ wills:

My action can hardly be regarded as subject to the will of another person if I use his rules for my own purposes as I might use my knowledge of a law of nature, and if that person does not know of my existence or of the particular circumstances in which the rules will apply to me or of the effects they will have on my plans. (Hayek 1960: 152)

The connection here made between law’s predictability and individual freedom is an enduring and important one (see further §2.2 above). Indeed, predictability is often cited as a cardinal rule-of-law virtue even among those who absorb “substantive” demands such as human rights guarantees into their specification of the ideal (§3.3). Here too it is thought that one of the most important things people need from the law that governs them is predictability in the conduct of their lives and commercial interests alike. These claims about the rule of law bring a certain air of reality to our discussions of freedom. Note also their frequent affiliation with the stability of business environments and the capacity to enforce contractual and property rights: as one theorist has put it, “[n]o one would choose to do business … involving large sums of money, in a country where parties’ rights and obligations were undecided” (Bingham 2010: 38). There may be no getting away from legal constraint in the circumstances of modern life, according to this view, but freedom is possible nevertheless if people know in advance how the law will operate and how they must act to avoid receiving its punitive application. Knowing in advance how the law will operate enables one to make plans and work around its requirements (see Hayek 1960: 153 and 156–7). And knowing that one can count on the law to protect property and personal rights gives each citizen some certainty about what they can rely on in their dealings with other people. The rule of law is violated, on this account, when the norms that are applied by officials do not correspond to the norms that have been made public to the citizens or when officials act on the basis of their own discretion rather than norms laid down in advance. If action of this sort becomes endemic, then not only are people’s expectations disappointed, but increasingly they will find themselves unable to form expectations on which to rely, and the horizons of their planning and their economic activity will shrink accordingly.

So, this line of thought runs, a functioning rule of law order gives us a legal basis for our expectations. The nineteenth-century utilitarians, advocating for law in the form of a civil ‘code’ rather than judge-made common law, argued that establishment of expectations—the “chain which unites our present existence to our future existence”—is largely the work of law. Moreover, they considered security of expectations to be a vital constraint on the action of law: “The principle of security … requires that events, so far as they depend upon laws, should conform to the expectations which law itself has create”:

It is hence that we have the power of forming a general plan of conduct; it is hence that the successive instants which compose the duration of life are not isolated and independent points, but become continuous parts of a whole. (Bentham 1931 [1802, 1864]: 111)

Others however have pushed the ‘values’ conversation in the direction of affinities between observance of the rule of law and respect for human dignity. The argument here aligns the predictability afforded by the rule of law with “treating humans as persons capable of planning and plotting their future” (Raz 1979 [1977]: 221). Another perspective locates respect for human dignity specifically in the formal and procedural principles through which the rule of law is operationalised, for how these address the legal subject as “a responsible agent, capable of understanding and following rules”. On this view, departures from observance of formal and procedural rule of law principles is an affront to the subject’s dignity as a responsible agent, such that “to judge his actions by unpublished or retrospective laws, or to order him to do an act that is impossible, is to convey … your indifference to his powers of self-determination.” (Fuller 1964: 162)

More still has been said about the connection between legal procedure and dignity. The contention advanced is that procedural principles capture a deep and important sense that law is a mode of governing people that treats them as though they had a perspective of their own to present on the application of norms to their conduct and situation (Waldron 2012). Applying a norm to a human individual is not like deciding what to do about a rabid animal or a dilapidated house. It involves paying attention to a point of view. As such it embodies a crucial dignitarian idea—respecting the dignity of those to whom the norms are applied as beings capable of explaining themselves.

5. The Conceptual Turn

The discussion in §3 hinted at the significance of the sub-field of theoretical inquiry into the rule of law that sets out to illuminate the essential features of the ‘concept’ of the rule of law. Sponsored by scholars of analytic philosophy and its effort to illuminate the distinctiveness of different concepts, the seeds for this conceptual turn can be traced to mid-twentieth-century debates about the existence conditions for law and legal systems (Hart 1961; Hart 1965; Fuller 1958, Fuller 1964). At the centre of those debates was the claim that at least some observance of formal principles of the rule of law (of the kind discussed in §3.1) is necessary for law itself to exist. The controversy attending this claim derives from the core tenet of the school of legal positivism known as the ‘separability thesis’: the argument that moral considerations do not figure in determining the existence of law. If at least some observance of the principles of the rule of law is necessary for law itself to exist, the separability thesis must be wrong. The reason why is because positivists and non-positivists alike agree that principles of the rule of law, when observed, are a good and valuable thing (Hart 1961: 207; Raz 1979 [1977]). But, the positivist response insists, this does not mean laws produced in accordance with such observance are necessarily moral or good. Rather, the only good secured by observing the principles of the rule of law is an instrumental one: its contribution to making lawgiving and law-applying effective, however moral or immoral the purposes of that enterprise might be (Hart 1965).

The hallmark of the ‘non-’ or ‘anti-positivist’ response to this argument is that a purely instrumental analysis of the value of observing the principles of the rule of law is necessarily incomplete. Members of this camp insist that, in addition to their instrumental value, compliance with the principles of the rule of law constitutes respect for the freedom and dignity of the agents addressed by the law, making possible a distinctive mode of governance that works through ordinary human agency rather than short-circuiting it through manipulation or terror. Some also argue that formal principles of the rule of law are moral in a sociological sense for how they constitute a ‘role morality’ that law-givers and law-appliers must fulfil to create and sustain law as a distinctive mode of governance (Fuller 1969: 239). There is a connection between these positions and claims made by non-positivists when addressing the matter of unjust or oppressive laws and legal orders. The argument here is that even the most bare-boned realisation of the principles of the rule of law has a disciplining effect on how power is wielded in unjust and oppressive conditions. As one adherent to this view puts it, “a tyranny devoted to pernicious ends has no self-sufficient reason to submit itself to the discipline of operating consistently through the demanding processes of law, granted that the rational point of such self-discipline is the very value of reciprocity, fairness, and respect for persons which the tyrant, ex hypothesis, holds in contempt” (Finnis 1980: 273).

5.1 The ‘Virtue’ of the Rule of Law

The most important effort to refashion philosophical engagement with the rule of law into a conceptual exercise saw debates about the existence conditions for law and legal systems reworked into arguments about the relation between the concept of ‘law’ on the one hand and the concept of ‘the rule of law’ on the other (Raz 1979 [1977]). The challenge for this agenda was the same as that faced in its earlier iteration, namely, to acknowledge the value of the rule of law without undermining the central tenet of legal positivism that the existence of law and legal systems can be ascertained by facts alone. The most famous reply to this challenge comprises three arguments, and, owing to its influence, ought to be teased out in full.

The first is an evocative repackaging of the claim that the instrumental value of observing the principles of the rule of law is morally neutral. The rule of law is the “virtue” of law, this argument runs, in the same way sharpness is the virtue of a knife. Just as a knife can be used for moral and immoral ends alike, so too can law (Raz 1979 [1977]: 225).

The second and third arguments wrestle with the viewed shared by positivists and non-positivists that commitment to the rule of law promotes respect for individual autonomy and dignity by supplying the kind of stability and predictability around which individuals can plan their lives. To defend the separability thesis in the face of this acceptance requires showing how observance of the morally valuable principles of the rule of law is not necessary for law and legal order to exist. Presentation of the rule of law as a political ideal goes some way towards answering this challenge: a contingently realizable ideal (the rule of law) cannot be a necessary condition for something else (law). Still, more is needed to meet the objection that at least some observance of something like the formal principles of the rule of law is needed to establish the basic institutions and practices on which functioning a legal order depends. The answer to this challenge came in the form of the two arguments. First, even if all legal systems must be founded on rules that establish their basic institutions, the level of compliance with the principles of the rule of law needed to secure those foundations is so minimal as to be morally insignificant. Second and in any event, the rule of law is ultimately a “negative” virtue: it merely offsets or corrects evils that only law could have created (Raz 1979: 224).

The combination of these second and third arguments has generated considerable pushback from ‘non-positivists’ who regard them as unsatisfying answers to the analytically important question of whether principles of the rule of law must be observed for law and legal orders to exist (Murphy 2005: 246–252; Waldron 2008: 11; Simmonds 2010: 285; Rundle 2013: 779–782). Still, almost five decades on, neither of the ‘minimal compliance’ or ‘negative virtue’ arguments has been seriously re-examined by philosophers of legal positivism (Raz 2019). That orthodoxy insists the conceptual relation between law and the rule of law was settled in the late 1970s.

5.2 Observations on the Conceptual Turn

The conceptual turn in rule of law theorization has catalyzed a range of inquiries aimed at fleshing out other dimensions of the ideal. These have included investigating whether the law in the rule of law is best understood as a “functional” or “modal” concept (Gardner 2012), ways in which theories of legal reasoning interact with conceptual analysis of the rule of law (MacCormick 1994 & 2023), and how the ideal might be squared with aspirations to substantive equality (Moreau 2024). Definitional preoccupation with how best to label to the essential principles of the rule of law (§3) has largely retreated in recent years while attempts to specify those principles have given increasing emphasis to the institutions needed to pursue and sustain the ideal in practice (Waldron 2008; Raz 2019). One cannot help but notice temporal connections between these shifts and ‘real world’ worries about decline in fidelity to traditional rule of law institutions (see further §8).

The conceptual turn in rule of law thought has been productive also in the provocative sense, generating efforts to develop and defend alternate methods and agendas of analysis (Sempill 2024). “Teleological” approaches that insist theoretical inquiry into the ideal is best led not by conceptual investigation into what the rule of law is, but rather by the question of what the rule of law is meant to do, have been especially influential (Krygier 2008). In a different direction but equally concerned about the limits of conceptual analysis are approaches that revisit the original preoccupations of the mid-twentieth-century debates that led ultimately to the ascendance of conceptual analysis of the ideal, reworking those original preoccupation into inquiries about what it is to be a subject of law rather than mere power, and what quality of official-subject relations is needed for the rule of law to materialise in whole or in part (Foran 2019; Raz 2019: 13; Rundle 2022: 59–61; Dyzenhaus 2022: 32–33 & 341–346). Others have sought to augment conceptual inquiry with empirical methods rather than displace it entirely (Gowder 2016)

Three high-level observations therefore might be made about the character and significance of the conceptual turn in contemporary rule of law theory.

The first, made plain in arguments favouring the conceptual separability of inquiry into the existence conditions for law and the existence conditions for the rule of law, is that some of the most well-known arguments about the rule of law in contemporary legal philosophy have never been about the rule of law alone. They have been contributions also to debates in general jurisprudence about the nature of law itself and the methods through which that inquiry is best undertaken (Dworkin 2004: 24–5; Waldron 2008; Rundle 2022: 21).

The second is that the effort of analytic philosophers to dis-connect the rule of law from other political and legal ideals so as to analyze the concept in isolation marks a notable departure from much of the history of rule of law thought (§2). In that history it was more typical for formulations of the ideal to emerge as a dimension of larger projects and inquiries—as theories within theories—than to be the centerpiece of those inquiries. The conceptual turn in rule of law theorisation, accordingly, has generated a significant shift in how the ideal has been treated as a subject of philosophical investigation.

The third observation, which follows from the second, concerns the implications of this conceptual turn for how earlier rule of law thought tends today to be presented. It is now very common to see those earlier treatments reverse-engineered into “accounts” of rule of law “principles” (usually “formal”: see §3) better suited to conceptual analysis and debate (see e.g., Tasioulas 2020: 121, 126). Although this move might serve the clarity and development of a particular and ascendant mode of philosophical inquiry into the rule of law and its various attributes, it is important nonetheless to see that it does so at the risk of obscuring the methodological, substantive and contextual specificities of the original offerings.

For better or for worse, few contributions to theorizing the rule of law ideal today can avoid being touched, in some way, by how the conceptual turn precipitated by analytic philosophy has shaped the assumptions made, methods used, questions asked, and arguments advanced about this central idea of political and legal thought.

6. The Rule of Law versus Rule by Law

Some theorists draw a distinction between the rule of law and what they call rule by law (see e.g., Tamanaha 2004: 3), celebrating the first and warning of the dangers of the second. The concern driving the distinction has to do with the extent to which law’s rule is thought to discipline politics. The rule of law is supposed to lift law above politics: the law should stand above every powerful person and agency in the land. Rule by law, in contrast, connotes the instrumental use of law as a tool of political power. It suggests the state uses law to control its citizens but tries never to allow law to be used to control the state. For these reasons, rule by law is commonly associated with the debasement of legality by authoritarian regimes, in modern China for example (Seppänen 2016; see further §8.4). The thought here is that law is present in the sense that its pedigree requirements have been fulfilled: for example, legislation is enacted by a recognized lawmaking institution, or executive decrees are issued by a person with legal authority to do so. But (the argument goes) the rule of this pedigree-compliant law does little or nothing to constrain political power in favor of the agency of the ruled.

The rule of law / rule by law distinction has deep historical roots. Early modern political thought, in particular, saw the argument that in a society whose members disagree about property, it was conducive to peace for the sovereign “to make some common Rules for all men, and to declare them publiquely, by which every man may know what may be called his, what anothers” (Hobbes 1647: Bk. II, ch. 6, sect. ix). The accompanying thought, however, was that it would undermine peace—indeed it would undermine the very logic of sovereignty—for the ultimate law-maker to be bound by the laws he applied to his subjects (Hobbes 1991 [1651]: 184; see Dyzenhaus 2021 for a contrary view). Yet in practice the claimed distinction between the rule of law and rule by law is unlikely to be clear-cut. At a minimum, even rule by law seems to imply that rulers accept something like the formal disciplines of legality. Unless the orders issued by the state are general, clear, prospective, public, and relatively stable, for example, the state is not ruling through law. So, the argument runs, even this thin or “formal” (§3.1) version of legality arguably has moral significance in the weight it gives to the human need for clarity and predictability. Rule by law “can be a way a government … stabilizes and secures expectations” (Goodpaster 2003: 686). Even if its use remains instrumental to the purposes of the state, such rule still implicates a certain bond of reciprocity towards the those who are so governed in the sense that the latter are assured that the promulgated rules are the ones that will be used to evaluate their actions (Fuller 1964; Winston 2005: 316).

One way to navigate the supposed distinction between the rule of law and rule by law, therefore, is to ask this. What is the ‘of’ in the rule of law doing that the ‘by’ in rule by law is not? This question is useful because it brings into focus the direction of legal obligations within each. Rule by law demands nothing (or very little) by way of legal obligations on the part of the ruler, beyond a need to comply with the formal requirements (§3.1) necessary to govern through law. The rule of law, by contrast, requires that obligations towards law apply equally to ruler and ruled (Rundle 2022: 7–8).

6.1 Rule of Law, Rule by Law, or a Continuum of Legality?

Even this more nuanced rendering of the rule of law / rule by law distinction may still be insufficient for those who question whether binaries of this or any other kind can ever correspond with the life of legal rule in practice. One answer to this question says we might do better in sharpening our understanding of the conditions in which legal orders (or parts thereof) thrive or come to be debased if, rather than label them as instances of the rule of law or rule by law, we map them instead along a “continuum of legality” (Dyzenhaus 2022: 32–33). Developing the intuition that the legal quality of legal rule can become so attenuated as to turn what was once a system of legal rule into something else altogether (Fuller 1958: 660; see further 2.6), the thought is not that we should dispense with the ideal of the rule of law altogether for how its idealized content fails to comprehend or guide many ‘real world’ conditions of legal rule. The thought instead is that it is productive to introduce more nuance into the discussion, particularly when examining how subjects are positioned in relation to power at different points along that continuum, and whether and to what extent they can turn to the law to protect themselves against such power. This more nuanced lens, attentive especially to what is happening to subjects within particular legal arrangements, is especially illuminating when examining histories of sustained discrimination and oppression through legal means (O’Regan 2024). Others have adopted the vocabulary of “partial rule of law states” to make a similar point (Gowder 2024), or to motivate greater attention generally to why it persistently has been the case that certain people are missing from – or missing out within – rule of law theory and practice alike (Rundle 2022: 53–65; see also Munro 2021; Bridges 2021).

6.2 The Rule of Men Repackaged?

Coming at the distinction from a different angle, some jurists maintain the contrast between the rule of law and rule by law have a more ambitious agenda to do with the ancient idea that we are best ruled by laws and not by men. They point to a puzzle: how is that we can have the rule of law rather than the rule of men when all law is made by people, interpreted by people, and applied by people? Law can no more rule us without human assistance than a cannon can dominate us without an iron-monger to cast it and an artilleryman to load and fire it (though see §7.7 for how the rise of AI and automation may problematise this point). Jurists who contrast the rule of law with rule by law with this ‘rule by men’ concern in mind believe they can reconcile these tensions by focusing on laws—like customary law or common law—whose human origins are in some way diffuse or immemorial rather than a top-down product of human law-makers (Epstein 2011). These jurists typically laud the English common law tradition for how it grows and develops under its own steam, and therefore stands in contrast to institutional arrangements that see an identifiable group of humans rules over others. No doubt there is a lot of mythology in this elevation of the English common law, as indeed the eighteenth-century utilitarian philosophers were at pains to point out. A more realistic view of common law, said one such critic, was that it involved the deliberate and arbitrary rule of “Judge & Co” (Bentham 1792). Still, it remains true that the human element in this sort of system is diffuse, and that the law that emerges from it at any given time is the product of the incremental work of many people over timer, rather than the intentional product of a ruling entity at the legislative center of a state.

It is not hard to see how this thinking informs a corresponding suspicion towards legislation per se (Hayek 1973). Legislation enacted by elected legislators fundamentally is a matter of will: the legislative process produces law because the people assembled in a legislature decide that a given law is to be produced. On this view, the enactment of legislation seems patently and undeniably to represent the rule of the very men—powerful politicians—to whose power the rule of law is supposed to be an alternative. However, most people who value the rule of law do not accept this suspicion towards democratic will formation and decision-making, or at least not to the same degree. If a statute is properly drafted (if it is clear, intelligible and expressed in general terms, and prospectively enacted and promulgated), and if it is administered impartially and with due process, then most people will consider legislation an entirely appropriate exercise of lawmaking consistent with the ideal of the rule of law. Indeed that is what many scholars and laypeople alike mean when they use the phrase ‘the rule of law’: people being governed by measures laid down in advance in general terms and enforced equally according to the terms in which they have been publicly promulgated. The argument that legislation is somehow illegitimate and should be put aside because it does not contrast sufficiently with the rule of men seems, if not perverse, then at best an exercise in splitting hairs. After all, rule by judges, too, can sometimes be seen as the very sort of rule by men that the rule of law is supposed to supersede (see Waldron 2002: 142–3 and 147–8).

No one doubts that legislation can sometimes undermine the rule of law, by purporting, for example, to remove legal accountability from a range of official actions or to preclude the possibility of judicial review of executive action. But this is not a problem with legislation as such: it is a concern about either the content of particular enactments or the absence of effective oversight and accountability mechanisms.

7. Controversies, Provocations and Applications

The rule of law has attracted many other controversies associated with its formal and ideological assumptions, its practical applications, and its responsiveness to new political, legal and social challenges. Some of these are longstanding and have crystallized into enduring debates, while others remain at an early stage of articulation and development.

7.1 Opposition to the Rule of Law Ideal

No account of the rule of law is complete if it does not mention the ways in which the ideal is deprecated. The laudatory history of the rule of law (§2) has been matched by strident opposition to its logic and claimed offerings. Among the most enduring of these criticisms is the belief that rule-based government is rigid, politically dangerous, and inferior to the application of focused intelligence and insight by those in power (Plato, Statesman 1995 [c. 370 BC], 294b–c). Modern expressions of opposition to the rule of law tend to take on a more institutional flavour, attacking parliamentarism, for example, for its underlying misguided liberal assumption that rules can prevail even under conditions of endemic crisis (Schmitt 1923).

Two related things are going on here. The first has to do with the assumption that rule-based political order is rigid and unresponsive to the “almost permanent state of instability” that characterizes human affairs (Plato, Statesman 1995 [c. 370 BC], 294b). On this view one would use rules only as a (distant) second-best if one felt one couldn’t discern or trust the appearance of expertise in political life. This concern is echoed in the work of modern legal pragmatists who place much more faith in insights of judges into new situations than in the application of established rules or strained analogies with ancient precedents (Posner 1995).

The second has to do with a purported opposition between rules-based political order and the power of decision. Those advancing this argument insist decisive executive decision-making must prevail in times of crisis, especially if the crises seem to be successive and unending (Schmitt 1923; Posner and Vermeule 2010). In such situations someone’s will has to prevail and, it is said, the rule of law does us no service by pretending that this element of will can be eliminated from politics or that decisiveness matters less than the “long deliberation” extolled in ancient conceptions of good government (Aristotle, Rhetoric 2010 [c. 350 BC]).

There are concerns also about the mentality that is fostered by an excessive emphasis on the rule of law. In its most extreme form, this worry says that the rule of law can have the effect of closing down the faculty of independent moral thought in legal officials (the judges, for example: see Cover 1975) and ordinary members of a community, making them anxious in the face of uncertainty and distrustful of their own or others’ individual judgments (see Henderson 1990). For the sake of clear and courageous moral judgment, this thought runs, it is important not to exaggerate the significance of something being required by law. Other criticisms are directed towards legalism generally and the tendency to over-formalize or over-bureaucratize relationships that are more healthily conceived in informal terms. This is not just a matter of over-legalizing the personal or private realm. It is a matter also of appreciating the damage that can be done to relations between officials (like social workers) and vulnerable clients (like welfare recipients) when rigid rules replace more informal professional norms (Simon 1983; Raso 2017). To that end, new threats to and possibilities for the rule of law are fast emerging in now widespread practices of ‘digital government’: see further §7.7.

7.2 Discretion

Official discretion has long been the villain of rule of law thought. While some jurists insist discretion it is little more than arbitrary power in legal clothing (Dicey 1885; Hayek 1944; see further §2.4 and §2.5), others condemn this view as an extravagant position, arguing that discretion is ineliminable in the modern administrative state and that its rule of law worries can be resolved by ensuring official discretions are properly authorized and structured through legislation (Davis 1969). Indeed, this alternate view highlights the important work discretion can do, in the context of administrative decision-making, in securing individualized justice (Davis 1969: 4, 30).

Discretion is of course also a feature of judicial power—in the area of criminal sentencing, for example—though this species of discretion has generated fewer worries than that reposed in actors of the administrative state. This itself indicates something important about controversies concerning the extent to which it should be the mission of the rule of law to eliminate or reduce the amount of discretion in the way a society is governed; namely, that it is important to excavate and analyse what lies behind such controversies. We might ask, for example, whether suspicion towards official discretion stems from concerns about discretion as an un-rule-like form of law that offers its repository a sphere of choice between possible courses of action, or from antagonism towards the political project (a redistributive “welfare state”) and corresponding institutional apparatus (an “administrative state”) within official discretion is commonly found. This understory of the rule of law versus discretion debate has provoked strong pushback from those who insist we need not pit one against the other and that the rule of law and a redistributive “welfare state” can be reconciled (Jones 1958; Davis 1969; Scheuerman 1994). Treatments of discretion, accordingly, rank highly among the many controversies of rule of law thought that require some digging to uncover the nature and source of their concerns.

7.3 The Law that Rules

Earlier (§5) we saw that so long as the ideal of the rule of law concerns the rule of law, theoretical questions about the nature of law itself will always lurk in the background. This subsection however is concerned with something different. What assumptions are made in rule of law theory about the law that does the ruling?

This provocation has several dimensions. One has to do with the presumptive association between the rule of law and the rule of general rules (Radin 1989; Rundle 2022: 49–50). The issue here concerns whether this association might be outdated and need to be rethought. This question has both normative and descriptive aspects. Normatively, we might wonder whether good law-making and good legal administration necessarily is served by the default assumption that the rule of law means the rule of rules (McDonald 2004). Descriptively, the question asks whether accounts of the principles commonly associated with the rule of law (§3) are archaic and out of touch with how law actually operates in the modern world. Partisans of the rule of law often think of the law-based rule they advocate in terms of clearly drafted and prospective measures promulgated as norms that can stand in the name of the whole community and form a publicly acknowledged framework for their actions and transactions. Yet modern legislation has long-consisted of framework statutes that repose authority in executive branch agencies to develop much more detailed rules and policies for their administration (Rubin 1989). The modes of communication through which these administrative embellishments are conveyed to the public are also much more complex and nuanced than those envisaged in traditional theories of the rule of law (see §7.7 for how the rise of AI and automation plays into this point). For example, the formal principles commonly associated with commitment to the rule of law—see §3—speak most cogently to the production of legislation governed subjects directly and looks congenial to legalistic concerns about clarity and predictability. Sometimes, however, these kinds of assumption about the law that rules can have little purchase on the way law actually operates as a framework for government (Rubin 1989: 397–408).

Moreover, not all types of legislation are necessarily equal in rule of law terms. Laws made by the executive branch of government—often called “secondary” or “delegated” legislation—have always come in many shapes and sizes and this remains a feature of executive lawmaking today. If doing no more than giving effect to a primary legislative program enacted by an elected legislature, for example by filling in details through a further layer of rules, delegated legislation can be relatively uncontroversial in rule of law and democratic terms (Sunstein & Vermuele 2022). But when this kind of law and lawmaking functions to expand executive branch power, what can follow is not only a democratic and constitutional problem but a rule of law one too. After all, a government writing its own rules for how to govern is not exactly what the ideal of the rule of law has in mind (Rundle 2022; 42).

Another site of debate has to do with the use of norms that have the character of standards rather than rules (a rule is like a numerical speed limit, whereas a standard is like a norm that requires people to drive at a “reasonable” speed). Legal systems use both types of norm (Sunstein 1994). They use standards, for example, for cases where the appropriate decision may vary with ambient circumstances and it seems better to trust the judgment of those who face a particular situation, rather than laying it down in advance. Standards are common in regulatory law for this reason, often accompanied by a distaste for or suspicion towards the kind of overt government intervention represented in legislated rule. The point for present purposes is that the element of respect for individuals’ powers of discernment conveyed in the prescription and use of standards represents a certain confidence in human judgment arguably in tension with the ideal of the rule of law. Standards allow for less certainty in the law, especially when it is difficult for the person attempting to comply with the norm to predict how their judgement will be viewed by an official or by a court. As one especially strident critic put the point:

[o]ne could write a history of the decline of the Rule of Law … in terms of the progressive introduction of these vague formulas into legislation and jurisdiction. (Hayek 1972 [1944]: 78)

Again, whether this assessment is right depends partly on how far we take the rule of law to be wedded to particular forms of law (like rules or standards) and particular values or functions (like predictability). Are values like predictability the be-all and end-all of the rule of law, or does the ideal promise also a kind of legal system that frames and facilitates reason and thoughtfulness in human affairs, and in which its participants are expected to bring the right kinds of legal arrangements to different activities and concerns (Waldron 2023)? Critical thinking about the law that rules is as important to these questions as critical thinking about the rule of law ideal itself.

7.4 Emergencies

Is it reasonable to use the rule of law to evaluate the way a society responds to emergencies? Or is the ideal suited only to conditions of ordinary politics?

It is often argued that emergencies require forms of state action that are more peremptory and less procedurally laborious than those required in “normal” times. As a matter of fact, a number of possibilities for navigating alleged tensions between the rule of law and emergencies have been discussed (see for example Scheuerman 2006; Criddle & Fox-Decent 2012; Dyzenhaus 2020; Greene 2024). One possibility is to insist, in the name of the rule of law, that existing constitutional safeguards should remain in force; after all, that is what they were designed for and these situations are where they are most urgently needed. Alternatively, in emergencies, one might rely more heavily on a general spirit of flexibility and circumstantial sensitivity in state action that is encouraged even in normal times. On this second option, the rule of law does not present itself as a major constraint on the flexibility of state action in face of danger. Or, one might seek to preserve akin to the rule of law by laying down in advance specific legal rules to govern emergencies—for example, rules that suspend ordinary civil liberties guarantees for example or authorize widespread discretion on the part of officials to undertake action that would normally be governed by general rules of law. A version of this last model dates back to sixteenth-century analysis of the institution of dictator in the Roman republic (Machiavelli, Discourses (1517), and was widespread during the global COVID-19 pandemic where many jurisdictions relied on existing public health emergency powers while others hurried to enact new laws once the emergency set in. Prescribing the legal framework for emergencies in advance has the advantage of predictability. Its disadvantage or risk, however, is that it endorses a sort of rule-of-law-lite which may eventually infect or supersede the conception of the ideal that is supposed to be normally applicable.

7.5 International Law

Increasingly the rule of law applies not only within national polities but also between them, even if its character and use in this global arena remains under-theorized (for a helpful discussion, see Crawford 2003 & 2014). Much of the work that has been done on the international rule of law transfers existing specifications of the ideal (see §3) to the international context, for example, by saying the rule of law requires determinacy, clarity, and predictability here in the same way it does in the domestic area (see Chesterman 2008). This move however may be misconceived when we are talking about states rather than individuals being the subjects of law (Waldron 2011b). For a start, states are in a much better position to be informed of their legal obligations than are individual men and women in society; after all, states are parties to the treaties and practices that establish international law (though perhaps this point does not hold equally for customary international law).

Either way, it is difficult to see how the liberty of an individual state can be as important or valuable as the liberty of an individual person. Surely states do not need protection from power as channeled through international law in the same way as ordinary people need protection from the exercise of political power in society. Moreover, in areas like international human rights law, any presumption based on the rule of law in favor of the liberty of national states will tend to have detrimental effects on the liberty or well-being of individual men and women. We have to be careful therefore that any invocation of the rule of law in the international realm does not undermine the values that are supposed to be secured by this ideal within national polities.

Whether international institutions themselves—like the United Nations and its agencies, for example—should be bound by the rule of law is another question (Birkenkötter 2025). The same international agencies that are vociferous advocates of the rule of law so far as its application to national states is concerned may resist submitting their own conduct to its disciplines (Hovell 2016; Brunnée & Toope 2018). The reluctance here stems in large part from an estimation of the importance of diplomatic immunity: UN officials worry that if they and their agencies are held legally liable for malfeasances of various kinds associated with peace-keeping activities, there is a danger that the whole basis of international action might unravel. The danger is probably exaggerated, however, and those who make this argument would not for a moment countenance a similar argument in the sphere of national states.

7.6 Development and Nation-Building

The rule of law is often cited as the key to nation-building and to the establishment of new democracies. These declarations are voiced especially loudly by international agencies that have developed measures and “indexes” of rule of law compliance against which eligibility for financial and other forms of development assistance is evaluated (Humphreys 2021). This role for the rule of law (or particular specifications thereof) is very much a late twentieth and early twenty-first-century phenomenon. But what evidence of commitment to the ideal is likely to satisfy those holding the reins in such assessments?

When it is argued (e.g., Barro 2000) that a new state needs rule-of-law institutions, a specific prescription is in view: effective courts and commercial codes that can uphold property rights and enforce contracts. This seems uncontroversial on its face—recall that “formal” and “substantive” theories of the ideal alike have emphasized the importance to the rule of law of institutions to enforce legal rights in contract and property. This is why contemporary rule of law discourse associated with development and nation-building initiatives speaks often as though these apparent rule of law requirements are universal yardsticks against which to evaluate political and legal arrangements in Brunei or Burkina Faso as much as in the United Kingdom and the United States.

Still, controversy is not far from view when the demand for institutions to enforce commercial legal rights, whether in the form of public courts or something else (like private arbitration mechanisms), is coupled with corresponding demands to limit the activity of elected legislatures. The argument here is that a legal system that supports political action through legislative activity will neither inspire the commercial confidence nor establish the stability that a modern global economy requires (see Carothers 1998 and—more critically—Carothers 2009). The cost of accepting this argument, however, is significant, and raises once more the relation between the rule of law and legislation, but this time taking us in the direction of a trade-off between rule of law values and democracy (Ngugi 2005; Brechenmacher & Carothers 2019). While there is nothing new in the suggestion that the rule of law presents “a juridical model of society that is inherently individualistic, class-biased and undemocratic” (Green 1986: 1024), we should expect nonetheless that ideological controversy around the ideal will take on different inflections in different eras. Longstanding associations between the rule of law and the availability of functioning courts to enforce rights in contract and property, for example, might today be repackaged in demands for forums for enforcement of investors’ rights under foreign investment treaties (Roberts 2013; Van Harten 2010; Humphreys 2021).

7.7 The Rule of Algorithms

There is nothing like a novel development to place pressure on prevailing commitments and practices and the assumptions informing each. At the time of writing, the rise of automation, Artificial Intelligence (‘AI’), Generative AI (‘GenAI’), and other algorithmic tools in the everyday work of legal and governmental systems is doing precisely that in rule of law thought and practice. Scholarship engaging with these developments is growing exponentially and with increasing emphasis on the theoretical dimensions of the puzzles raised.

7.7.1 Automated Decision Making

It did not take long for commentary evaluating, appraising, and diagnosing the novel challenges raised by algorithmically-mediated or ‘automated’ decision-making (‘ADM’) to be articulated in a rule of law register. Certain features of ADM have made growing reliance on the practice by governments a predictable target for rule of law worries and demands. Calls in particular for the ‘explainability’, ‘transparency’, ‘accessibility’, and ‘reliability’ of ADM are now standard themes of rule of law critique of contemporary governmental practice (Hildebrandt 2016; Deeks 2019; Mayson 2019; Zalnieriute et al 2020; Dancy & Zalnieriute 2025). Moreover, the suite of decision-making practices to which ADM attaches—the outputs of administrative agencies, tribunals, courts and legislatures—is so broad that commentary on the rule of law worries presented can easily obscure significant differences between the institutional (and constitutional) environments of each.

The question for our purposes is from where the conceptual and normative resources informing a rule of law critique of ADM ought to be drawn. Early scholarship in this fast-evolving field reached instinctively for traditional ‘checklists’ of generally accepted rule of law criteria as the starting point from which concerns in this vein could be identified and evaluated. Arguments about the accountability and transparency problems presented by ‘digital government’, for example, more often than not are a minor variation on long-accepted rule of law principles such as that laws and decisions made under them must be ‘intelligible’ or ‘accessible’ to those subject to them (Zalnieriute et al. 2019). Still, what this reaching for extant theories of the rule of law has revealed is the conceptual instability and under-interrogated assumptions in play on both sides of the conversation (Finlay 2026; Burgess 2024; Huq 2024; Tasioulas 2023). It is difficult if not impossible to know what is being complained about or sought from the rule of law ideal in a world of AI and ADM without prior effort to specify exactly what we mean when we refer to either.

7.7.2 Analyzing AI and ADM through a Rule of Law Paradigm

Earlier sections of this entry have made clear that rule of law thought has always been informed by a range of un- or under-articulated assumptions about the people, institutions, processes and commitments that do its work. Among these, the rise of AI and ADM destabilizes in particular the notion that decision-making according to law is a practice tethered in some way to human rationality, judgment and influence. Irrespective of who that decision-maker is—a bureaucrat, a non-judicial tribunal, a judge, or an elected legislature—common calls for a ‘human in the loop’ in algorithmically-mediated decision-making (Crootoff et al 2023) give expression to a powerful rule of law understory. According to that understory there has always been a human at hand, doing the rule of law’s work, in the myriad spaces within which legally-authorised decision-making and regulation occurs. This human, moreover, tends to come clothed in assumptions drawn from longstanding rule of law imaginaries about the figure of the judge (Shklar 1987: 1, 3): the paragon rule of law official who possesses and exercises their legally-framed authority with rationality, impartiality, transparency, accountability and conscious respect for the dignity of legal subjects. The advent of impersonal, algorithmically-mediated decision-making invites critical reappraisal of long-held psychological attachments towards the ideal (Goldenfein 2026) as much as it disrupts inherited assumptions about what kinds of law do the ruling in the rule of law (§7.3). A further worry has to do with (seemingly inevitable) involvement of private actors in configuring the technologies that come to be relied upon by governments in their decision-making practices (Crawford & Schultz 2019).

A striking feature of philosophical inquiry into the implications of ‘the rule of algorithms’ for rule of law thought and practice is an emerging effort to isolate specific practices for more targeted interrogation. This has in turn laid bare the conceptual and methodological choices to be faced if productive analyses of the promise and pitfalls of algorithmic incursions are to reach the clarity to which inquiry in this mode aspires. Analysis of AI-informed adjudication undertaken by appellate judges offers a compelling example. Should the foundation for such inquiry be a ‘thin’/‘formal’ or ‘thick’/‘substantive’ account of the principles of the rule of law? What, moreover, is normatively at stake in such choices? In answer to such questions the trend continues to be one favoring a ‘thin’ or ‘formal’ conception of the rule of law (§3.1), for both normative and methodological reasons. A formal conception of the rule of law, it is argued, “offers AI-driven technology its best shot at helping us to deliver the rule of law”. It also meets “a two-pronged methodological demand”: namely, the pluralistic demand that positions the rule of law ideal “as one legally-relevant value among others”, and the further demand that “desiderata flowing from the rule of law exhibit sufficient coherence or unity to justify bringing them together under one heading” (Tasioulas 2023: 21).

7.7.3 An Uncertain Artificial Horizon for the Rule of Law?

Two general observations might therefore be made about the controversies, applications and provocations emerging from this fast-growing field of inquiry.

The first, no less important for its obviousness, is that inquiry directed to the impacts of AI and algorithmic tools on legal, political and moral practices is not necessarily inquiry directed to the impacts of AI and algorithmic tools on the ideal of the rule of law. At least at this early stage, interconnections between these questions can make it difficult to identify where one ends and the other begins. What is clear, however, is that targeted philosophical analyses undertaken in a rule of law register (e.g., Tasioulas 2023) have organised inquiry around familiar conceptual and methodological patterns. These include concern to engage appropriate foundational ‘accounts’ or ‘conceptions’ of ‘principles’ the rule of law, careful disentangling of the ideal from companion ideas such as democracy and human rights, and consideration of which rule of law ‘values’ (§4) are best called upon to illuminate the normative dimensions of analyses of AI, GenAI and ADM undertaken in a rule of law register.

A second observation is that algorithmic incursions into the everyday life of legal systems and governments have rendered ‘checklists’ of rule of law requirements drawn from models of rule-based governance inadequate bases from which the potential (or actual) threats and benefits of such technologies can be assessed. If rule of law thought and practice at this fast-evolving frontier is to be intelligible to persons entangled in settings of authority and power transformed by these interventions (Brownsword 2016), it seems inevitable that articulation and operationalization alike of the ideal may need to be reimagined. Only experience can answer how radical that reappraisal might come to be.

7.8 Indigenous Orders and the Rule of Law

All political ideals have histories. Still, the universalizing discourses in which modern expressions of the rule of law are typically packaged can make it easy to forget that its recurrent features and assumed purposes are born of a genetically English legal and political inheritance. Being reminded of this is acutely important if we are to comprehend the provocations posed to the rule of law ideal by Indigenous legal and political traditions. It is equally important if we are to comprehend—and address—experiences had in the shadow of the ideal by Indigenous subjects in England’s former colonies.

Indigenous legal and political traditions are as much concerned with law-governed political order as the English-born institutional configuration that largely continues its hold on rule of law thought and practice in the polities of England’s former colonial empire. Confronting the provocations posed to the rule of law ideal by Indigenous legal and political thought and practice, therefore, demands both imagination and a return to fundamentals. With respect to the latter, the basic idea underlying the rule of law—the ascendancy of law and the institutions of the legal system in a system of governance—says nothing, on its own, about the form or content of the law or legal institutions that should be authorized to do the ruling. Nor does it prescribe the source(s) from which that law must come. As for imagination, asking how we might realize an ideal in which ruler and ruled alike are mutually subordinate to law points to the irreducible relation between rule of law practice and argument. To be sure, certain formal, procedural, institutional, and source-based prescriptions for the ideal have recurred throughout its history. To suggest however that law-governed political order is unrealized or unrealizable in the absence of specific institutional prescriptions runs against the very idea of an ideal. From time to time, and from context to context, these prescriptions will need to be reimagined and reworked.

When grappling with these questions it is crucial also to reflect on how the oft-cited rule of law tenet of the equality of all before the “ordinary law” and the “ordinary courts” (Dicey 1992 [1885]) has been for many First Nations peoples no more than a fixture and figment of colonial storytelling (Behrendt 2016; Lino 2018). Rule of law commitments held out as politically neutral too often have rung hollow in practice, or have done more in service of reproducing colonial relations and constituting new forms of structural injustice than they have in extending the ideal’s claimed offerings to First Nations peoples (Watson 1997; Napoleon 2001; Borrows 2002; Watson & Douglas 2021; Blackhawk 2023).

What, then, of the prospects for a shared rule of law between the custodians of these different political and legal inheritances? The most common answer to this question brings us back to the critical importance of inquiry into the kinds of law that are given the authority to rule within polities ostensibly committed to the ideal. Only if that law is derived from Treaty—foundational legal agreement on how First Nations peoples are to be governed and by whom—can a mutually respectful shared commitment to the rule of law be possible. This provocation is at different stages of articulation and application in different places as we enter the second quarter of the twenty-first century. It is one to watch for its challenge to orthodoxies of rule of law thought and the politics of its practice alike.

8. The Era of Reappraisal?

Few could dispute that the late twentieth and early twenty-first century has been the golden age of rule of law discourse and scholarship. Nowhere is this more obvious than in the sudden explosion of theoretical work on the subject in the first quarter of the twenty-first century. The period since the last version of this entry has witnessed magisterial new works and targeted revisitations by philosophers who have engaged repeatedly with the demands and content of the ideal (Raz 2019; Postema 2022a; Waldron 2023). The same period has seen also the arrival of major state-of-the-field, perspective-seeking collections on theoretical its treatment to date (Meierhenrich & Loughlin 2021; Sevel 2025). Why this explosion of theoretical writing, now? Five observations might be offered.

8.1 Real-World Catalysts

The conceptual turn in philosophical treatment of the rule of law (§5) occurred in close temporal proximity to real world events in which the ideal took on a life of its own. The catalysts were and remain several: political and legal transitions precipitated by the collapse of communism in Eastern Europe; the effort of international financial institutions to make rule of law compliance a condition of engagement with countries seeking their assistance (§7.6); worries about apparent abuses of the rule of law associated with global trends of ‘democratic decay’ (Wacks 2021; §8.4); and in the United States specifically, concerns that governance tactics during the presidencies of Donald Trump represent “a grave threat not just to institutions designed to serve the rule of law but to our very understanding of the ideal” (Postema 2022, ix). It is not hard to see how one has influenced the other and continues to do so: the more discourse around real-world events centers the ideal, the more scholarly activity there is in response (Lacey 2021; Huq 2024).

8.2 New Philosophical Preoccupations

The primary preoccupations of philosophical engagement with the rule of law have however shifted from late twentieth-century definitional contests about the formal, procedural or substantive character of its principles and their instrumental or intrinsic value, to greater interest in the ideal’s distinctiveness. With respect to the latter, increasing emphasis is being placed on the need to untangle the rule of law from other companion concepts—human rights, democracy, social justice and economic freedom, for example—to serve clarity of analysis (Raz 2019: 10; Waldron 2021: 124) and to avert loss of “a distinctive part of our heritage of political philosophy” (Waldron 2023: 3). Still, real world practice offers ample indications to suggest these conceptual entanglements and blurred boundaries are here to stay. French President Emmanuel Macron’s speech at the World Economic Forum in January 2026 (see Other Internet Resources), for example, invoked rule of law phraseology multiple times in association with a disparate range of commitments and practices.

8.3 Perspectives New and Old

Efforts to promote alternate theoretical and interdisciplinary perspectives on the rule of law also have grown considerably in the period since the last version of this entry. This is reflected especially in recent state-of-the-field scholarly surveys which add anthropologists, historians, sociologists, political scientists and others to the mix of theoretical approaches that might be taken towards the ideal, “venerable” (Sevel 2025: 2) or “noble but flawed” (Meierhenrich & Loughlin 2021: 3) as it may be. Either way, custodianship of the rule of law as an academic subject matter continues to be dominated by legal scholars; a enduring trend that has not been without its critics. Political theorists in particular have been sharply critical of how the primacy of legal perspectives on the ideal has led to an excessive focus on the work of courts and judges and a tendency “to ignore every political reality outside the courtroom” (Shklar 1987: 3). Sociologists too have worried that longstanding preoccupation with the rule of law’s manifestation in specific legal institutions and processes has deflected attention from the sociological underpinnings critical to its realisation (Krygier 2017). Time will tell whether recent efforts to encourage more interdisciplinary engagement with the rule of law will foster shifts in this pattern.

8.4 Worries about Constitutionalism

Rule of law theorization also has become notably more central to the work of scholars of constitutional law and theory, especially in connection with widespread worries about democratic decay and rising authoritarianism. Revisiting and reemphasizing common institutional prescriptions for the ideal has been a recurrent feature of these works, with judicial independence and compliance with the rulings of courts especially high on the list (Barber 2019; Grimm 2019; Adams, Meuwese & Ballin 2017; Grant 2017; Winter 2022; Postema 2022b; Sunstein 2024; King 2025). Expanding executive power and lawmaking has also come into focus (Merrill 2020), though with a welcome push away from the longstanding preoccupation of modern rule of law thought with official discretion and towards the wide range of unorthodox legal and administrative forms that find inclusion within the toolkit of expanding executive branch power in twenty-first-century neoliberal and managerial conditions (Cohn 2021; Rundle 2022: 42–43).

8.5 The Private Life of the Rule of Law

Finally, there has been a notable increase as well in theoretical writing extending rule of law thought to private legal relations, augmenting the tradition’s foundational concern with legal limitation of public or governmental power (Kampourakis, Taekema & Arcuri 2022). Once again, this development is of its time: exercises (and excesses) of private and corporate legal power are as much a part of everyday life today as exercises of public power, if not more so. The employment relationship has been a primary site of investigation among those concerned to develop this inquiry (Anderson 2017). Moreover, that it is now typical for private entities and private law forms of regulation to be embedded in the everyday work of government also has implications for the reach, influence and content of rule of law thought. Standard assumptions about the character of the law that rules have been complicated, and have catalyzed inspection of the extent to which private law forms, relations, and doctrines measure up to expectations of the rule of law ideal (Austin & Klimchuk 2014).

8.6 Next Steps

In view of the remarkable level of attention directed to it in the first quarter of the twenty-first century, it is hard to imagine more could be said about the rule of law in the second. Nonetheless, as has always been the case, yet unknown political, legal and technological developments are bound to pose new challenges to the claimed content, value, and reach of the ideal as well as to its scholarly treatment. The challenges posed by digital technologies are but one aspect of this picture (§7.7), though one presently attracting much attention. Time will reveal what happens next. In the meantime, one thing is certain. Precisely because the rule of law ideal will continue to do work wherever it appears, so too will there be a need to articulate, debate, challenge, or defend the meaning(s) assigned to it.

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Acknowledgments

As of the 2026 update, Kristen Rundle has taken responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry.

Copyright © 2026 by
Kristen Rundle <kristen.rundle@unimelb.edu.au>
Jeremy Waldron

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