Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Bernard Bolzano

First published Thu 8 Nov, 2007

Bernard Bolzano (1781–1848) was a Catholic priest, a professor of the doctrine of Catholic religion at the Philosophical Faculty of the University of Prague, an outstanding mathematician and one of the greatest logicians or even (as some would have it) the greatest logician who lived in the long stretch of time between Leibniz and Frege. As far as logic is concerned, Bolzano anticipated almost exactly 100 years before Tarski and Carnap their semantic definitions of logical truth and logical consequence; and in mathematics he is not only known for his famous Paradoxes of the Infinite, but also for certain results that have become and still are standard in textbooks of mathematics such as the Bolzano-Weierstrass theorem. Bolzano also made important contributions to other fields of knowledge in and outside of philosophy. Due to the versatility of his talents and the various fields to which he made substantial contributions he became one of the last great polymaths in the history of ideas.

The presentation of Bolzano's personality that is given here would still be incomplete unless it were added that Bolzano was also a great philanthropist. This becomes evident not only by Bolzano's writings in ethics and political philosophy, but it also manifests itself in practice by his activities for the benefit of the poor, subjugated, discriminated and disadvantaged people. Together with his friends and pupils he supported activities in favor of such things as poorhouses, homes for the blind, loan banks for the working-class, and libraries and elementary schools in the countryside. Bolzano's liberal intellectuality and his progressive theological and political ideas, combined with his practical activities and his enormous influence as a priest and as a university professor on people in general and the opinion leaders in Bohemia in particular, were a highly explosive mixture in the political and religious atmosphere in which Bolzano lived. Bohemia and its capital Prague were at his time part of the Austrian empire. Due to Klemens Fürst von Metternich, a very illiberal and repressive political system was established in the Austrian empire by means of police force and censorship. All kinds of liberal and national movements were suppressed in this political system. No wonder that Bolzano's progressive political ideas and activities were found to be unacceptable to the political authorities. This situation in combination with personal intrigues resulted in January of 1820 in Bolzano's removal from his professorship by Emperor Franz (who signed personally all decrees of appointment and dismissals of professors of all the universities in the empire). From that time on Bolzano was forbidden to teach, preach, or publish, and he had to sustain himself on a meager pension that was “graciously granted” to him by the emperor. It came as a blessing in disguise that Bolzano now — “exempted” from teaching duties —  had all the time he needed to elaborate and write his new foundation of logic. It was published in 1837 in four volumes as Theory of Science. After that, Bolzano took great pains to elaborate a new foundation of mathematics. The realization of this project was considerably developed but not yet completed when Bolzano died in 1848.

Small pieces of his voluminous philosophical and mathematical literary remains have been published from time to time. The complete edition of his works that was planned several times had to wait until 1969 when the two most meritorious Bolzano scholars, Eduard Winter and Jan Berg, together with the publisher Günther Holzboog started the Bernard-Bolzano-Gesamtausgabe, which — due to the effort of the three persons — became one of the most distinguished complete editions of the works of a philosopher in our time.

Due to the peculiar circumstances of Bolzano's life and their interconnection with his scientific career, the biographical part of this article is longer than usual and divided into two sections. The third section of the article presents a survey of Bolzano's main writings, and the following sections (4 to 13) are devoted to the different branches of philosophy to which Bolzano made contributions. In the final section (14) Bolzano's influence on the development of the sciences and on the intellectual life in Bohemia is considered.

1. Bolzano's Life and Scientific Career

Bernard Bolzano was born on 5 October 1781 in Prague. His father came from Lombardy (hence the Italian surname), though he lived already from childhood in Bohemia; by profession he was a merchant. Bolzano's mother came from the German speaking family Maurer in Prague. Bernard was the fourth of twelve children altogether, most of whom died young.

When he was ten years old, Bolzano entered the Gymnasium (i.e. a kind of high school) of the Piarists in Prague, which he attended from 1791 to 1796. He subsequently began his “philosophical studies” at the University of Prague; they lasted three years, roughly corresponding to the higher level of high schools. Included in the “philosophical studies”, besides philosophy itself, were subjects such as history, languages, and biology, but above all also mathematics and physics.

After this, Bolzano wanted to study theology. In his intention to do so, however, he came into conflict with his father. Thus, for the purpose of reflection, he spent the academic year of 1799/1800 attending courses in mathematics and philosophy. He used this time for thorough-going reflection concerning his future, especially with regard to studies as well as choice of profession. After mature and conscientious consideration, Bolzano began his study of theology at the University of Prague in the autumn of 1800. At that time such a course of studies lasted four years; he finished it in the summer of 1804. The decision to pursue the study of theology, however, did not yet coincide with the final decision also to enter the clergy; rather, he hoped to get clear about his choice of profession precisely by studying theology.

For a long time, Bolzano was tormented by doubts concerning faith. Up to the end of his study of theology, certain doctrines of the church seemed to him irreconcilable with reason or at least with historical facts. Only with painstaking effort was Bolzano able to overcome these doubts, due to the help of a conception advocated by the pastoral professor Marian Mika, whom he held in high regard: For the justification of a religious doctrine it suffices (according to Mika) to show “that the belief in it guarantees certain moral advantages” (Bolzano 1836, 27). In religion what is at issue is not at all “what the nature of a matter is in itself ”, but rather only “what the most edifying presentation is for us” (Bolzano 1836, 17); the doctrines of religion and especially of (Catholic) Christianity serve primarily to advance virtue and happiness and thus the general welfare wherein Bolzano saw — in harmony with utilitarianism — the final goal of morality.

This conception rescued Bolzano from his religious doubts. It became the foundation of his whole philosophy of religion and was the decisive factor that prompted him to get ordained as priest finally on 7 April 1805. A few days later, on 17 April 1805, he received his doctorate of philosophy at the University of Prague. Just two days later, on 19 April 1805, he took up the newly established chair for religious doctrine in the Philosophical Faculty at the University of Prague, which had been granted to him provisionally by the Austrian Emperor, Kaiser Franz, on 13 February 1805. The definitive occupancy of this chair was followed by his appointment as professor ordinarius on 23 September 1806. Due to poor health (hemoptysis) he did not teach for more than two years (from June 1813 to October 1815), and only at the beginning of the academic year 1815/16 did he return to teaching. In the academic year of 1818/19 Bolzano was dean of the Philosophical Faculty. On 20 January 1820 Bolzano was removed from his professorship definitely and was not allowed to engage in any further teaching and publishing. The more detailed circumstances that led to these measures and their consequences will be explained in the following section.

After this, especially important for Bolzano's life was his acquaintance with Anna Hoffmann, whom he first met in 1823 — thus three years after his removal from office — at the deathbed of her daughter. From then on it was his habit to live during the summer on the estate of the Hoffmann family in Těchobuz (Southern Bohemia) and during the winter with his brother, who was a merchant in Prague where he had taken over his father's firm; from 1830, when the Hoffmann family stayed in Těchobuz, Bolzano took up permanent residence there and only went to Prague for short visits with his brother.

Bolzano himself did not at all feel his removal from office to be a misfortune (see Bolzano 1836, 49). He tried instead to see it in the best possible light. (Cf. Bolzano 1836, 72 ff., Bolzano 1965, 28 and 406.) Now he could devote himself completely to the study of logic and mathematics, for which he previously had only little time due to his strict adherence to his duties as an academic teacher. Thus the removal had also advantages for Bolzano as a scientist and writer, as well as for his health, as he himself stated (Wisshaupt 1850, 30).

One of the main difficulties that Bolzano's removal caused for his scientific work was of course that he was forbidden not only to teach, but also to publish. Thus great effort was required on the part of Bolzano and his pupils and friends in order to arrange for his writings to appear at least anonymously and outside of Austria. In 1834 the Lehrbuch der Religionswissenschaft (Bolzano 1834b) was edited anonymously in four volumes from Bolzano's lecture notes without his knowledge by his pupils; it appeared in a publishing house in Bavaria. In 1837, Dr. Bernard Bolzanos Wissenschaftslehre (Bolzano 1837a) appeared, again in four volumes, in the same publishing house. As many others of Bolzano's writings, this book was published in such a way that it appeared that it happened without Bolzano's intention. Later his hope (expressed in Bolzano 1836, 79) was fulfilled to be allowed to publish at least writings which were not of religious or political content without playing hide-and-seek. In this enormous endeavor which was needed for eventually finding publishers for the most important works and having them printed, Bolzano was well supported by his pupils and friends. They managed to publish a good deal of “accompanying literature” (introductions and prefaces to editions, essays in journals, reviews etc.), very often also anonymously. In this regard especially Michael Josef Fesl and Franz Příhonský were of great merit, though they were more or less lacking in philosophical and generally scientific talent.

Mrs. Hoffmann, who always took good care of the sickly Bolzano and was a great help and good friend to him, became seriously ill herself in 1841. Thus she moved with her family to Prague. Bolzano also moved to Prague and lived there with his brother from the end of 1841 until the end of his life. Mrs. Hoffmann died in 1842.

In Prague Bolzano could also be more active again in the Royal Bohemian Society of the Sciences as lecturer and administrator. In 1815 Bolzano already became a regular member of this prestigious scientific society, and he was its director in 1819; he took up this office once again in 1843. In addition, he was director of its mathematical section from the end of 1841 to 1845, and director of the “section for philosophy and pure mathematics” in 1842 and from the end of 1845 up to his death.

Bolzano suffered from attacks of coughing up blood, apparently due to having had tuberculosis. When he had once again overcome such an attack in the beginning of December 1848, he fell into extreme chills, from which he never recovered. On 18 December 1848 he died at 10:05 AM; the cause of death was said to be (in the medical terminology of the time) a “lung ailment”. On 21 December 1848 Bolzano was buried at the Wolschan Cemetery in Prague, where his grave can still be found today.

2. Bolzano's Removal from Office and the “Bolzano Trial”

In taking up the chair for religious doctrine, Bolzano had achieved the goal to which he strove upon entering the station of clergyman: The goal of this station he found in the “advancement of virtue and an inward happiness dependent on this by means of the doctrines of Christianity” (Bolzano 1853a, 37). This goal, he believed, could best be achieved by teaching at the university (or also at a Gymnasium). He wanted to educate the youth in the spirit of the Enlightenment with respect to religion as well as morals and politics. In this regard, however, Bolzano pursued a goal that was, unbeknownst to him, exactly opposed to what the emperor had in mind upon establishing such chairs by royal decree of 3 February 1804 at universities and secondary educational institutions (Jaksch 1830, 589–593, Unger 1840, 542–544). Emperor Franz was appalled by the French Revolution and its disastrous consequences, for which he ultimately blamed the Enlightenment for the most part; he therefore absolutely rejected every Enlightenment-related tendency. The chairs for religious doctrine were for him an instrument in the struggle against the negative political effects which, on his view, resulted from the Enlightenment. By means of such chairs the students were to be religiously grounded and trained in conscientious action — and that meant conformity with the state (Jaksch 1830, 590); they were consequently to be shaped into “good Christians and law-abiding citizens” (Jaksch 1830, 593). Religion and morals had the aim of supporting the state, according to the emperor, and the afore-mentioned chairs for religious doctrine, whose first occupant at the University of Prague was Bolzano, were established as a means to this end.

According to the decree of 3 February 1804, the chairs for religious doctrine were established for the sake of “improving religious instruction” (Jaksch 1830, 589). Connected with these professorships was the important assignment to deliver the Sunday homilies, also called ‘exhortations’ or ‘Erbauungsreden’ (‘edifying addresses’), to the students (Bolzano gave them voluntarily also on holidays); the effectiveness of these chairs (whose occupants were therefore also called ‘catechists’ — cf. Bolzano 1836, 31, Jaksch 1830, 589) was thereby essentially enhanced.

From the very beginning, already before he was definitively assigned as occupant of the chair for religious doctrine, Bolzano confronted obstacles and opposing forces. Attacks against Bolzano were brought up again and again from religious as well as from political standpoints. At first all these intrigues seemed to produce no effect. However, the decisive blow against Bolzano was eventually delivered. In this the personal physician of Emperor Franz, Freiherr Andreas Josef von Stifft, played an important role. Stifft presented a report to the emperor on 2 February 1819 concerning Bolzano's edifying addresses, a selection of which had already appeared in 1813 as a book. In this report, Stifft managed to draw the emperor's attention to the following passage, which could only have impressed him as Stifft intended: “There will come a time when the thousand different kinds of orders of rank and of barriers among human beings, which cause so much evil, will be put back into their proper confines, when everyone will deal with his neighbor as a brother ought to deal with his brother! There will come a time when one will introduce constitutions which will no longer be so terribly open to abuse as our present ones are” (Bolzano 1813, 99, slightly modified and with a detailed footnote in the 2nd edition, p. 36).

Bolzano himself, who confessed to having never read newspapers (Bolzano 1836, 42) or having read too few of them (Bolzano 1956, 250), presumably was not aware of the impression which such views were making at that time among the state officials and especially in the emperor; moreover, when he delivered (and also published) this homily, he could not foresee that some day it was to be presented to the authorities to be used against him.

In a decree which the State Counsel authorized on 27 November 1819 and the emperor signed on 24 December 1819, Bolzano's removal from his chair was finalized and a reprimand was issued to him. The officially stated reason for Bolzano's removal from his office was that in his (already published) edifying addresses and in his lecture notes (that were later published as Textbook of the Science of Religion), he “severely violated the duty of the priest, the teacher of religion to the youth, and the good citizen of the state”. There were thus in the foreground here alleged instances of misconduct against the state rather than erroneous religious teachings. The decree in which Bolzano's removal was finalized was given to him on 20 January 1820, and on this date he was not only removed from his chair, but also forbidden to teach, preach or publish any more (cf. Bolzano 1836, 48 f., and Bolzano 1965, 28).

As regards the question concerning Bolzano's orthodoxy, the archbishop was given the task of conducting his own investigation. The ecclesial investigations took a few years since one wanted to demand from Bolzano a public retraction such as the one to which his pupil Fesl was compelled, though under essentially more unfavorable conditions, namely confinement to a monastery. Bolzano steadfastly refused to make such a public retraction, since he himself was convinced that he had never advocated views that diverged from the teachings of the Catholic Church. It was finally seen to be satisfactory for Bolzano to submit a declaration of his orthodoxy before the archbishop on 31 December 1825 and to confess the Trinitarian faith in the presence of the archbishop and the investigating committee.

3. Bolzano's Main Writings

Bolzano's uncommonly versatile work culminated in three extensive main writings in three different areas of knowledge: (1) in theology his four volume Textbook of the Science of Religion (Bolzano 1834b), (2) in philosophy the four volume Theory of Science (Bolzano 1837a), which provides a new foundation for logic and is at the same time an extensive manual of logic, and (3) in mathematics the Theory of Quantities, conceived of as a monumental work, but not completed.

Bolzano's teaching was concerned exclusively with fundamental topics of theology; in addition he worked mainly in logic. Nevertheless, his scientific development began in mathematics. It was mathematics that was the starting point for his scientific work and to which he ultimately returned in order to create a new foundation on which mathematics as a whole could be built; he succeeded in doing this, however, only in bits and pieces. For a professional career in mathematics Bolzano had prerequisites and also opportunities no less than he had for his teaching of the science of religion, which was the course he actually chose and involved so many difficulties. Already in 1804 Bolzano's first scientific publication, namely Considerations on Some Objects of Elementary Geometry (Bolzano 1804) appeared. Further mathematical monographs followed (Bolzano 1810, Bolzano 1816, Bolzano 1817a and Bolzano 1817b), thereafter only posthumously. When Bolzano applied for the chair of religious doctrine he also applied for a chair in mathematics at the University of Prague and underwent the examination (or Konkurs as it was called). His qualification for the chair of mathematics was obvious and accordingly certified by the committee. It was a matter of chance that he was finally appointed not to the chair of mathematics but to that of religious doctrine.

Bolzano's research in philosophy, and in particular in logic, served him as a basis for his work in theology as well as in mathematics.

4. Logic

Although it is logic in which Bolzano's greatest philosophical accomplishments can be found, his interest in logic was nevertheless, strictly speaking, secondary in nature: Bolzano came upon the idea of developing a new logic because he noticed already in his early mathematical investigations that the logic at that time did not suffice for the treatment of mathematics. Likewise, Bolzano's investigations in the science of religion and theology compelled him to engage in logical studies, since he also wanted to construct the science of religion and theology on a solid logical foundation, as can be seen in sections 10–14 of the first part of his Textbook of the Science of Religion (RW I, 32–41). For there are in theology no less than in mathematics and philosophy “a significant number of concepts which must be developed, very lengthy series of inferences which must be properly executed, and very many, extremely deceptive fallacies whose total lack of soundness must be discovered” (RW I, 10; cf. also Bolzano 1838b, 334). The decisive impulse to write a textbook of logic, however, resulted — astonishingly enough — from Bolzano's ethical investigations: in his attempt to establish the highest moral law, he found that the logic of his time was deficient and in need of a fundamental renewal (Bolzano 1968a, 30 f.).

4.1 Bolzano's Concept of Logic

The term ‘logic’ was understood in Bolzano's time, as also by Bolzano himself, not in the narrow sense of formal logic, as it is commonly used nowadays, but rather in the broad sense which includes — besides formal logic — also both epistemology and the philosophy of science. Thus Bolzano used instead of ‘logic’ also the term ‘theory of science’. By ‘logic’ or ‘theory of science’ Bolzano means that discipline or science which formulates rules, “according to which we must proceed in the business of dividing the entire realm of truth into single sciences and in the exposition thereof in special textbooks if we want to proceed in a truly expedient fashion” (WL I, 7; cf. also WL I, 19 and 56).

This definition of logic makes a strange impression at first glance and was also often misunderstood. By putting it forward, Bolzano ascribes to logic a task that is generally not included in philosophy at all, but rather in the technique of scientific procedure. Bolzano, however, considered this task to be important enough to subject it to a scientific treatment. Since he did not see how it could otherwise be brought within the purview of a science, he assigned this task to logic which seemed to him to be the best candidate for this. What Bolzano mentions in his definition is, in his own view, by no means the only task of logic. In order to avoid superfluous criteria, Bolzano stated only the most concrete purpose in his definition, for the other tasks are entailed by it. Bolzano's logic is a composite of the theory of foundations, the theory of elements, the theory of knowledge, the art of discovery (heuristics), and the theory of science proper. Thus, logic is, for Bolzano, an encompassing philosophical discipline, and the “theory of science proper” is only a sort of appendix of his logic.

This assessment of the different parts of the Theory of Science coincides with Bolzano's own judgment, according to which the “philosophical gain” is only in the first three (indeed, first two) volumes (Bolzano 1965, 232): the theory of elements is “due to the originality of its views”, the most important, noteworthy and meritorious part of the Theory of Science (Bolzano 1838b, 355, 340).

4.2 Bolzano's Conception of Logic

Bolzano's logic was based upon a fundamental view that was the very opposite of the common view of his time. Whereas it was quite common at his time to mix logical with psychological investigations, Bolzano made every effort to separate them. For him logical concepts are concepts of their own, and their definition therefore must be kept free from any psychological admixture (WL I, 61–66). Bolzano's approach to logic was — long before Frege and Husserl — unmistakably antipsychologistic, even if he did not yet use this term. In order to overcome psychologism and to achieve a strict separation of logic from psychology, Bolzano “opened up” for logic a realm or “world” of its own, different from the world of material objects as well as from the world of mental phenomena, a World 3 to speak with Karl Popper. Bolzano's motive for postulating such a logical realm of its own obviously was the erroneous belief that logical properties (such as logical truth) and logical relations (such as logical consequence) need purely logical objects as their bearers in order to remain purely logical and free from any psychological admixture themselves. What is more, Bolzano had an unshakeable intuition that there are and must be such purely logical objects, namely “objective sentences” or “sentences in themselves” (Sätze an sich), and their parts, i.e., “objective ideas” or “ideas in themselves” (Vorstellungen an sich). In today's terminology, Bolzano's “sentences in themselves” are called ‘propositions’; this term (without any epithet) will be used for them in what follows. (The term ‘sentence’ without epithet, however, will be used in its linguistic sense for certain strings of words.) Moreover, following Bolzano's practice, we will use the term ‘idea’ (‘Vorstellung’) without epithet for ‘idea in itself’ (‘Vorstellung an sich’). Propositions and ideas are the objects which can be “grasped” by mental phenomena (subjective propositions, in particular judgments, and subjective ideas) and expressed in language, but — despite their close connection to their mental and linguistic correlates — they must be rigorously distinguished from them.

Due to his conception of logic, Bolzano was “in need” of propositions and ideas and therefore postulated that there are such genuinely logical objects. He himself, however, was convinced that he need not postulate them but can undoubtedly prove that there must be propositions and ideas.

4.3 The Basis of Bolzano's Logic and of his Whole Philosophy

Something can be true even nobody knows that it is. We therefore need a concept of truth that does not require of every truth that someone knows it. For this concept Bolzano introduced the term ‘Wahrheit an sich’ (‘truth in itself’). If something is a truth and no human being knows that it is, then — for Bolzano — it must be a “truth in itself”; being true but not known to be true is for him a distinguishing characteristic of a “truth in itself”. A “truth in itself” (Wahrheit an sich) is nothing but a true prop­os­ition, i.e., a proposition that has the property of being true. Bolzano takes the proof that there is at least one “truth in itself” to be fundamental not only for logic and for philosophy in general, but for any science. Bolzano offers therefore several arguments such as the following ones for the claim that there must be “truths in themselves”: (i) There are obviously truths that are unknown and therefore (so Bolzano) “truths in themselves”. E.g. one of the two propositions “There are winged snakes” or “There are no winged snakes” must be true, but we do not know which one (WL I, 108); and one of the propositions stating that a specific tree at a certain moment bears a certain number of blossoms must be true, even nobody knows which one (WL I, 112). (ii) The Pythagorean theorem or the Copernican discovery that the earth rotates around the sun have not become true by their discoveries but have always been true, i.e. (according to Bolzano), they are “truths in themselves” (Zimmermann 1847, 71 f., 136). (iii) If no thinking being existed, it were true that there exists no thinking being, but this (according to Bolzano) could only be a “truth in itself” (Bolzano 1839, 150). There is one proof for the existence of a “truth in itself” or a true proposition, however, which Bolzano takes to be decisive. It is an improved version of the traditional refutation of scepticism by self-application (RW I, 35, WL I, 145). Before we present and discuss this proof, a terminological remark seems to be in order: The word ‘truth’ (as well as the German word ‘Wahrheit’) is ambiguous insofar as it denotes the property of being true on the one hand and a bearer of this property (a true proposition, a true sentence, a true judgment etc.) on the other hand (WL I, 108 f.). Only the latter can be meant, however, as soon as the word ‘truth’ is preceded by the indefinite article (‘a truth’) or if it is put into the plural form (‘truths’). It is in such clear cases only that we will allow the word ‘truth(s)’ without epithet to be used in the sense of Bolzano's ‘truth in itself’ or ‘truths in themselves’, but otherwise we will use ‘true proposition(s)’ instead to avoid confusion. In general we will therefore reserve the word ‘truth’ for the property of being true. That being said, we can now turn to Bolzano's alleged proof for the existence of true propositions:

  1. There is no true proposition (assumption of reductio).
  2. (1) expresses a proposition.
  3. The proposition expressed by (1) is not true (from (1) and (2)).
  4. It is not the case that there is no true proposition (from (3) — in contradiction to (1)).
  5. There is a (i.e., at least one) true proposition (from (1)–(4) by reductio).

The improvement of Bolzano's version of this traditional proof consists in Bolzano's explicitly mentioning premise (2) as indispensable for the deduction (WL I, 145, 151; cf. also WL IV, 282 f.), thus making clear that the proof would not go through if this premise were not accepted. The inference of (4) from (3) is vindicated by Bolzano's explication of propositional negation (see section 4.4). Bolzano is not content with having proven (allegedly) that there is at least one true proposition; he wants even to prove by mathematical induction that there are more and even infinitely many true propositions (see section 12.3).

The above derivation is an illustrative example of Bolzano's importation of proof methods from mathematics — such as the methods of indirect proof and of mathematical induction — into philosophy. (For certain reservations concerning these methods cf. WL IV, 269–285.) Nevertheless, this alleged proof for the existence of a true proposition does not reach its goal for a simple reason: The proof is in no way peculiar for truths in the sense of true propositions as Bolzano needs to have it. If successful at all, it would work in the same way also for proving the existence of true judgments or true sentences (understood as linguistic entities). A proof for the existence of at least one truth in itself, i.e. a true proposition, requires premise (2) (as well as premise (3)). In premise (2), however, the existence of a proposition is already presupposed since it is shorthand for what can be explicitly stated as: There is a (i.e., at least one) proposition expressed by (1). Thus, if we take the derivation as a proof for the existence of at least one true proposition, we will succumb to an obvious petitio principii. By — correctly — requiring the addition of premise (2) to be necessary for the formal correctness of the proof, Bolzano unwittingly displayed its failure due to an informal fallacy. Bolzano himself, however, was convinced that he had correctly and successfully proven that there are “truths in themselves”. From this it follows that there must be propositions, since “truths in themselves” are a certain kind of propositions (WL I, 111 f.). And since in every proposition ideas are contained as its parts, a further consequence is that there are also ideas. For every proposition there is also another proposition that is its propositional negation. The propositional negation of a true proposition is a false proposition. Therefore, among propositions there must also be false ones. They are often overlooked because a special name such as ‘falsehood in itself’ was never introduced “officially” for them and is at least not customary.

As far as the ontological status of propositions and ideas is concerned, Bolzano stresses again and again their objectivity, i.e. their independence from thinking in general and from the minds and mental phenomena of thinking beings by which they are “grasped” in particular. Bolzano does not only accentuate the objectivity of propositions and ideas, but he also lays particular emphasis on their being not real (wirklich), whereby ‘real’ means, in Bolzano's terminology, the same as efficacious (wirksam, from which etymologically ‘wirklich’ is derived). The realm of reality includes everything in space and time and herewith all material objects and events of the physical world (i.e., Popper's “World 1”) as well as all mental (or “psychical”) phenomena of our inner world (i.e., World 2). (In addition, Bolzano includes in his realm of reality also God who is outside of space and time.) Propositions and ideas belong to a “third realm” (World 3) outside of Bolzano's realm of reality which encompasses World 1 and World 2. Unfortunately, Bolzano uses the nouns ‘Existenz’ (‘existence’) and ‘Sein’ (‘being’) synonymously with ‘Wirklichkeit’ (‘reality’); he therefore states again and again that there are (es gibt) propositions and ideas but they do not exist and they do not have being. This peculiar — if not odd — terminology has caused numerous misunderstandings, not only about Bolzano's views but also for Bolzano himself, e.g., in his discussion about Kant's dictum that being is not a real predicate. (Despite Bolzano's terminological convention, we will here use the English word ‘existence’ in general in the broad sense of Bolzano's ‘es gibt’.)

It is not only for this terminological reason that Bolzano's characterization of the ontological status of propositions and ideas remains in the last analysis nebulous and has therefore repeatedly evoked criticism. One must of course add, for the sake of doing justice to Bolzano, that no other advocate of such a World 3 — including Husserl, Popper and even Frege — has done better than he had done and has succeeded in saying anything clearer about this than what can already be found in his work. Despite all these deficiencies, Bolzano's unproven assumption or postulation of propositions and ideas turned out to be extremely fruitful for his own research.

4.4 Bolzano's Analysis of Propositions (i.e., of his “Sentences in Themselves”)

Although Bolzano contributed many highly interesting and valuable insights to the analysis of propositions, they all are shaped in the subject-predicate scheme. We must explain some of these insights before we discuss Bolzano's main contributions to logic in the sections 4.6–4.9.

In what follows brackets will be used for the denotation of propositions and ideas. Thus ‘[Socrates has wisdom]’ will denote the proposition expressed by the words ‘Socrates has wisdom’, and ‘[Socrates]’ and ‘[wisdom]’ will denote the ideas expressed by the words ‘Socrates’ and ‘wisdom’, respectively. (Such a notation is not without problems, but this is not the place to discuss them.) Bolzano starts his analysis of propositions by proclaiming the traditional subject-predicate view as a dogma: Despite the variety of their linguistic expressions, all propositions are of the form [A has b] and therefore have exactly three parts: a subject idea [A], a predicate idea [b], and the copula [has], i.e. the idea expressed by the word ‘has’ or another form of ‘to have’ (WL II, 9–17). Bolzano prefers this copula to the copula expressed by a form of ‘to be’ for the following reason: In everyday language we try to avoid abstracts such as ‘wisdom’ and prefer saying ‘Socrates is wise’; but in doing so we attribute a property — namely wisdom — to Socrates. The logical structure of the proposition is therefore best displayed — says Bolzano — by the words ‘Socrates has wisdom’. Due to the stylistic preference of adjectives over abstract nouns, everyday language very often does not even provide us with an abstract noun corresponding to an adjective; in such cases we therefore use the adjective at hand, although we could always easily introduce a corresponding artificial noun into our language.

Since every proposition has the same copula, two propositions can be different only if they have either different subject ideas or different predicate ideas or both. This results in Bolzano's identity criterion for propositions: Two propositions [A1 has b1] and [A2 has b2] are identical iff (i.e., if and only if) [A1] = [A2] and [b1] = [b2]. In order for [A has b] to be a proposition, it will suffice that the predicate idea [b] be an arbitrary idea, in a way at least “pretending” to be an idea of an attribute (WL II, 16–18). In order for [A has b] to be true, however, it is necessary that the predicate idea [b] is an idea of an attribute (Beschaffenheit). An attribute can be an “inner attribute”, i.e., a property (Eigenschaft) of an object, or an “outer attribute”, i.e., a relation (Verhältnis) among objects. Examples of properties are wisdom or omnipotence, examples of relations are friendship to so-and-so, fatherhood to so-and-so, being twice as long as such-and-such (WL II, 378–389). In his careful analysis of the difference between inner and outer attributes, Bolzano already came close to what in our day is sometimes called a mere Cambridge property (WL I, 388 f.).

The main trouble resulting from the traditional subject-predicate view in general and from Bolzano's uniform [A has b] structure of every proposition is that under its subject idea [A] two different cases are concealed insofar as it can be singular (as in the case of [God] or [the sun] or [Bernard Bolzano]) or general (as in the case of [man] or [animal] or [planet]). Due to this duality, Bolzano has to add that [A has b] or [A have b] is to be understood (when [A] is general) in the sense of [Every A has b] or [All A have b], e.g. [Animals have sensitivity] = [Every animal has sensitivity] = [All animals have sensitivity] (WL II, 24 f.).

In order to confirm his thesis that every proposition has the form [(Every) A has b], Bolzano shows of all kinds of verbal forms of significant sentences how to transfer them into his standard form (cf. WL II, 38 ff. and 211 ff.). Here are some of the rather important examples of Bolzano's analysis.

  1. Predicate negation (i.e., “inner negation”): The lack of an attribute b (such as the lack of omnipotence) is itself a property (WL II, 47) that we can denote by the negation ‘non-b’ (‘non-omnipotence’). Negative propositions of the form [A has non-b], e.g. [Bernard Bolzano has non-omnipotence (i.e., lack of omnipotence)],  therefore share the general form [A has b] with all other propositions (WL II, 44–52).
  2. Propositional negation (i.e., “external” negation): From propositions of the form [A has non-b] we have to distinguish propositions in which another proposition is denied. We can express such propositions by ‘It is not the case that A has b’. According to Bolzano, such a proposition is about another proposition and states that this proposition is false, i.e., not true. Its subject idea is therefore an idea of a proposition and its predicate idea is the idea of falsity or lack of truth, i.e., non-truth. Their form is therefore best displayed as [[A has b] has non-truth] (WL II 62–64).
  3. Subjunctive and disjunctive propositions: The subjunction of two propositions s1 and s2 is explained by Bolzano as a proposition of the form [s2 is a consequence of s1] (WL II, 198 f., 224–226; Bolzano proposes here also alternative interpretations of ‘if … so’ sentences). An inclusive or exclusive disjunction of two propositions s1 and s2 is interpreted by Bolzano as a proposition which attributes to the idea [a true proposition belonging to the collection consisting of s1 and s2] the property of being non-empty or singular, respectively (WL II, 204 f., 228 f.).
  4. Particular propositions and there-is propositions: In view of Bolzano's interpretation of [A has b] as [Every A has b] whenever [A] is general, it is of special interest how he deals with particular propositions expressed by ‘Some A have b’. Bolzano transforms such sentences into there-is sentences of the form ‘There is at least one A that has b’. But what about such there-is sentences? In a sentence of the form ‘There is at least one A’ we attribute, according to Bolzano, not a property to A itself but to [A], i.e., the idea of A, namely the property of being non-empty. The form of the corresponding propositions is therefore best given as [[A] has non-emptiness] (WL II, 52–54, 214–218). This analysis is completely in accordance with Kant's — and of course even more so with Frege's and Russell's later on —, although Bolzano never stopped criticizing Kant for his dictum that existence is not a real predicate. Bolzano took this dictum to be about existence in his own narrow sense of ‘existence’ or ‘being’, i.e., in the sense of ‘reality’, and not — as he should have — in the broad sense of his ‘es gibt’. His disagreement with Kant on this point is therefore merely verbal in nature. For Bolzano's approach, a true negative existential sentence such as ‘There is no round square’ does not pose a problem any more; the proposition expressed by this sentence is [[a round square] has emptiness] (WL II, 54 f.).

In his analysis of propositions Bolzano distinguished clearly different levels in his realm of propositions and ideas. He even introduced a special name for ideas of ideas, such as the idea of the idea [A], i.e., [[A]]; he called them ‘symbolic ideas’ (WL I, 426 ff.). In his efforts to show that all propositions can be shaped into [A has b], Bolzano makes extensive usage of such symbolic ideas (and also of ideas of propositions) as subject ideas of propositions, as it is exemplified under iii and iv above.

Bolzano took pains to systematize his attempts of shaping all propositions into [A has b]. His attempts, however, remained only on the level of examples, since he missed a key for their systematization such as Frege's function-argument scheme.

Bolzano combines his doctrine that the form [A has b] is common to all propositions with a correspondence theory of truth, whereby he, like Aristotle, avoids speaking of correspondence or adequation. A proposition [A has b] is true, according to Bolzano, iff A has (in fact) b (WL I, 112). There is an important qualification, however, that Bolzano has thereby in mind, namely that there is at least one A; a proposition [A has b] can only be true, according to Bolzano, if it is about something and if its subject idea [A] is therefore non-empty (WL II, 16, 328–330, 399 ff.). Formulated more carefully, Bolzano's truth condition must therefore be stated as follows (WL I, 112, 121–224, WL II, 26 f., 328–330):

[A has b] is true (or: has truth) iff [A] is non-empty, and for every x that is an object of [A] there is a y that is an object of [b] such that x has y.

Due to this definition of truth and due to Bolzano's doctrine that every proposition has the form [A has b], every proposition has existential import for Bolzano. (‘Existential’ must here be taken in the sense of Bolzano's ‘there is’; and it must be kept in mind that Bolzano's interpretation transfers many propositions to a meta-level and that in such a case the existential import concerns [A] rather than A itself.) This peculiar kind of an existential presupposition of Bolzano's logic makes his theory of syllogisms (which he himself saw as a mere section of his whole logic) an intermediate system between Aristotle and Venn: Whereas Aristotle's theory of categorical syllogisms does not allow empty terms at all, Bolzano's logic does so, but they cannot be the subject ideas of true propositions in Bolzano's logic. As a consequence, the so-called conclusio ad subalternatam is logically valid also for Bolzano, i.e., [Some A have b] follows logically from [All A have b] (WL II, 114, 399 ff.), but [All A have non-b] is not convertible, i.e., [All B have non-a] does not logically follow from [All A have non-b] (WL II, 401 f., 526). Therefore exactly two of the 24 valid Aristotelian syllogisms (namely the modi CAMENES — or CALENTES in Bolzano's terminology — and CAMENOP of form IV) are invalid in Bolzano's logic as he himself proved by means of counter-examples (WL II, 415, 558), whereas all other Aristotelian modi (including the weakened ones) are logically valid also in Bolzano's logic.

4.5 Bolzano's Theory of Ideas (i.e., of his “Ideas in Themselves”)

The three immediate parts of a proposition are its subject idea, its predicate idea and the copula [has]. In further analyzing the subject and predicate idea of a proposition, we will find out, that in special cases (as, e.g., in the case of the idea [the judgment that God is omnipotent]), a complete proposition will turn out to be a part of an idea  (WL I, 221). In general, however, the parts of an idea are themselves ideas. After careful consideration Bolzano decided against the view to define a proposition as something constructed out of ideas (i.e., a connection of two arbitrary ideas by means of the copula [has]) (WL II, 18); he rather suggested that we define ideas as those parts of a proposition which are not themselves propositions (WL I, 216, WL II, 18). In this sense he granted priority to propositions over ideas, thereby anticipating Frege and Wittgenstein. There is a clear demarcation between propositions and ideas: Whereas each proposition is either true or false (WL II, 7), an idea cannot be true or false (WL I, 239 ff.).

There are two “dimensions” to be distinguished in each idea: its “internal” dimension of being divided into parts, and its “external” dimension of eventually being directed towards objects.

As far as the inner structure of ideas is concerned (WL I, 243 ff.), Bolzano distinguishes simple from complex ideas: A simple idea has no proper parts, whereas a complex idea has. The “sum” (Summe) of proper parts of a complex idea is called its ‘content’ (‘Inhalt’). Due to Bolzano's peculiar usage of the term ‘sum’ that is restricted — like his usage of ‘collection’ in general — to sets with at least two members, he could not apply his concept of content to all ideas, but only to complex ideas. In order to simplify matters, we will use here the modern concept of a set, allowing for a set to be a singleton (i.e., containing only one single member) or even to be empty (i.e., containing no member at all). In what follows we will therefore take the content of an arbitrary idea to be the set of all of its parts (including improper ones, i.e., including itself). The content of a simple idea i is then the singleton {i} containing i itself as its only member. Two ideas i1 and i2 can have the same content, i.e., the same parts, without themselves being identical, because the common parts of i1 and i2 can be arranged in different ways in i1 and i2. Bolzano's favorite example is: [an erudite son of an unerudite father] has the same content, but is not identical with [an unerudite son of an erudite father]; the same holds for [35] and [53] (WL I, 244). In analyzing an idea, we will in all cases eventually come upon simple ideas (WL I, 263–265). Without explicitly expressing it, Bolzano obviously held the view that every idea is recursively constructed out of simple ideas. Two ideas are therefore identical iff they are constructed out of the same simple ideas in the same way. In order to be able to apply this general idea precisely in concrete cases, we would have to be able to identify the simple ideas and the formation rules involved. Unfortunately, Bolzano informs us about both only by hinting at examples here and there. As examples of simple ideas he mentions [something] (WL I, 447), [has] (WL I, 380, WL II, 18), [non] (WL II, 415), [Wirklichkeit], i.e., [reality] (WL II, 60), and [Sollen], i.e., [ought] (WL II, 69, WL IV, 489).

With respect to its “external” dimension, an idea can have several (may be even infinitely many) objects, exactly one object, or no object at all. An idea that has no object at all is an empty idea; Bolzano calls it ‘gegenstandlos’ (‘objectless’). Bolzano puts forward the thesis with particular emphasis that there are empty ideas; his standard examples are ideas such as [nothing], [golden mountain] (WL I, 304 f., WL II, 329) or [winged horse] (WL III, 24). A special kind of empty ideas, viz. contradictory ideas (or, as Bolzano usually prefers to call them, imaginary ideas) cannot even have an object (WL I, 315 ff., WL III, 405 f.), examples being [a round polygon], [a round square], [a triangle that is quadrangular], [a regular pentagon], [a wooden iron tool], [an equilateral rectangular triangle] (WL I, 305, 315, 317, 321, 324, WL II, 329).

Non-empty ideas are called ‘gegenständlich’ (‘objectual’) by Bolzano. They can be singular as, e.g., [the philosopher Socrates], [the city of Athens], [the fixed star Sirius] (WL I, 306), [an even integer between 4 and 8] (WL III, 407), [God] (WL III, 408), or general; if general, they can have a finite number of objects, such as [a heir of Genghis-Khan's Empire] (WL I, 299) or [an integer between 1 and 10] (WL I, 308), or an infinite number of objects, such as [a line] or [an angle] (WL I, 298). For non-empty ideas (and only for them) Bolzano defines their extension (Umfang) (WL I, 297 f.); by using again the modern concept of a set (as we already did with Bolzano's definition of the content of an idea), we can extend his definition to all ideas including empty ones; the extension of an arbitrary idea i (or Ext(i), as an abbreviation) is then nothing but the set of all objects of i.

By crossing the “internal” with the “external dimension” of ideas we can get new and interesting “creations”. Combining, e.g., the smallest content with the smallest extension of a non-empty idea results in a new type of idea, viz. in an “intuition in itself” or, as we may say for the sake of brevity, an intuition (Anschauung). An intuition is an idea which is simple, i.e., has no proper part, and at the same time singular, i.e., has only one single object (WL I, 325–330). If an idea is neither itself an intuition nor contains any intuition as a proper part, it is called ‘Begriff’ (‘concept’) by Bolzano; examples of concepts are the simple idea [something] and the complex idea [God] whereby, for Bolzano, [God] = [the real being that has no cause of its being real]. A mixed idea is a complex idea which contains at least one intuition as a proper part (WL I, 330 f.). The distinction between intuitions and concepts plays an important role in Bolzano's epistemology (cf. section 5.2 where we will also present examples of intuitions).

Talking about the “external dimension” of ideas, we made — following Bolzano — intensive usage of a certain relation R between ideas and their objects that is basic in Bolzano's theory of ideas. For ‘i R x’ we used phrases such as ‘i is an idea of x’ or ‘x is an object of i’; other expressions for it are ‘i represents x’, ‘x is subsumed under i’ or ‘x falls under i’ (WL I, 298). The domain of R is the set of non-empty ideas, its range being the set of all objects; moreover, R has the following properties: it is neither reflexive nor irreflexive (the latter due to counterexamples such as: [idea] R [idea]; cf. WL I, 461), it is neither symmetric nor asymmetric, it is neither transitive nor intransitive, and it is neither one-many nor many-one. Since, according to our definition, Ext(i) = {x | i R x}, we can express ‘i R x’ also in terms of ‘extension’ as ‘x ∈ Ext(i)’.

Bolzano defines a variety of relations between ideas concerning their extensions, such as the following ones: An idea i1 is compatible with an idea  i2 iff i1 and i2 share a common object, i.e. Ext(i1) ∩ Ext(i2) ≠ Ø; and i1 is included in i2 (or: i2 includes i1) iff i1 is compatible with i2 and every object of i1 is also an object of i2, i.e., Ext(i1) ∩ Ext(i2) ≠ Ø, and Ext(i1) ⊆ Ext(i2). In Bolzano's theory of ideas, precise correlates are available of basic concepts of set theory such as the empty set as well as the membership relation and the relation of inclusion between sets. Unfortunately, the clear distinction between membership and inclusion in his theory of ideas vanished in his theory of propositions due to the common form [A has b] of all propositions whereby [A] can be not only a singular, but also a general (or an empty) idea.

Already in his theory of ideas Bolzano used a method which he was very proud to have invented: the method of idea-variation. He made the most fruitful usage of this method, however, by applying it to whole propositions.

4.6 Bolzano's Method of Idea-Variation

In his analysis of propositions, Bolzano did not break through the traditional paradigms. In another respect, however, namely concerning the definition of basic semantic concepts, he opened wide the gates to modern logic. The main instrument to do so was the method of idea-variation that he invented. He himself took it to be his main contribution to logic that was for himself — who certainly did not suffer from arrogance — of “epoch making importance” (Bolzano 1838b, 150).

The basic insight underlying Bolzano's method of idea-variation is quite simple (WL II, 77 ff.). Let us take as our first example S1 the proposition [Kant is a German philosopher]. (In order to simplify matters linguistically, we do not adhere to Bolzano's formulation ‘A has b’ but will allow also formulations of the kind ‘A is (a) B’. Moreover, we will take in what follows words like ‘German’, ‘French’, ‘European’, ‘American’ etc. in the sense of ‘born in Germany’, ‘born in France’, ‘born in Europe’, ‘born in America’ etc.) We consider one or more extra-logical ideas that are parts of S1, i.e. the ideas [Kant], [German], or [philosopher], to be variable in the sense that we think that they are replaced by another idea fitting to the former one (i.e., belonging to the same “category”). In this way the idea [Kant] can be “varied” in S1 and replaced, e.g., by [Hegel]; in other words, we can substitute [Hegel] for [Kant] in S1. The variation in question is a kind of replacement or substitution. It results in a “new” (or better: in another) proposition, viz. in the true proposition [Hegel is a German philosopher]; we will say that [Hegel is a German philosopher] is the [Hegel]/[Kant]-variant of S1. A false [Kant]-variant of S1 is its [Sartre]/[Kant]-variant [Sartre is a German philosopher]. Similarly, [Kant is an European philosopher] is a true and [Kant is an American philosopher] is a false [German]-variant of S1. The operation of replacement (or substitution) can also be performed on two or more parts of a proposition simultaneously: Replacing [Kant] and [philosopher] in S1 simultaneously by, e.g., [Gauss] and [mathematician], results in the true ([Gauss], [mathematician]/[Kant], [philosopher])-variant [Gauss is a German mathematician]. A false ([Kant], [philosopher])-variant of S1 is, e.g., [Sartre is a German musician]. We can also replace all extra-logical parts of S1 simultaneously: A true ([Kant], [German], [philosopher])-variant of S1 is [Mozart is an Austrian composer], whereas [Sartre is a Greek mathematician] is a false one. Following Bolzano, we will here use this generalized operation of simultaneous replacement (or variation). Given an arbitrary proposition s and two sequences i1, i2,…, in and j1, j2,…, jn of ideas, a proposition s′ is uniquely determined by this operation; due to this operation, for each k (1 ≤ k ≤ n), the idea ik is replaced in s uniformly (i.e., wherever it “occurs” in s) by the corresponding idea jk. The resulting proposition s′ is the (j1, j2,…, jn/i1, i2,…, in)-variant of s, or — briefly put — the j/i-variant of s. (Thereby we take i = <i1, i2,…, in> and j = <j1, j2,…, jn>. Moreover, we are using here ‘s’, ‘s′’, ‘s1’, ‘s2’,… as variables for propositions, ‘i1’, ‘i2’,…, ‘j1’, ‘j2’,… as variables for ideas, and ‘i’ and ‘j’ as variables for sequences of ideas.) The close relationship between a variant of a proposition and a substitution instance of a sentence is quite obvious. In order for the i/j-variant of an arbitrary proposition s to be uniquely determined and to fulfill certain criteria of adequacy, however, several restrictions are required: (i) Each of the ik’s (1 ≤ k ≤ n) must be simple or at least “relatively” simple (in the sense that in each particular context under consideration they are not further analyzed into parts but “taken” to be simple); (ii) each of the ik’s is an extra-logical idea; (iii) the ik’s are pair-wise distinct; moreover (iv), in order to keep the result of the replacement operation “well-formed”, i.e., a genuine proposition, we must require that each jk “fits” the corresponding ik, i.e., is of the same semantic category; and finally (v), we must also require that at least one of the ideas ik must be contained in s as one of its parts so that the operation of replacement is never performed vacuously.

Instead of saying that a j/i-variant of a proposition s is true or false (or that it is a true or false variant of s), Bolzano prefers to say: j macht s hinsichtlich i wahr bzw. falsch (cf. e.g., WL II, 79, 113 ff.), i.e.: j verifies or falsifies s with respect to i (or, more literally: j makes s true or false with respect to i).

As far as our first example S1 is concerned, there are true as well as false variants of it with respect to every single extra-logical part of it and also with respect to every sequence of such parts. But now let us consider the following expamle S2: [Every German philosopher is European]. It has true as well as false [German]-variants, [European]-variants, ([German], [philosopher])-variants, ([German], [European])-variants, ([philosopher], [European])-variants and also ([German], [philosopher], [European])-variants. But obviously, all [philosopher]-variants of S2 must be true — provided, says Bolzano, that their subject idea is non-empty. This proviso is a typical feature of Bolzano's approach and mentioned by him again and again, since — according to his truth condition — a proposition with an empty subject idea is trivially false. By variation of the subject idea of a proposition or of parts of it, however, we will in most cases also have variants with empty subject ideas, and only in exceptional cases all variants of a proposition could therefore turn out to be true. If all i-variants of a proposition s with an non-empty subject idea are true, Bolzano will say that s is universally valid with respect to i. Hereby we have to take into account, that for Bolzano also in his meta-language words such as ‘all’, ‘every’ or ‘each’ have existential import and that therefore his definition must explicitly stated as follows (WL II, 82):

A proposition s is universally valid (allgemeingültig) with respect to a sequence i of ideas iff there is at least one true i-variant of s, and every i-variant of s with a non-empty subject idea is true.

Analogously we can define what it is for a proposition to be universally contravalid:

A proposition s is universally contravalid (allgemeinungültig) with respect to a sequence i of ideas iff every i-variant of s is false.

[Every German philosopher is American] is an example of a proposition that is universally contra­valid with respect to [philosopher].

If a proposition is universally valid or universally contravalid with respect to i, Bolzano says that it is analytic with respect to i, otherwise, that it is synthetic with respect to i. If a proposition is analytic or synthethic with respect to at least one sequence i, Bolzano calls it ‘analytic’ or ‘synthetic’, respectively, without further qualification (WL II, 83–89, 331–338). Herewith Bolzano starts a new tradition of usage of the term ‘analytic’ as opposed to that from Kant up to Carnap and Quine: Whereas in this latter tradition the term ‘analytic’ includes exclusively true propositions, in Bolzano's terminology also all universally contravalid propositions are subsumed under this term; and even a universally valid proposition could be false if it has an empty subject idea but all of its variants with non-empty subject ideas are true. (On this point, however, Bolzano is not always consistent.)

Logical properties of a proposition are — according to a classical view — of a formal character, i.e., they are primarily properties of the form of a proposition rather than of the proposition itself. This allows us to present Bolzano's view also in an alternative way. Bolzano himself identifies explicitly the form of a proposition with a set of propositions (WL I, 48, WL II, 82): The form of a proposition s with respect to a sequence i of ideas or (as an abbreviation) the i-form of s is the set of all i-variants of s, provided that at least one of the ik’s is contained in s. (For cases in which this proviso is not met, neither an i-variant of s nor the i-form of s is defined.) A propositional i-form can therefore be defined as the i-form of at least one proposition s; and a propositional form is a propositional i-form with respect to at least one sequence i. Due to the proviso mentioned, a propositional form as defined before can never be empty or a singleton. We can now define universal validity and universal contravalidity first for a propositional form and subsequently for a proposition in the following way:

A propositional form F is universally valid iff at least one member of F is true, and every member of F with a non-empty subject idea is true; F is universally contravalid iff every member of F is false.

A proposition s is universally valid (or universally contravalid, respectively) with respect to a sequence i of ideas iff there is a propositional form F such that F is a propositional i-form which is universally valid (or contravalid, respectively), and s is a member of F.

s is analytic with respect to i iff s is universally valid or universally contravalid with respect to i; s is synthetic with respect to i iff s is not analytic with respect to i.

s is analytic (or synthetic, respectively) iff s is analytic (or synthetic, respectively) with respect to at least one sequence i.

4.7 Bolzano's Definition of Logical Truth

The result of applying the operation of variation to a proposition depends essentially on our choice of ideas to be varied in the proposition in question. And it can depend on matters of fact whether or not a proposition is universally valid (or contravalid) with respect to a sequence i of ideas. Thus, e.g., it is due to the fact that every German is European that the proposition [Every German philosopher is European] is universally valid with respect to [philosopher]. From a logical point of view, the most interesting results will turn up if all extra-logical parts of a proposition, which are simple (or — as explained before — “relatively” simple), are taken to be variable (WL II, 84). To simplify matters, we will assume for what follows that for any proposition s there is always fixed a certain alphabetic order of all extra-logical simple ideas contained in it; thereby, for every proposition s, a sequence is of all extra-logical simple ideas contained in s is uniquely determined. It would appear that we now could define the concepts of logico-universal validity and logico-universal contravalidity in the following way: A proposition s is logico-universally valid, or — put briefly — logically true, iff s is universally valid with respect to is; s is logico-universally contravalid, or — put briefly — logically false, iff s is universally contravalid with respect to is; s is logically analytic iff s logically true or logically false; and s is logically synthetic iff  s is not logically analytic.

In proceeding this way, however, we would have to face serious problems concerning purely logical propositions, i.e., propositions all of whose parts are purely logical ideas. Due to our requirements (ii) and (v) above concerning Bolzano's replacement operation, the is-variant of a purely logical proposition is not defined; in consequence the preceding definitions of logical truth, logical falsity and logical analyticity are not applicable to purely logical propositions, since they do not contain any extra-logical idea. Consider, however, the following three purely logical propositions: [There is something, or it is not the case that there is something], [There is something, and it is not the case that there is something], and [There is something]. The first of these three propositions is obviously logically true, the second one logically false, and the third one is neither logically true nor logically false. Giving up requirement (v), as some would like to have it, results in a purely logical proposition being its only own is-variant; that, however, would turn every purely logical proposition either into a logical truth or into a logical falsity according to our definition, in contrast to the fact that the proposition [There is something] is not logically analytic.

A posssible way out of this dilemma is to choose the alternative procedure sketched above by taking these logical properties primarily to be properties of propositional forms. Thereby the logical form of a proposition s is identified with the set of all of its is-variants; F is a logical propositional form therefore iff it is the logical form of at least one proposition. (Please note that according to this approach, the logical form of a purely logical proposition is not even defined; nevertheless, a purely logical proposition can be a member of a purely logical propositional form.) We will define first the relevant properties for propositional forms:

A propositional form F is logically valid iff F is a logical propositional form that is universally valid, i.e., at least one of its members is true, and all of its members with non-empty subject ideas are true.

F is logically contravalid iff F is a logical propositional form, and all of its members are false.

We then define the corresponding properties for single propositions:

A proposition s is logically true iff there is a propositional form F such that F is logically valid and s is a member of F.

s is logically false iff there is a propositional form F such that F is logically contravalid and s is a member of F.

s is logically analytic iff s is logically true or logically false.

s is logically synthetic iff s is not logically analytic.

It is easy to find an example of each of these kinds of propositions: the proposition [Every German philosopher is German] is logically true, the proposition [Kant is German and Kant is non-German] is logically false, and the proposition [Kant is a German philosopher] is logically synthetic.

4.8 Bolzano's Definition of Material Consequence and of Logical Consequence

Bolzano's logical World 3 includes in addition to ideas and propositions also what we will call ‘arguments’. Bolzano is dealing with arguments at lengths in his Theory of Science (cf., e.g., WL II, 113 ff., 391 ff.), but he does not introduce a name for them. Following the general line of his terminology, he could have called them ‘Schlüsse an sich’ (‘derivations in themselves’ or ‘inferences in themselves’), but he did not; he rather used this term for a certain kind of propositions, namely for propositions stating that a proposition follows (or — in his words — is ableitbar, i.e., derivable) from a set of propositions (WL I, 213, WL II, 200; for another usage of the same term by Bolzano cf. section 5.4). A Bolzanian argument consists of two sets of propositions: the set of its premises and the set of its conclusions. In order to simplify matters, we will assume here that an argument has always a single proposition (rather than a whole set of propositions) as its conclusion, and we will identify an argument with an ordered pair <σ, s> consisting of a set σ of propositions (i.e., the set of premises) and a single proposition s (i.e., the conclusion).

Bolzano first explains what it means that a single proposition s is derivable (ableitbar) from a set σ of propositions with respect to a certain sequence i of ideas (WL II, 113 ff., 198 ff.). Since Bolzano's term ‘Ableitbarkeit’ (‘derivability’) is used nowadays in a purely syntactical sense, we use here instead the more common phrases ‘s follows from σ with respect to i’ or ‘s is a consequence of σ with respect to i’.

We have explained Bolzano's method of idea-variation in section 4.6 with respect to single propositions. In order to apply it also to arguments, we have now to extend our original definitions to whole sets of propositions. In applying the operation of variation to a set σ of propositions, each member of σ is replaced by its corresponding variant: The j/i-variant of a set σ of propositions is the set of all the j/i-variants of the members of σ. We will say of a set σ of propositions that it is true iff each of its members is true; and we will say that a sequence j of ideas verifies a set σ of propositions with respect to i iff j verifies each member of σ with respect to i, i.e., iff the j/i-variant of each member of σ is true. A proposition s follows from a set σ of propositions (or, in other words, s is a consequence of σ) with respect to a sequence i of ideas iff every sequence j of ideas that verifies σ with respect to i verifies s as well with respect to i.

 In transferring this formulation into a formal definition, we have to bear in mind again that ‘every’ has existential import also in Bolzano's meta-language. The formal definition has therefore to be stated as follows:

s follows from σ with respect to i (or: s is a consequence of σ with respect to i) iff there is a sequence j of ideas such that j verifies σ with respect to i, and every sequence j of ideas which verifies σ with respect to i, verifies s likewise with respect to i.

In this sense, e.g., the proposition [Kant is European] follows from the set {[Kant is a philosopher], [Every philosopher is German]} with respect to the idea [philosopher]. The conclusion follows, so to speak, “materially” from the premises, or is a “material” consequence of the premises, due to the fact that every German is European. This is not enough, of course, for an argument to be logically correct. In order to be logically correct, the conclusion s of an argument <σ, s> must logically follow from σ, i.e., s must be a logical consequence of σ (WL II, 391–395; the similarity with the distinction between material and formal consequence in Tarski 1956, 419, is obvious). A simple definition of logical consequence seems to suggest itself: s follows logically from σ (or: s is a logical consequence of σ) iff s follows from σ with respect to the sequence iσ∪{s} of all extra-logical simple ideas contained in σ or s.

This simple answer, however, faces the same problems as the corresponding answer with respect to logical truth (cf. section 4.7).  In a similar way as with logical truth, we must also here give priority to the logical form of an argument and then proceed by this means to define the concept of logical consequence for particular arguments. This, however, will not be elaborated on here, but rather will be developed in the following supplementary document, in which also the material of sections 4.6 and 4.7 is reconstructed in a more technical way:

A Formal Reconstruction of Bolzano's Definitions of Logical Truth and Logical Consequence

4.9 Further Applications of the Method of Idea-Variation

Beyond the usage of the method of idea-variation for his truly pioneering definitions of logical truth and logical consequence and related concepts (such as the concepts of satisfiability and compatibility), Bolzano made use of this method also for a series of other purposes, above all in his development of the theory of probability (WL II, 77–82, 171–191, 509–514, WL III, 136–138, 263–288, 559–568, RW II, 39–49, 57–61, 66–71). Bolzano's theory of probability is based on his distinction of different degrees of validity of a proposition s with respect to a sequence i of ideas. This degree of validity of s with respect to i is representable as a fractional number m/n where n is the number of all possible variants of s with respect to i and m is the number of true variants of s with respect to i. If all variants of s with respect to i with non-empty subject ideas are true, m = n and m/n = 1, i.e., s is universally valid with respect to i; if all variants are false, m = 0 and m/n = 0, i.e., s is universally contravalid with respect to i (WL II, 81 f.).

The logical degree of validity of s is then the degree of validity of s with respect to is, i.e., with respect to a certain sequence of all simple extra-logical ideas contained in s. In order to be able to apply this notion in a useful way, we have to explain how to count the variants of a proposition, since for each variant of a proposition (as for each proposition in general) there are infinitely many others that are logically equivalent to it (e.g., due to replacing a part [b] of the proposition by [non-non-b], [non-non-non-non-b] etc.). If we would count all of them, the resulting fractional number would not be very informative. Bolzano was completely aware of this problem (WL II, 79 f.), and he was very creative in developing methods for solving it as well as many other puzzling problems.

Bolzano is not content with this concept of probability simpliciter but rather continues to develop an even more important relative concept of probability. What is at stake here is the probability of a proposition s relative to a set σ of propositions with respect to a sequence i of ideas, and in particular with respect to iσ∪{s}, i.e., the sequence of all simple extra-logical ideas contained in s or σ. Its degree can again be represented by a fractional number 0 ≤ m/n ≤ 1, where n is the number of cases where σ comes out true and m is the number of cases where σ ∪ {s} comes out true (WL II, 171–191; for a careful reconstruction of Bolzano's theory of probability see Berg 1962, 148–150; cf. also Dorn 1987, and Berg 1992b).

In his Tractatus (5.15) Ludwig Wittgenstein came so close to Bolzano's definition of probability that Georg Henrik von Wright felt it to be appropriate “to speak of one definition of probability here and call it the Bolzano-Wittgenstein definition” (Wright 1982, pp. 144 f.).

Bolzano's work on probability was not only of purely theoretical interest to him but also had interesting practical consequences with respect to problems in the philosophy of science (cf. section 5) and in particular also with respect to religious questions (cf. section 9).

5. Epistemology and Philosophy of Science

Bolzano strove for objectivity in “pure logic”. In “applied logic”, in particular in epistemology, however, we have to take into account also the real, i.e., empirical, conditions of the human mind and thinking according to Bolzano (WL I, 66 f.). Nevertheless, he defined  the basic concepts of epistemology primarily on the level of ideas and propositions. This gave rise to the misunderstanding that his investigations are worthless for epistemology proper or even that there is no epistemology proper at all in Bolzano's work. The fact that this is by no means the case, will — hopefully — be shown by the following examples taken from Bolzano's epistemology.

5.1 “Appearances” of Propositions and Ideas in Human Minds

In epistemology, we are primarily and directly not concerned with propositions and ideas, but rather with their appearances (Erscheinungen) in the minds of thinking beings (“im Gemüt von geistigen bzw. denkenden Wesen”). One and the same proposition or idea can, as Bolzano says, appear in the minds of different thinking beings or also at different times in the mind of one and the same thinking being, without thereby being multiplied (WL I, 217, WL III, 13, 112). Bolzano says, in such a case, that the thinking being and its mind “grasp” the proposition or idea in question (the corresponding German word being ‘erfassen’ or ‘auffassen’). What happens in such a case is that in the mind of the thinking being under consideration there is (or “appears”) a mental phenomenon, or a mental process takes place in it, that is called by Bolzano a ‘Gedanke’ (‘thought’); it can be a subjective idea or a subjective proposition.

In contrast to ideas and propositions (i.e., “objective” ideas and “objective” propositions), subjective ideas and subjective propositions belong to the real world, in particular to World 2. For Bolzano, a subjective idea as well as a subjective proposition is a real property (or “adherence”) of the thinking being in whose mind it appears, or rather of this being's mind or “soul” itself (WL III, 6, 10 f., 109). A subjective idea is a mental phenomenon — i.e., an attribute of a mind — that “grasps” an idea (in the “objective” sense of the word); and a mental phenomenon that “grasps” a proposition is called ‘Urteil’ (‘judgment’) by Bolzano (WL III, 108). In addition to judgments, there is a second kind of subjective propositions, viz. propositions that are “merely thought” (bloß gedacht); a “merely thought proposition” is in fact a subjective idea of a proposition (WL I, 155). Merely having a subjective idea of a proposition does not require that we assert that this proposition is true, whereas a judgment is an act (Handlung) of asserting that the proposition grasped by the judgment is true (WL III, 108, 199).

When we say of a subjective idea or a judgment that it “grasps” an idea or proposition, respectively, the word ‘grasp’ is used in a more restrictive sense than before, where it was a thinking being or its mind of which it was said that it “grasps” an idea or proposition. This stricter relation between subjective ideas and ideas, and between judgments and propositions is fundamental for Bolzano's epistemology. Instead of saying in this sense ‘p grasps o’, Bolzano will synonymous­ly also use the phrase ‘o is the material (Stoff) of p’. Both formulations, however, are — as Bolzano emphasizes — to be understood merely metaphorically (Bolzano 1935, 84 f.). The corresponding relation is introduced as a primitive concept in Bolzano's epistemology. Let us use the symbol ‘G’ for this relation, whereby ‘p G o’ is to be read as ‘p grasps o’ or, alternatively, ‘o is the material of p’.

In terms of ‘G’, i.e., the strict relation of “grasping”, the weaker relation of “grasping” between a thinking being and an idea or proposition can be defined as follows: a thinking being x “grasps” (in the weaker sense of this word) an idea or proposition o iff there is a subjective idea or a judgment p in x’s mind such that p G o. The relation G is the link between the mental phenomena of World 2 on the one hand and the World 3 of ideas and propositions on the other hand. Via relation G, items of World 3 can have a certain, non-causal influence on the mental phenomena of World 2, and these on their part stand in causal relations to the physical phenomena of World 1.

Due to the domain and the range of G being disjunctive sets, the relation G has the following formal features: it is irreflexive, asymmetric, and transitive; moreover, G is many-one, but not one-many. Due to G’s being many-one, by each subjective idea and each judgment an idea or a proposition, respectively, is uniquely determined as its material (WL III, 8 f., 108). Most of the important properties, relations and distinctions, which were defined by Bolzano primarily for ideas and propositions, can therefore easily be transferred from the sphere of ideas and propositions to the sphere of subjective ideas and judgments. We therefore will say of a subjective idea that it is simple or complex, empty, singular or general, an intuition, a concept or “mixed” according as the idea grasped by it has the corresponding property; and the same goes for judgments. 

5.2 Subjective Intuitions and Subjective Concepts

An intuition is for Bolzano an idea that is simple and singular (cf. section 4.5). The question arises immediately whether such an intuition exists after all and — if so — what it can contribute to epistemology. Both questions are answered by Bolzano at once: In order to show that there are intuitions, he hints at subjective ideas (ideas in our minds) that grasp “objective” intuitions as defined before; and since these subjective intuitions exist in our actual world, the corresponding “objective” intuitions must exist (in the sense of ‘es gibt’) in the logical realm of World 3. What are the examples of subjective intuitions, however, that Bolzano can put forward in support of his claim? It is subjective ideas such as the subjective idea of the change in our mind that is the immediate reaction on an outer object (such as a rose) that stimulates our senses. In everyday language we usually express such an idea only by the word ‘that’ (‘dieses’ or — in Bolzano's old-fashioned orthography — ‘dieß’). Bolzano's rather long-winded explication (in WL I, 326 f.) reveals subjective ideas of a particular sensation or sense-datum as his favorite examples of subjective intuitions (cf. also WL III, 21 f.). The object and the cause of a subjective intuition of this kind is itself a mental phenomenon such as a subjective idea or a judgment (WL III, 85). If a subjective intuition is directly caused by an “outer” object, Bolzano calls it an ‘outer intuition’. Also in the case of an outer intuition, its proper object is not the “outer” cause of it but an “inner” mental event; human beings are capable only of having subjective intuitions whose proper object is a change in their mind (WL III, 89, 145). In other passages Bolzano seems to be less cautious and claims also of an idea such as [Vesuvius] (WL II, 38) or [Socrates] (WL I, 260, in explicit contradiction to WL III, 89) to be a pure intuition. This would obviously result in taking each rigid designator (in today's terminology) to express an intuition.

In the same way in which a subjective intuition is defined as a subjective idea that “grasps” (in the sense of G) an “objective” intuition, we can also define subjective concepts and “mixed” subjective ideas (WL III, 21–23).

5.3 Judgments A Priori and A Posteriori

Using the distinction between intuitions and other ideas, Bolzano is now able to draw an important epistemological distinction among propositions and in particular also among true propositions: A proposition is a conceptual proposition iff it does not contain any intuition but consists exclusively of concepts, such as the propositions [God is omnipotent], [Gratefulness is a duty], or [√2 is irrational]; all the other propositions are called ‘empirical propositions’ (or also ‘perceptual prop­ositions’) by Bolzano, e.g. [That is a flower], or [Socrates was an Athenian] (WL II, 33 f.). There is no problem in transferring this distinction from the sphere of prop­ositions to the sphere of judgments, since (as already mentioned) by every judgment a certain proposition is uniquely determined (via relation G) as its “material” (WL III, 115).

At first glance, this objective distinction among propositions seems to be far away from the Kantian distinction between judgments a priori and a posteriori. Nevertheless, the two distinctions are closely interrelated, and they almost coincide (WL II, 36); hence, Bolzano warns against confusing them (WL IV, 451 f.). The close relationship of the two distinctions becomes obvious as soon as we ask ourselves how to discover of a conceptual or an empirical proposition whether or not it is true: In the case of conceptual propositions, it is mere reflection, i.e., an inner “inspection” of our subjective concepts, without any experience, that is required to find out whether or not it is true, whereas in the case of an empirical proposition experience is indispensable for judging its truth or falsity (WL II, 36). This Kantian distinction of the different ways of recognizing the truth or falsity of such judgments, however, as important as it is, must be based on the more fundamental objective distinction between conceptual and empirical propositions on Bolzano’s view.

Empirical propositions contain at least one intuition. Most important are those empirical propositions whose subject idea is an intuition. These are propositions about perceptions or sensations, i.e., in Bolzano's words, about certain changes in our minds, caused by other inner events or by external sensory stimuli. Starting with empirical propositions of this kind whose subject idea is usually expressed by a word such as ‘that’, denoting, e.g., a certain color sensation, how can we come to an objective description of our world?

For Bolzano every proposition is either true or false, and this forever — or better: timelessly. If we get under certain circumstances the impression that one and the same proposition can sometimes be true and sometimes be false, this is merely due to the fact that we do not talk about a proposition but about an ambiguous linguistic chain of words that expresses two or even more propositions, some of which can be true and others false (WL II, 7). If it is the proposition itself, however, of which we get the impression that it can be true as well as false, this is due to the fact that we take a part of it to be variable (WL II, 77); in this case again we do not consider a single proposition, but a whole set of propositions, i.e., a propositional form. In the expression ‘It is snowing’, e.g., time and place are not determined, and it therefore does not express a proposition, but rather a propositional form, indicated by ‘It is snowing at time t at place l’. In order to express a proposition, the variables have to be replaced; Bolzano usually replaces them — for convenience — by indexicals, e.g., ‘It is snowing today and here’ (WL I, 113).

Even if Bolzano makes extensive usage of indexicals in the expression of ideas and propositions, there is no place for indexicals within his World 3: There are neither indexical ideas nor indexical propositions; what sometimes seems to be an indexical idea or proposition is in fact merely an indexical expression of an idea or proposition. (See, however, an opposite view defended in Textor 1996.) In view of this, it is highly interesting that the indexicals ‘that’ and ‘I’ play such a prominent role in Bolzano's work, in particular in his epistemology (in WL III). The reason for this seems to be that our empirical knowledge is based on immediate perceptual judgments, i.e., judgments that “grasp” (in the sense of G) a certain kind of an empirical proposition. The subjective subject idea of such an immediate perceptual judgment is a subjective intuition for whose expression an indexical such as ‘that’ or ‘I’ seems to be indispensable.

Bolzano quite clearly faced the problem of how to get from these immediate perceptual judgments expressed by means of indexicals to an objective description of our world. His epistemology therefore reminds us in many respects of the discussion concerning phenomenalism and physicalism in the Vienna Circle and even more of Bertrand Russell's program in his Inquiry into Meaning and Truth (Russell 1940). The highly interesting similarities between Bolzano's and Russell's program still await further investigation.

5.4 Immediate and Mediated Judgments

Judgments are psychical phenomena and they belong therefore not to World 3 but to our real world. Each judgment is an act or event that takes place at a certain time in a certain mind and is herewith part of a causal network. As a part of our real world, each judgment comes into being in time (and will pass away later on). From an epistemological point of view it is of particular relevance whether a judgment is caused or mediated by other judgments or whether this is not the case, i.e., whether the judgment is “immediate” (WL III, 123 ff.). If a judgment m is caused or mediated by a set μ of judgments, Bolzano calls the mind's transition from μ to m ‘Schluss’ (‘inference’), as distinct from the usage of this term explained in section 4.8. An inference in this sense is a mental process (belonging to World 2) of inferring a judgment m from a set μ of others; we can represent it by <μ, m>. Such an inference — as opposed to an “inference in itself” or an argument — is a causal process, to be clear. Since by each of the judgments involved in an inference — by the members of μ as well as by m — a proposition is uniquely determined (due to G) as its “material”, by every inference <μ, m> an argument <σ, s> is uniquely determined, for which Bolzano has defined what it means that s is a logical consequence of σ, or that s has a certain logical probability > ½ relative to σ. These properties can then be applied indirectly to <μ, m> and used for its evaluation (see the following section 5.5).

From the obvious existence of mediated judgments, however, it follows that there must also be immediate judgments (WL III, 125, 138–139). Immediate judgments cannot be false and must therefore be certain (WL III, 212, 263). Certainty has thereby not to be taken in its objective sense in which a proposition s is certain relative to a set σ of propositions iff the logical probability of s relative to σ is 1, i.e., iff s is a logical consequence of σ (WL II, 173). In the present context, certainty must rather be taken in a subjective sense in which it is primarily a property of a judgment; if two judgments grasp one and the same proposition, one of them can be certain (in this subjective sense of the term) whereas the other one is not (WL III, 263 f.). As the two most important immediate judgments among the empirical ones Bolzano mentions judgments of the form “I — have — an appearance X” and “That (what I just now perceive of) — has — property b” (WL III, 139). Judgments of these two kinds are called ‘(immediate) perceptual judgments’, whereas the term ‘empirical judgment’ is normally used only for mediated judgments containing a subjective intuition (WL III, 131 f.). The propositions “grasped” by these immediate perceptual judgments are empirical propositions whose subject ideas are intuitions that are usually expressed by means of the indexicals ‘I’ and ‘that’. Bolzano's philosophy of science can thus be found to be empiricist, founded on a phenomenalist basis.

With respect to all judgments m mediated by a set μ of judgments, it is of high relevance whether the argument <σ, s> corresponding to <μ, m> fulfills certain criteria. In the sections 4.7 and 4.8 we have already dealt with two properties of <σ, s> that can easily be transferred to <μ, m> and must here primarily be taken into consideration: it is on the one hand the property of s being a logical consequence of σ, and on the other hand the property of s having a certain degree of logical probability > ½ relative to σ. With respect to empirical judgments, considerations of probability are in the foreground.

Logical consequence “transfers” certainty, also in its subjective sense, from the premises to the conclusion of an inference. That is to say, if each member of a set μ of judgments is certain for a person A (as is the case for each immediate judgment), and if a judgment m is mediated or caused by μ insofar as it is inferred by A from μ as a logical consequence of it, then m is also certain for A (WL III, 264 f.). Hereby it is not enough, of course, for the argument <σ, s> corresponding to <μ, m> that s is a logical consequence of σ, but it is required that A infers m from μ in virtue of (kraft) this logical relation.

Error and uncertainty have two possible sources according to Bolzano: either the premises that one presupposes are uncertain (or even false), or one has used a mere probability inference (WL III, 265 f.), i.e., an inference whose conclusion asserts the truth of a proposition s itself instead of merely asserting the truth of the proposition [s is probable] (WL II 510). Considerations of this kind amount to quite a refined epistemological system of subjective probability, in which Bolzano distinguishes degrees of credibility and of assurance by using his probability theory (WL III, 274–288). Unfortunately, these investigations are little known, since they are only developed in the third volume of his Theory of Science which receives far less attention than it deserves. (For a reconstruction of these ideas cf. Berg 2003a.)

5.5 The Entailment Relation

In addition to logical consequence and probability, there is a third category, however, that is brought into play by Bolzano within this context: it is the relation which obtains between a set σ of propositions and a proposition s iff σ is the “objective ground” of s or — in other words — iff s “follows objectively” from σ; in today’s terminology we say instead that σ entails s or that s is entailed by σ. This relation of entailment (Abfolge) is — to be clear — primarily not an epistemological relation but — like (logical) consequence and (logical) probability — a relation between a set of propositions and a single proposition (WL II, 339 ff., WL III, 495 f.).

Bolzano's favorite way of explaining this concept is by means of two inferences whose corresponding arguments are <Σ1, S1>; and <Σ2, S2> such that the following holds: S1 describes the rising of a thermometer at a certain moment of time at a certain place, and S2 describes the rising of the temperature at the same place and time. Σ1 contains the law that from the rising of temperature the extension of a liquid (in the thermometer) will follow plus the required antecedent conditions, whereas Σ2 contains the proposition that if a thermometer at a certain time and place rises then also the temperature there will rise plus the corresponding antecedent conditions. (Sometimes Bolzano also uses an analogous example with atmosphere pressure and barometer.) Let us assume that we have constructed the two arguments in such a way that both, S1 is a logical consequence of Σ1 and S2 is a logical consequence of Σ2. Nevertheless, Bolzano argues, there is an essential difference between the two examples insofar as Σ1 is the ground for S1, and S1 is therefore entailed by Σ1, whereas this is not true for <Σ2, S2> (RW I, 13 f., WL II, 341, WL IV, 15, 32–34, 261–263, 385 ff.,  493, 580 f.). In Aristotle's words (Analytica posteriora I, ch. 13), by deducing S2 from Σ2 we merely show that S2 is true, whereas by deducing S1 from Σ1 we show why S1 is true; following Aristotle, Thomas Aquinas distinguished between a demonstratio quia and a demonstratio propter quid (cf. Summa Theologiae I, quaestio 2, art.2).

In Bolzano's example, what is described by Σ1 is the cause of the phenomenon described by S1. The entailment relation is not restricted, however, to these cases where it mirrors causality of our real world on the level of propositions in World 3; for Bolzano there are also obvious examples of the entailment relation in mathematics and ethics (e.g., WL II, 348).

The argument <Σ2, S2> provides us with an instance of a proposition s being a logical consequence of a set σ of propositions without being entailed by σ. Can a proposition s also conversely be entailed by σ without being a logical consequence of σ? Bolzano guesses that this is possible but he is not definitive about it (WL III, 346–348).

The two relations are clearly distinct from one another anyway since the entailment relation is — unlike the relation of logical consequence — asymmetrical, intransitive, and irreflexive. In spite of a certain lack of clarity in Bolzano's explication, it is obvious that his concept of entailment is of great relevance not only for the philosophy of empirical sciences but also with respect to proof theory. It has been pointed out that there are interesting parallels between Bolzano's semantic notion of entailment and Gentzen's syntactic concept of “normal proofs” (cf. Berg 1962, 151–164, and Buhl 1958, 85 f.).

6. Ethics

In addition to his trail blazing works in logic, Bolzano made valuable contributions to other subdisciplines of philosophy such as ethics. Ethical considerations entered, to be sure, into various works of Bolzano, especially of course into the ones concerning the science of religion, but also (which is perhaps to be expected less) into the logical ones. These ethical considerations of Bolzano have their origin already at the beginning of his course of studies (when he attempted to support his decision regarding studies and profession by appeal to general ethical principles) and exerted great influence on his other works in different areas. They were, however, never published together; an abstract can be found in Bolzano 1968a.

6.1 Critique of Kant's Categorical Imperative

Kant was for Bolzano throughout his life a permanent challenge that stimulated him to develop original ideas. When he was eighteen years old, he already studied Kant's Critique of Pure Reason. Of particular interest for Bolzano was Kant's moral philosophy. The Categorical Imperative was from the very beginning a target of his critique. “The first points in which he [i.e., Bolzano] thought he could definitely accuse Kant of being in error concerned the highest moral principle”, Bolzano writes in his notes about himself in the third person (Bolzano 1977, 68). In the Textbook of the Science of Religion, Bolzano subjected the Categorical Imperative to a careful critique (RW I, 253 ff.).

Bolzano's main objection against the Categorical Imperative was that we cannot derive from it alone — as Kant supposed — whether a given act ought to be done or not. Kant's instruction to ask ourselves of a maxim whether we can will without contradicting ourselves that it should become a universal law is of no use, according to Bolzano, since for him there is no practical proposition or ought proposition whose contradictory opposite is self-contradictory. This, however, is not a decisive argument against Kant's Categorical Imperative for several reasons. Nevertheless, Bolzano refused to accept the Categorical Imperative strictly and replaced it with the utilitarian principle of “the advancement of the general welfare”, as he proudly reports in his autobiography (Bolzano 1836, 23).

6.2 Bolzano's Highest Moral Law

The highest moral law that Bolzano put in place of Kant's Categorical Imperative was by no means original. Bolzano, however, modified and justified it in an original way and consistently applied it to many different areas; it is decisive, according to Bolzano, also in the realm of the sciences (cf. WL IV, 23–28) and even in fine art, poetry, and music (RW IV, 295–298; Bolzano 1843c, 72).

By the highest moral law Bolzano means “a practical truth [i.e., a true ought proposition] from which every other practical truth […] can be objectively derived, i.e., as the consequence from its ‘ground’” (RW I, 228; cf. also RW I, 44, 256, RW IV, 27, 221, and WL II, 348); in other words, the highest moral law is a practical truth from which every other practical truth is derivable by “drawing upon a merely theoretical Untersatz (minor premise)” (RW I, 244; cf. also RW IV, 217, WL IV, 178). Thus, on the basis of the asymmetry of Bolzano's entailment relation (Abfolge), the highest moral law must be an ought proposition that does not objectively follow from (i.e., it is not entailed by) any other ought proposition. It must therefore be “an original or unconditional practical truth” (RW I, 229), a principle (RW IV, 207), or a basic truth, i.e., a truth that does not have an objective “ground”, but can only be an objective “ground” of other (practical) truths (WL II, 375). If there is only one such practical truth, this must itself be the highest moral law; if, however, there are several ones, the highest moral law is to be found in their conjunction (RW I, 229 f.).

Bolzano's highest moral law consists in the utilitarian requirement of advancing the general welfare (RW IV, 206, 227, 236; Bolzano 1836, 23, 43; WL IV, 26 f., 178). Briefly, this highest moral law is formulated thus: “Strive to bring about the greatest amount of happiness” (RW I, 250), or: “Always act as the best for all or the welfare of the whole demands” (RW IV, 216, also 218, 221, and 229). On the basis of careful considerations, Bolzano arrives at the following definitive version of his highest moral law:

Always choose from all actions that are possible for you the one which, all consequences considered, most advances the welfare of the whole, in whatever parts (RW I, 236; cf. WL IV, 119).

Bolzano specifies the content of the thus obtained formulation of the highest moral law in several respects, such as the following ones (RW I, 235):

  1. Of which beings is the happiness advanced? Answer: of all sentient beings, at least insofar as this is possible without restricting the happiness of other beings.
  2. To what degree is the happiness of sentient beings advanced? Answer: to the highest degree that is possible for us.
  3. Which of two actions ought one to choose, of which one advances one's own happiness and the other advances the happiness of someone else to a greater degree? Answer: the second action.

Bolzano's explanations exhibit a remarkable awareness of problems. Thus, he points out that all sentient or “animal” beings are equal and must be equally involved in the increase of happiness or decrease of suffering (RW I, 235). The addendum that this goes for beings “for whom there are no varying degrees of virtue” indicates that Bolzano would allow for certain distinctions in the case of beings which are capable of virtuousness (and for which there are consequently also differences of degree in regard to kinds of happiness which other beings cannot appreciate). The capacity of virtuousness is therefore — no less than sentience — a morally relevant quality for him. In this Bolzano agrees with considerations in contemporary ethics, according to which the quality of personhood is, in addition to sentience, morally relevant.

In the moral assessment of an action, not only its effects on beings that are capable of virtue and are rational must be taken into account, but also its effects on animals (RW IV, 205, 227), and even its effects in the inanimate realm (RW IV, 205). If, e.g., two actions have an equally advantageous influence on rational beings, though one of them causes pain for an animal and this is not so in the case of the other action, it is quite obvious that we ought to choose the latter (RW I, 255). And, similarly, it seems clear that we ought to forgo a small pleasure if we can free an animal from excruciating pain by doing so (Bolzano 1935, 56). With this conception Bolzano was far ahead of the usual ideas of morality and of law during his time. It is therefore no wonder that he — like many utilitarians today — had to defend himself against the reproach of putting animals on a par with human beings, i.e., of either reducing man to animal or of elevating animal to man, and thus granting equal rights to animals and human beings. This, however, does not follow from his principle, since not all animals are receptive to one and the same degree of pleasure and of the feeling of pain (Bolzano 1935, 56), and it is not only sentience that is morally relevant. The extent to which the inclusion of animals in ethics was a matter of concern for Bolzano is also clear from the fact that he even draws upon the ban on the torture of animals and generally the duties towards animals in his Theory of Science as examples for the elucidation of methodological rules (WL III, 570, WL IV, 196).

Bolzano discusses 18 different principles that were proposed in the course of the history of philosophy as a highest moral law (RW I, 242–258). He attempts to show for each of these principles, one by one, that his highest moral law is not only distinct from it, but is superior to it. Bolzano also enters into a detailed discussion in reply to objections against his highest moral law. He gave much thought regarding the selection of these objections, since he uses his replies to them for further important clarification concerning his highest moral law.

Bolzano stresses that one must “not only look at the proximate consequences of each action, but also at further ones” in assessing an action according to the principle of advancing the general welfare (RW I, 237). Since we can never know all the consequences of an action, the principle of advancing the general welfare demands that we always decide in favor of the action which seems most conducive to the welfare of the whole according to those consequences thereof which we can foresee arising from it (RW I, 241).

With a similar argument Bolzano replies to the objection that according to his principle the moral value of our actions would depend on mere chance, as the following example seems to show: “If someone with the intention of killing his neighbor drew a dagger against him, but accidentally only opened a boil and this were now healed thereby, he would have performed a good work”. This view, however, rests on a misunderstanding, according to Bolzano, since for him “the moral goodness of an action (i.e., its claim to being rewardable) is always a matter of whether the action has been undertaken with a view to agreeing with the law” (RW I, 240). From this reply it is clear that Bolzano is no “pure” consequentialist, since the moral assessment of an action for him depends not only on its factual or foreseeable consequences, but also — and indeed only (in terms of his exact words) — on the view or intention in which the action is executed. (For a careful analysis of Bolzano's highest moral law cf. Künne 1999.)

6.3 Bolzano's Ethics as a “Mixed” Normative Theory

Bolzano developed and understood his ethics as a counter position to Kant's ethics. However, Bolzano's ethics also contains an essential viewpoint of Kantian ethics: The only thing that can be g