Mental Causation
Worries about mental causation are prominent in contemporary discussions of the mind and human agency. Originally, the problem of mental causation was that of understanding how a mental substance (thought to be immaterial) could interact with a material substance, a body. Most philosophers nowadays repudiate immaterial minds, but the problem of mental causation has not gone away. Instead, focus has shifted to mental properties. How could mental properties be causally relevant to bodily behavior? How could something mental qua mental cause what it does? After looking at the traditional Problem of Interaction, we survey various versions of the property-based problem and look at proposed solutions to them.
- 1. The Importance of the Issue
- 2. The Problem of Interaction
- 3. The Ascent to Properties
- 4. Problem I: Property Dualism
- 5. Problem II: Anomalous Monism
- 6. Problem III: Exclusion
- 7. Problem IV: Externalism
- 8. Metaphysics and the Philosophy of Mind
- Bibliography
- Other Internet Resources
- Related Entries
1. The Importance of the Issue
Mind-body interaction has a central place in our pretheoretic conception of agency. Gus's barking his shin produces a feeling of pain, which in turn causes Gus to seek his mother's comfort. When Lilian deliberates over competing courses of action, settles on one of these, and forms an intention to act, it is her forming the intention, a mental occurrence, that leads to her subsequent behavior. Such examples are part of the commonsense picture we have of ourselves.
It's not surprising, then, that questions about mind-body interaction often accompany philosophical reflection about the nature of the mind. Indeed, mental causation often figures explicitly in formulations of the mind-body problem. Campbell (1984), for instance, presents the mind-body problem in the form of four assertions:
(1) The human body is a material thing. (2) The human mind is a spiritual thing. (3) Mind and body interact. (4) Spirit and matter do not interact.
These four assertions give rise to a problem because (barring equivocation) they are jointly inconsistent: at least one of them must be false. Whether you feel pressure to reject this or that assertion will depend, in part, on how you evaluate the causal claims in (3) and (4). In this sense, how you answer questions about mental causation can determine your view of the mind's place in nature.
The philosophical significance of mental causation goes beyond general concerns about the nature of mind. Some philosophers (e.g., Davidson 1963; Mele 1992) insist that the very notion of psychological explanation turns on the intelligibility of mental causation. If your mind and its states, such as your beliefs and desires, were causally isolated from your bodily behavior, then what goes on in your mind could not explain what you do. (For contrary views, see Ginet 1990; Sehon 2005; and for further discussion, action, §3.)
If psychological explanation goes, so do the closely related notions of agency and moral responsibility (cf. Horgan 2007). If your body's behavior is not explained by your mind's activities—its deliberations, decisions, and the like—what sense could it make to hold you responsible for what your body does? You would appear to be a mere passive observer of your body's activities. Such a picture would apparently require abandoning what Strawson (1962) calls our “reactive attitudes”, the moral attitudes and feelings (e.g., gratitude, resentment) so central to our interpersonal lives.
Clearly, a good deal rides on a satisfactory solution to the problem of mental causation. Problem or problems: as will become clear, there is more than one way in which puzzles about the mind's “causal relevance” to behavior (and to the physical world more generally) can arise.
2. The Problem of Interaction
2.1 The Need for a Causal Nexus
Descartes (1642/1996) set the agenda for subsequent discussions of the mind-body relation. According to Descartes, minds and bodies are distinct kinds of substance. Bodies, he held, are spatially extended substances, incapable of feeling or thought; minds, in contrast, are unextended, thinking, feeling substances, souls. (We use “soul” with no theological implications to designate minds considered in the Cartesian way as immaterial substances.) Despite recognizing these deep differences, Descartes accepted the common belief that mind and body causally interact: “Everyone feels that he is a single person with both body and thought so related by nature that the thought can move the body and feel the things which happen to it” (in Cottingham et al. 1991, p. 228). If minds and bodies are radically different kinds of substance, however, it is not easy to see how they could causally interact. Descartes was well aware of the difficulty. Princess Elizabeth of Bohemia puts it forcefully to him in a 1643 letter, pressing Descartes to tell her
how the human soul can determine the movement of the animal spirits in the body so as to perform voluntary acts—being as it is merely a conscious substance. For the determination of movement seems always to come about from the moving body's being propelled—to depend on the kind of impulse it gets from what sets it in motion, or again, on the nature and shape of this latter thing's surface. Now the first two conditions involve contact, and the third involves that the impelling thing has extension; but you utterly exclude extension from your notion of soul, and contact seems to me incompatible with a thing's being immaterial (in Anscombe and Geach 1954, pp. 274-5).
Elizabeth is expressing the prevailing mechanistic view as to how causation of bodies works: it must involve the cause's impelling the body, where impelling requires contact between cause and effect. Since a soul could never literally come into contact with a body—souls are spatially unextended—an immaterial soul could never impel, and so could never causally interact with, a body.
Elizabeth's worries might seem quaint and outdated. Causal relations countenanced by contemporary physics can take several forms, not all of which are of the push-pull variety. Why shouldn't soul-body interaction simply be included as another sort of “non-mechanistic” causation? (For discussion, see Richardson 1982.) But Elizabeth's objection is in fact just one version of a more general worry about soul-body interaction, a worry that rests on the following thesis about causation:
(CN) Any causal relation requires a nexus, some interface or connection by means of which the causal relation occurs.
Elizabeth presumes that when an effect is bodily motion, the nexus required by (CN) is spatial contact. But even if she is wrong about this, (CN) nevertheless poses problems for the dualist: if contact is not the mind-body nexus, what is?
One line of thought appeals to the transference theory of causality (Ehring 1997; cf. causal processes). Here the idea is that identity—the literal persistence of something from cause to effect—provides the needed bridge. If something in a soul could become present in a body, this could causally link the immaterial and material. Descartes himself appears to accept such a theory in declaring (in Meditation Three) that there could be nothing in an effect not present in its total efficient cause. (Martin [2008, ch. 10] calls this the “pipeline” view of causation.) But now the problem reasserts itself: if, as the substance dualist insists, bodies and minds are radically different, they have no properties in common. According to Descartes, a body's properties are modes of extension, ways of being extended, while a soul's properties are modes of something quite different, thought or consciousness. If causation involved transference, a Cartesian soul could not causally affect, or be affected by, a body (but see Hart 1988; Hoffman and Rosenkrantz 1991).
A dualist could, of course, simply reject (CN). The notion of a causal nexus has come under criticism, often from philosophers working in the Humean tradition (Blackburn 1990). But the next two versions of the problem may arise even if one rejects (CN).
2.2 The Pairing Problem
A second version of the Problem of Interaction is the “Pairing Problem” (Kim 1973; 2005, ch. 3; Sosa 1984; Foster 1991, ch. 6). Imagine two qualitatively identical minds M1 and M2 and the bodies B1 and B2 to which they are “attached”, that is, the bodies with which they directly causally interact. In virtue of what is it true that M1 is causally paired with B1 and M2 with B2?
This is not the epistemological question of how we could know that these are the pairings (although this is troublesome, too). The question, rather, is metaphysical: in virtue of what are these the pairings? If minds were, like bodies, located in space, causal pairing could be achieved by the relative spatial locations of the substances. Particular minds might be inside or “inhabit” particular bodies. But if minds are non-spatial souls, relative spatial location is unavailable to fill the pairing role. And since M1 and M2 are, by hypothesis, qualitatively identical, we cannot appeal to the different intrinsic properties that they might possess.
Unger (2006, pp. 242-59) has recently proposed a solution to the Pairing Problem that appeals to “individualistic powers” (cf. Foster 1991, pp. 167-8). Powers are standardly thought of as powers for interactions with objects of a particular type. A key has the power to open this lock, but only by virtue of having the power to open any lock of this kind, the power to open any intrinsically comparable lock. Individualistic powers, in contrast, are powers possessed by an object to affect or be affected by another particular object. Think of a key possessing the power to open this lock, but lacking the power to open any intrinsically indiscernible lock. An immaterial substance, suggests Unger, could have the power to interact with a particular body and no other. As the key example illustrates, it is by no means obvious that powers could be individualistic in Unger's sense. Even if there were such powers, however, we might wonder how they could possibly be exercised given the deep differences between material and immaterial substances.
2.3 The Completeness of the Physical
A third version of the Problem of Interaction turns on the thesis that the physical world is causally complete in the following sense:
Completeness: Every physical effect has a sufficient physical cause.
As we trace back the causal history of any physical effect—that is, of anything physical that has a cause—there will never be a need to appeal to anything non-physical. The physical world contains within itself the resources for a full explanation of any of its (caused) members, and in this sense is “complete”. The point applies, then, to whatever might occur to or within our bodies. In particular, any bit of bodily behavior has a sufficient physical cause, which itself has a sufficient physical cause, and so on. In tracing the causal history of what we do, we need never appeal to what's non-physical. (See Taylor 1992, ch. 3 for an extended example of such a causal chain.)
Completeness in various guises appears frequently in the mental causation literature. Yablo (1992) calls it “Physical Determinism”, although as Yablo and others have pointed out, Completeness need not be taken to imply causal determinism: “sufficient physical cause” can be read as “physical cause sufficient for the effect's objective probability.” Completeness at times goes under the name “Closure” (Crane 1992; Baker 1993; Melnyk 2003; Kim 2005), although some philosophers prefer to reserve the latter term for a stronger principle, one barring the non-physical from affecting the physical (Kim 1998, p. 40; Robb 1997; Marcus 2005). Whatever one chooses to call the principle, its proper formulation is still a matter of some dispute (Lowe 2000).
Is Completeness true? Perhaps it is a conceptual truth: for an effect to be physical is, at least in part, for it to have a physical cause. (For discussion, see Papineau 1993, §1.9; Lowe 1996, p. 56.) But the principle looks more substantive than that. If so, its proponents might claim that it enjoys empirical support from multiple confirming instances—or at least from the lack of disconfirming instances—in the history of science. Alternatively, one might say that Completeness is an indispensable working hypothesis of natural science, or that it's entailed by physicalism, a philosophical doctrine enjoying independent support (Lewis 1966; Melnyk 2003, p. 222; other arguments for Completeness are discussed in Papineau 2001; Montero 2003).
In any case, Completeness does not by itself yield the causal irrelevance of the non-physical, for even if every physical effect has a sufficient physical cause, some physical effects might have non-physical causes as well. This version of the Problem of Interaction thus requires a second premise, one that places a ban on such overdetermination:
No Overdetermination: There is no systematic overdetermination of physical effects.
This principle enjoys wide support in the literature. It is said that postulating systematic overdetermination in this context is “absurd” (Kim 1993a, p. 281), or at least “looks suspiciously ad hoc” (Lowe 2000, p. 572). Schiffer remarks that “it is hard to believe that God is such a bad engineer” as to allow such overdetermination (Schiffer 1987, p. 148).
With Completeness and No Overdetermination in place, the Problem of Interaction in our final version is straightforward. Assume for reductio that minds are immaterial substances that routinely cause behavior. Since (by Completeness) such behavioral effects also have sufficient physical causes, these effects are systematically overdetermined. But this contradicts No Overdetermination. The dualist's options would then seem to be quite limited. One is to embrace epiphenomenalism, a doctrine on which the mental, while caused by the physical, exerts no “downward” causal influence in return. Even more radical is parallelism, on which the mental and physical run in tandem, with no causal influence in either direction.
The premises can, however, be challenged. Baker (1993), not herself a Cartesian dualist, argues that if Completeness threatens to undermine our ordinary (and scientific) explanatory practices—many of which cite the mental—it's Completeness that has to go. Our explanatory practices trump any abstract metaphysical principles with which they might conflict (see also §§6.3, 7.5 below). Coming from a quite different perspective, Stapp (2005) culls evidence from contemporary physics suggesting that there are, contrary to Completeness, causal gaps in the physical world, gaps filled in by the mental (see also Sturgeon 1998; Davies 2006).
Another dualist option is to deny No Overdetermination. Mills (1996), for example, defends mental-physical overdetermination as the most plausible route for the dualist to take. Overdetermination is plausible, the reasoning goes, if for any behavioral effect B, both a non-physical (mental) cause M and physical cause P satisfy the following counterfactual conditionals (among others):
(1) If M had occurred in the absence of P, B would have occurred. (2) If P had occurred in the absence of M, B would have occurred.
If the dualist can reasonably claim that (1) and (2) are true, this will make a strong prima facie case for overdetermination (see also Garrett 1998, and, for a more general discussion of overdetermination, Funkhouser 2002).
3. The Ascent to Properties
Cartesian dualism has fallen out of favor among philosophers and cognitive scientists. There are, to be sure, non-Cartesian forms of substance dualism, and they might have the resources to confront the Problem of Interaction in its various guises (Hasker 1999; Lowe 2006). But the dominant view today seems to be that if the mind is a substance at all, it is a physical substance—the brain, for instance. This sort of “substance monism” is in fact a consequence of the more general token identity theory: every concrete mental particular (token) is physical. We will assume token identity in what follows: minds, mental events, and any other mental “objects” are physical (cf. the identity theory of mind).
What becomes of the Problem of Interaction on such a view? It would seem to dissolve. While causation between brain and body is complex, even to the point of being empirically inscrutable, it does not pose the same problems as soul-body interaction. There are no special philosophical problems with brain-body interaction, nor is there anything especially odd or worrisome about an event in your brain causing, say, your arm to go up. Any philosophical questions here belong to the metaphysics of causation generally and have no special application to mental causation.
Nevertheless, philosophical worries about mental causation persist. Theoretical and commonsensical considerations leading us to think the mind or mental events cause behavior should also make us think that they do so qua mental, i.e., in virtue of their mental properties. Properties figure crucially in causal relations (Kim 1973; Armstrong 1989, pp. 28-9; Ehring 1997). Drop a square paperweight into soft clay and it will produce an impression. The shape of the impression can be traced to the shape of the paperweight, the depth of the impression to the mass of the paperweight. The shape and mass of the paperweight are “causally relevant” or “causally efficacious” properties. In particular, they are causally relevant with respect to certain properties of the impression. By contrast, other properties of the paperweight, such as its color or value, appear to be causally irrelevant to producing this kind of impression.
By themselves, these observations pose no special problem for the philosopher of mind. While the notion of a causally relevant property is in need of philosophical analysis (Horgan 1989; Braun 1995), there is no reason at the outset for a token-identity theorist to be especially concerned about the causal relevance of mental properties. Gus smiles because of the way his food tastes, that phenomenal property; Lilian walks to school along a particular route because of what she believes, that representational property. Assuming that the mind is a physical substance, why should a mind's causing behavior in virtue of its mental properties be any more puzzling than a paperweight's causing a square impression in virtue of its shape?
Recent philosophical work on mental properties has revealed that matters are not so simple, however. Mental properties are alleged to have, not just one, but up to four features that make their causal relevance philosophically puzzling, no less problematic than mind-body interaction is for the substance dualist. These features will be discussed in the following sections. Each feature makes it appear as though mental properties, or some important family of mental properties, are causally irrelevant to the production of behavior. The threat is a new form of epiphenomenalism: even if minds and mental events are causes, they are not causes qua mental.
4. Problem I: Property Dualism
The new epiphenomenalism immediately confronts a particularly strong version of property dualism, one insisting that mental properties are sui generis, in no way reducible to the dispositional and structural properties recognized by the physical sciences (see dualism, esp. §2.2). Some property dualists accord this status only to a certain class of mental properties, namely qualia, the “what it's like” features of conscious experience. Property dualists about qualia include Jackson (1982; retracted in his 1998), Chalmers (1996), and, somewhat reluctantly, Kim (2005). Other property dualists, including some emergentists, are willing to extend the thesis to all mental properties.
Suppose that property dualism is true. Can mental substances or events cause what they do qua mental, in virtue of their mental properties? The arguments against soul-body interaction, now couched in terms of properties, could enter here again. For example, the principle of Completeness seems to lose none of its attractiveness when formulated explicitly—even if a bit awkwardly—in terms of properties. One could add to the principle a clause stipulating that a “sufficient physical cause” is one that's sufficient in virtue of its physical properties; that is, it's qua physical that a sufficient physical cause is sufficient (see also §5.4). Such a principle can, paired with No Overdetermination, be used to argue that mental properties are causally irrelevant to behavioral effects. The argument here and the responses to it are structurally similar to those in §2.3, so we will not pursue further this version of the property-based problem. (Property dualism also faces the Exclusion Problem, to be discussed in §6.)
5. Problem II: Anomalous Monism
5.1 The Argument for Anomalous Monism
Another version of the property-based problem of mental causation can be traced back to Davidson's influential paper, “Mental Events” (Davidson 1970; see also his 1974). In this paper, Davidson defends an account of the mind-body relation he calls “anomalous monism”. Davidson argues that we have excellent reasons to accept each of the following principles:
Principle of Causal Interaction: Some mental events interact causally with physical events.Principle of the Nomological Character of Causality: Events related as cause and effect fall under strict laws.
Anomalism of the Mental: There are no strict laws on the basis of which mental events can be predicted and explained.
According to Davidson, the mind-body problem is an expression of apparent tension among these principles. Most of us unquestioningly assent to the first principle: mental events have physical causes and effects. The second principle is only slightly more controversial. A genuine causal sequence falls under a “strict” (that is, exceptionless) law of nature. We might be utterly ignorant of the law, but we distinguish genuinely causal sequences from mere coincidences by assuming that the former, but not the latter, conform to a law. (Note: “strict” is not synonymous with “deterministic”; a strict law could be either deterministic or probabilistic.)
One way to understand what Davidson has in mind is to consider the place of physics among the sciences. Physics gives us an account of laws governing the basic constituents of the world. These laws are strict, unlike laws associated with “higher-level” sciences such as biology or psychology. Biological and psychological processes are liable to interference from “outside” (non-biological, non-psychological) forces. Dinosaurs became extinct when a meteor collided with the Earth; your intention to raise your hand is derailed when you are struck in the head by a chunk of plaster falling from the ceiling. But in the case of the basic constituents, there are no sources of interference because there is no “outside”, only more of the same, more basic constituents. The fundamental physical things are in this sense causally autonomous.
Assuming that everything is made up of the basic constituents, it seems to follow that the behavior of everything is governed by laws governing those basic constituents. Any causal sequence is a sequence involving the basic constituents and so governed by strict, fundamental laws. Interactions among fundamental entities will be fantastically complex, and “higher-level” sciences are in the business of finding abstract patterns of regularities and capturing these in higher-level laws. Such laws, however, are not strict, since they abstract away from fine-grained differences that, at lower-levels, prove important.
The resulting picture is of a single, multi-faceted, material world that can be described in different ways. Some of our descriptions are “mental”, some “physical”. The same world answers to both. There is, however, no prospect of translating mental terms or descriptions into physical terms or descriptions, hence no prospect of establishing systematic mental–physical correlations of the sort that would be required for strict mental–physical laws. Importantly, however, this is consistent with the possibility of establishing loose mental–physical generalizations, which could be regarded as defeasible, ceteris paribus laws (see e.g., Fodor 1987; 1991b).
Davidson's view is often described as a token identity theory (§3): every particular (token) mental event is identical with some particular (token) physical event, but mental types cannot be identified with physical types. Most philosophers who address these issues find it natural to identify types with properties, so to say that mental types cannot be reduced to or identified with physical types would be to say that mental properties are distinct from physical properties.
Is Davidson, then, a property dualist of the sort discussed in §4? The question is a tricky one, for two reasons. First, Davidson is at the very least agnostic about properties. Whatever his considered view, he does not invoke properties in the way that property dualists typically do. Second, property dualism as described earlier is incompatible with physicalism, yet Davidson himself appears to be a physicalist. (Here we must add “in a sense”, for there is no one kind of physicalism. But we are confident that Davidson is a physicalist in a sense that the property dualists of §4 would reject.)
5.2 The Charge of Epiphenomenalism
In whatever sense Davidson is or is not a property dualist, anomalous monism faces a number of difficulties, the most pressing of which, for our purposes, is that it apparently makes mental properties causally irrelevant to physical effects. Suppose Gus forms the intention to illuminate the room and subsequently flips the switch, thereby turning on the light. In this case we have a cause that, if Davidson is right, can be given both a mental and a physical description, and an effect that has a physical description. If this means that the cause has a mental property (in virtue of which it satisfies a mental description) and a physical property (in virtue of which it satisfies a physical description), we are faced with a further question. Granted, the event with the mental property is the event with a physical property, and granted that this event has a physical effect, given Davidson's principles, why should we think that the mental property had anything at all to do with the event's physical effect? Davidson's second two principles appear to block such relevance. If all causal relations are subsumed under strict laws, and if there are no strict psychophysical laws, then any instance of mind-body causation is subsumed only under physical laws. But then it looks as though only a mental event's physical properties are relevant to what it causes. The mental properties (or mental types) are causally irrelevant (see Stoutland 1980; Honderich 1982; Sosa 1984).
5.3 The Appeal to Counterfactuals
Some (e.g., Lepore and Loewer 1987) look to counterfactuals to answer this charge of epiphenomenalism. The central idea is that anomalous monism is compatible with physical effects' being counterfactually dependent on mental properties. And such dependence secures an important kind of causal relevance for the mental, the sort that Lepore and Loewer call “bringing about”. On their view, a's being F brings about b's being G when the following conditions are met:
(1) a causes b. (2) a is F and b is G. (3) If a had not been F, b would not have been G. (4) a's being F and b's being G are logically and metaphysically independent.
(Note that, because this is intended as an account of causal relevance, not of causation, clause (1) does not introduce any circularity. Alternative counterfactual accounts of causal relevance can be found in Lepore and Loewer 1989; Horgan 1989; see also counterfactual theories of causation.)
Now suppose a mental event, such as a decision to hail a cab, causes you to move your hand, thereby signaling a cab. Say the mental property of the cause here is being a decision to hail a cab, and the behavioral property of the effect is being a cab-hailing. In such a case, the mental property will be causally relevant in the production of your behavior if the following counterfactual holds: If the cause had not been a decision to hail a cab, the effect would not have been a cab-hailing. And such a counterfactual is quite plausible, as are similar counterfactuals in a wide range of cases. But is their truth compatible with anomalous monism? Lepore and Loewer argue that it is. While Davidson prohibits strict laws connecting mental and physical properties, he does allow for non-strict laws. Such laws are enough to ground or “support” counterfactuals (see also laws of nature). Consider, by analogy, the properties of being a match-striking and being a match-lighting. The law connecting such properties (if there is such) is evidently non-strict: striking causes lighting only ceteris paribus. Nevertheless, we can assert with confidence, after a given lighting, that if the match had not been struck, it wouldn't have lit. Non-strict psychophysical laws would similarly appear to ground counterfactuals connecting mental and behavioral properties.
Whether this is a plausible defense of anomalous monism depends on, among other things, whether counterfactual accounts of causal relevance (and of causation more generally) are plausible. Such theories have come under attack on a number of fronts. These attacks can take the form of counterexamples (Braun 1995; Ehring 1997) or broader metaphysical concerns. Here we mention a couple of the latter. They are not decisive against counterfactual accounts, but they do create some pressure to look elsewhere to avoid epiphenomenalism.
First, a substance dualist, too, could appeal to counterfactuals in the face of the Problem of Interaction. Suppose, as an occasionalist would, that God has set up the world in such a way that the states of souls mirror those of bodies so that the “right” counterfactuals come out true. For example, if I had not felt pain just now, my hand would not have withdrawn, for God in that case would not have caused it to withdraw. A solution of this kind to the Problem of Interaction looks too easy: even if God ensures that soul–body counterfactuals hold, this does not amount to a genuine causal connection between the two kinds of substance. A similar point could be made about properties: Suppose a soprano sings the word “shatter”, thereby causing a glass to shatter (cf. Dretske 1988, p. 79; Braun 1995). The pitch of the note, not its meaning, is what's causally relevant here. But now add that God had decided that if the note had not meant “shatter”, he would not have allowed the glass to shatter. The four conditions listed above would seem to be satisfied, but the meaning of the soprano's note is still, intuitively, not causally relevant to the breaking of the glass.
Reflection on cases such as these leads to a second, more fundamental point. When a counterfactual is true, there should be something in the world that makes it true. Even granting that, if the cause had not had its mental property, the effect would not have had its behavioral property, in virtue of what is this true? What is this counterfactual's truthmaker? This truthmaker, and not the bare counterfactual itself, is what matters in determining whether a property is causally relevant. And once we look at the relevant truthmakers in actual cases of (apparent) mental causation, the problem of epiphenomenalism crops up again. Although the effect counterfactually depends on the mental property, this appears to be true only because the mental property depends on a physical property which is doing the real causal work. The mental property looks like a freeloader (Leiter and Miller 1994). This sort of concern is a version of the “Exclusion Problem” (§6). It also threatens the next defense of anomalous monism to be considered.
5.4 The Appeal to Nomological Sufficiency
While Fodor (1989) apparently agrees that the counterfactual account above captures a kind of causal relevance, he argues that Lepore and Loewer have settled for too little. On Fodor's view, mental properties can be relevant to behavior in a stronger sense, a sense in which they are sufficient for their effects and in this way “make a difference”. Fodor spells out this sufficiency in terms of laws: a property makes a difference if “it's a property in virtue of the instantiation of which the occurrence of one event is nomologically sufficient for the occurrence of another” (Fodor 1989, p. 65, note omitted; see also McLaughlin 1989).
Does such an account save anomalous monism from the charge of epiphenomenalism? On the face of it, it cannot, for mental properties on Davidson's view appear only in “hedged” laws, laws that include an implicit ceteris paribus rider. Consider a candidate psychological law:
(L) If an agent, a, wants x, believes x is obtainable by doing y, and judges y best, all things considered, then a forms the intention to y and subsequently y's on the basis of this intention, ceteris paribus.
The ceteris paribus clause here would seem to block the mental properties in question from being causally sufficient for the behavioral effect. But perhaps not: according to (L) the mental properties are sufficient for the behavioral effect when the ceteris paribus conditions are satisfied. And this sort of causal sufficiency, Fodor argues, is all we could reasonably want for mental properties. In this way, the causal relevance of the mental ends up being compatible with its anomalism.
An account of causal relevance in terms of laws is natural given the tight connections between laws and properties (see, e.g., Armstrong 1983). But those sympathetic to Fodor's position might still ask what the causal mechanism is in mental-physical interactions. For example, it could turn out that the reason psychophysical laws such as (L) hold is that mental properties are themselves “grounded in” more basic, physical properties, and that only the latter do genuine causal work: mental properties merely “piggyback” on the real bearers of causal powers (see Lepore and Loewer 1989; Leiter and Miller 1994). This is the same “exclusion” worry that was raised against the counterfactual account above. The Exclusion Problem will soon get a closer look, but first we'll see how Davidson himself might address the problem.
5.5 Davidson's Response
How might a proponent of anomalous monism respond to the difficulties raised in this section, short of embracing epiphenomenalism? Davidson (1993) appears to deny a crucial assumption of the argument that many critics take for granted, the assumption, namely, that causes do their causing in virtue of their properties. When an event causes something, it doesn't do so qua this or that: it just causes what it does, full stop. Were this so, none of the property-based problems discussed here could get off the ground.
Such a response seems obviously to miss the point however (Kim 1993b, McLaughlin 1993, Sosa 1993). Given that the mental “supervenes” on the physical, all parties agree that mental events (events with mental properties) can cause physical events. The difficulty is to understand how they could do so in virtue of being mental, in virtue of their mental (rather than their physical) properties, how they could have physical effects qua mental. The principle of the Nomological Character of Causation (§5.1) appears to require that, when one event causes another, it does so in solely virtue of its physical properties.
Perhaps it is Davidson's critics who have missed the point, however. Davidson rarely uses the word “property”. Instead, he formulates anomalous monism in terms of predicates and descriptions. An event is mental if it answers to a mental predicate, physical if it is physically describable. Davidson's critics have assumed that, if an event answers to a mental predicate or is physically describable, this is because it incorporates a mental property or a physical property. If an event picked out by a mental predicate is physically describable, they surmise, this must be because the event includes a mental property and a physical property. It is hard to find any justification for this interpretation in what Davidson actually says, however. This is not simply because Davidson is agnostic about properties. It is chiefly because Davidson is thinking about the mental-physical distinction as a difference in conception, not as the expression of a sharp ontological division.
As noted in §5.1, Davidson's picture is of a single, multi-faceted world, one that can be described, truly, in many different ways. Some of our descriptions are “mental”, couched in a mental vocabulary, some are “physical”, expressed in physical terms. The same world answers to both. Indeed, everything to which a mental description truly applies could be given an exhaustive physical description. This is the heart of Davidson's doctrine of the “supervenience” of the mental on the physical.
In the case of particular causal sequences—your desire for water causes you to turn on the tap, for instance—the sequence is in principle re-describable in the vocabulary of basic physics so as to satisfy a strict law, one formulated in basic physical terms. There is, however, no prospect of translating mental terms or descriptions into physical terms or descriptions, hence no prospect of establishing systematic mental-physical correlations of the sort that would be required for strict mental-physical laws. As noted earlier, the impossibility of strict psychophysical laws is consistent with the possibility of establishing loose mental-physical generalizations that could be regarded as defeasible, ceteris paribus laws (see, e.g., Fodor 1987; 1991b). These laws are not what grounds psychophysical causal claims, however. Such claims are true when they pick out events describable in a physical vocabulary in a way that answers to a strict law.
For Davidson, then, it makes no more sense to ask whether an event had a particular effect in virtue of being mental or in virtue of being physical than it would to ask whether its effect stemmed from its being described in English or in German. Physics is in the business of uncovering the deep causal structure of the world. Physics, however, enjoys no monopoly on ways of (truly) describing that worldly goings-on.
Thus construed, Davidson has little in common with property dualists (§4) or philosophers who identify themselves as non-reductive physicalists (§6.1). Ontologically, anomalous monism is fully reductive. Non-reductive physicalists begin with the denial that mental descriptions are conceptually reducible to physical descriptions, and proceed to draw a substantive ontological conclusion: mental properties are distinct from, but in some way dependent on, physical properties. This line of reasoning is not one that would have occurred to Davidson. (For further discussion, see Heil 2008.)
6. Problem III: Exclusion
6.1 Functionalism and Multiple Realizability
While reflection on property dualism or anomalous monism can lead to the next property-based problem, another route is by way of the doctrine of non-reductive physicalism (see physicalism, §6). Like the property dualist, the non-reductive physicalist holds that mental properties are distinct from physical properties. But unlike the property dualist, the non-reductive physicalist insists on a strong dependence of the mental on the physical: mental properties are “realized in” or, for some, “constituted by” physical properties. This strong tie between the mental and physical is the subject of a large contemporary literature, some of which we touch on below.
Non-reductive physicalism in its current form grew out of the doctrine of functionalism, according to which mental properties are functional properties. To be in pain, for example, is a matter of being in a state with a certain causal profile: pain is a state caused by tissue damage, and one that causes certain overt responses (moans, attempts to repair the damage, beliefs that one is in pain). But, argue functionalists, it is most unlikely that we could identify a single physical state that played this role in every actual and possible case of pain. Human beings differ in endless tiny physiological ways: your neurological states, including states you go into when you are in pain, probably differ subtly from another person's. Human beings' neurological states, in turn, differ from those of a cat or a dog, and perhaps dramatically from states of an octopus. We can even imagine encountering aliens with vastly different biologies, but to which we would unhesitatingly ascribe pains.
Here we arrive at a core thesis of functionalism: states of mind are multiply realizable. The property of being in pain can be realized in a wide variety of physical (and perhaps non-physical) systems. A creature is in pain in virtue of being in a state with the right sort of causal profile, some sort of neurological state, say. The property of being in pain cannot be identified with this neurological state, however, because creatures of other kinds can be in pain in virtue of being in vastly different physical conditions. Functionalists often put this point by saying that mental properties are “higher-level” properties, properties possessed by objects by virtue of their possession of appropriate “lower-level” properties, their realizers.
6.2 The Exclusion Problem
Now, however, we are again confronted with the specter of epiphenomenalism. If mental properties are not physical properties, how could they make a causal difference? Whenever any mental (functional) property M is instantiated, it will be realized by some particular physical property P. This physical property is unproblematically relevant to producing various behavioral effects. But then what causal work is left for M to do? It seems to be causally idle, “screened off” by the work of P.
This version of the problem of mental causation has appeared in various guises (see Malcolm 1968 for an early statement of the problem, and Kim 1989; 1993b; 1998; 2005 for more recent refinements). It's called the “Exclusion Problem” because it appears as if the physical properties realizing mental properties exclude the latter from causal relevance. (As we've already mentioned, functionalism is not the only doctrine threatened by this argument. For problems of mental causation aimed specifically at functionalism, see Block 1990; Rupert 2006; McLaughlin 2006.)
This problem has clear affinities with other versions of the problem of mental causation. Consider the claim above that the realizing property P must be relevant to the production of a particular behavioral effect. This would seem to be justified either by an appeal to Completeness (§2.3) or to Davidson's doctrine (§5.1) that causal relations must fall under strict (and so physical) laws. And the argument's depiction of P and M as competing for causal relevance—one must exclude the other—would seem to require a principle such as No Overdetermination (§2.3).
In spite of these similarities, the Exclusion Problem is in one important respect unique: unlike the other problems we've looked at so far, exclusion worries generalize to a wide range of properties outside of the mental. Any properties, mental or otherwise, that are multiply realizable by physical properties are threatened with causal irrelevance. (For discussion of this and related issues, see Kim 1998, pp. 77-87; Noordhof 1999; Bontly 2001; Gillett and Rives 2001; Block 2003.)
Some philosophers (e.g., Fodor 1989; Baker 1993) take this general nature of the problem to be an encouraging sign. We happily accept biological, or meteorological, or geological properties as causally relevant, despite their being distinct from their physical realizers. Why then imagine that exclusion threatens the causal relevance of mental properties? But others would insist that the alleged causal relevance of biological and other “special science” properties is by no means sacrosanct. Causal powers we attribute to them must respect what our best metaphysics tells us. And in any case, the central issue is not so much whether mental properties (and the rest) are causally relevant to the production of physical effects, but how they could be (Kim 1998, pp. 61-2, 78-9; McLaughlin 2006, pp. 40-1). Even if the Exclusion Problem, because it generalizes, does not tempt us to embrace epiphenomenalism, it presses on us a responsibility to explain how mental properties could be causally relevant given that they appear to be screened off by their physical realizers.
The Exclusion Problem is the subject of a large and still-growing literature. In the next few sub-sections, we look at some of the main lines of response, dividing them into three broad categories.
6.3 Autonomy Solutions
The Exclusion Problem presents us with a picture on which higher-level mental properties are in causal competition with their lower-level physical realizers. Physical properties are unproblematically relevant in the production of behavior, and so mental properties must either find a way to do the work that their realizers are already doing or face exclusion. But some philosophers would insist that this picture is deeply misleading: mental properties enjoy causal relevance in their own right and are not threatened by exclusion from physical properties.
This “autonomy solution” (cf. Jackson 1996, §2) can take a variety of forms. One version starts from the observation that psychological explanations—and more generally, explanations in the special sciences—are in an important sense independent of physical explanations. Psychological explanations typically abstract away from details of lower-level implementation, appealing instead to their own distinctive kinds and laws. Explanations in the special sciences can thus proceed quite independently of those in the lower-level physical sciences. If the structure of the causal order reflects these explanatory practices, mental properties need not be threatened by exclusion. (Variations on this theme appear in Dennett 1973; Baker 1993; Van Gulick 1993; Hardcastle 1998; Marcus 2001; Raymont 2003; Ross and Spurrett 2004; see also §7.5.)
This appeal to explanation is quite closely connected to what's called the dual explanandum strategy. The Exclusion Problem presents a mental (functional) property M and its physical realizer P as competing to be causally relevant to the same thing, namely a bit of behavior. But M may not be threatened with exclusion if M and P are causally relevant to different properties of the effect. Return for a moment to the paperweight example from §3. The shape of the paperweight is causally relevant, but not to the impression simpliciter: it's relevant the impression's shape. In general, a causally relevant property is relevant to some particular property of the effect (Horgan 1989). Perhaps, then, M and P do not causally compete because they are parts of separate, autonomous causal lines to different properties of the effect.
Consider one way this might work. Behavioral properties, just like mental properties, appear to be multiply realizable. For example, there is more than one way to hail a cab, many different physical realizations of this behavioral property. Now suppose some belief causes you to hail a cab. In accordance with Completeness (§2.3), some physical property P of the belief is sufficient for your behavior. But strictly speaking, P is relevant only to the particular way in which you hailed the cab, the particular physical realization of your hailing. What, then, is responsible for your behavior's higher-level property of simply being a cab-hailing? It's natural to suppose that it's a higher-level property of your belief, namely, some mental property, such as the belief's representational content. (For proposals along these lines, see Yablo 1992; Thomasson 1998; Marras 1998; Crisp and Warfield 2001; Gibbons 2006; see also §§7.3-4 below.)
6.4 Inheritance Solutions
Autonomy solutions can make it appear that the causal powers of mental properties “float free” of their physical realizers, bringing to mind the doctrine of parallelism (but see Thomasson 1998; Marcus 2001, §3.3). Some non-reductive physicalists have accordingly looked to tie the causal powers of mental properties more closely to those of their physical realizers. The idea is that mental properties are so intimately related to their realizers that the former “inherit” the causal powers of the latter. The relation between levels is not one of rivalry, such that the physical might exclude the mental, but one of cooperation. Nor, moreover, is there any threat of overdetermination, since the mental works through the physical (cf. the metaphor of “transparency” in Jackson 1996).
On some versions of the inheritance solution, what the higher-level mental property derives from its physical realizer is some weaker or “lower-grade” form of causal relevance. For example, Jackson and Pettit (1988; 1990) distinguish the robust “causal efficacy” of physical properties from the weaker “causal relevance” of higher-level properties. Causal relevance in this sense is an explanatory notion: as one might put it, the actual production is achieved at the physical level, but by being realized in the physical, mental properties inherit an explanatory relevance they wouldn't have otherwise. One advantage of such a view is that it accords a derived form of relevance to mental properties, but in such a way that respects both the priority of physical causation and the principle of No Overdetermination. (For similar views, see Levine 2001, §1.5; and, perhaps, the solution once favored by Kim in his 1984. Those who appeal to the counterfactual dependence of behavior on the mental [cf. §5.3] might also fall into this category. For an answer to the charge that this is a weaker form of causal relevance—“causation lite”—see Loewer 2002; Menzies 2007.)
If such a weakening seems to amount to epiphenomenalism, you might look for an inheritance solution on which mental properties are causally relevant in just same, robust sense that their physical realizers are (cf. the “homogeneity assumption” in Crane 1995). How can this be done without violating No Overdetermination? Well, suppose that a mental property is immanent in its physical realizer; M, that is, is somehow nothing over and above P. In that case, any causal work done by P is, in a straightforward way, inherited by M. Overdetermination is avoided because M's work is included in P's.
The metaphysical details of such a picture matter. Otherwise, “immanence”, “nothing over and above”, and the like will turn into mere labels for that psychophysical relation, we know not what, that solves the Exclusion Problem. Accordingly, several promising lines of inquiry have been pursued by various philosophers. Yablo (1992; cf. his 2001) argues that mental properties are determinables of their physical realizers in the way that red, say, is a determinable of scarlet (critics include Worley 1997; Ehring 1996; Funkhouser 2006). On Pereboom's (2002) view, mental properties are constituted by physical properties (critics include Ney 2007). Shoemaker (2001) argues that the causal powers of a mental property are a subset of the powers of its physical realizer (cf. Wilson 1999; critics include Heil 1999). A bit more neutrally, Bennett (2003; 2008) says that mental properties are metaphysically necessitated by their physical realizers (see also supervenience).
Take Shoemaker's view as representative. Properties bestow causal powers. The property of being water, for example, bestows the power to dissolve salt in certain circumstances; the property of being sharp bestows the power to cut in certain circumstances, etc. Now consider again mental property M and one of its realizers in a given instance, P. Plausibly, M's powers are included in P's. Both properties, for example, have the power to cause a certain kind of behavior, but because of its greater “specificity”, P has in addition to this powers that M lacks. Now in general we don't think that wholes causally compete with, or are excluded by, their parts. When Gus steps on Lilian's toe, his foot's causing Lilian discomfort doesn't exclude Gus' causing her discomfort. Both Gus and his foot coexist as causes, without competition and, we might add, without overdetermination. A similar point could be made about properties: if the causal powers of M are included in those bestowed by P, then P's causal relevance to behavior, far from excluding M's, includes it.
6.5 Identity Solutions
Autonomy and inheritance solutions grant at least this much to the Exclusion Problem: mental and physical properties are numerically distinct, however intimately they are otherwise related. But a third sort of strategy tries to undermine the argument at exactly this point: any mental property just is its physical realizer. If M=P, there's no question of one's excluding the other, nor is there any mystery of how M can work through P, for M and P are just one and the same property.
This sort of psychophysical property identity would seem to be blocked by the multiple realizability argument sketched earlier. But what exactly does that argument show? Some (e.g., Kim 1992; cf. Lewis 1969; 1994; Jackson 1995; Heil 2003b) take it to show, not that mental properties are distinct from their physical realizers, but that what we thought was one kind of mental property is actually many. Pains realized by different physical properties are, in spite of having the same name (“pain”), different, though similar, mental properties. There is no such property as pain simpliciter, only pain-for-this-physical-structure and pain-for-that-physical structure. Once such “structure-specific” identities are allowed, we can say that M (now just, say, pain-for-human beings) is identical with P, M's “realizer” in human beings (replies include Fodor 1997; Block 1997).
This solution comes at a price: it forces us to abandon the belief that pain is a single, natural kind. There is, however, a way to preserve this doctrine while pursuing a strategy that's otherwise quite similar to the strategy just sketched. The essential idea is that “property” as we've used the term so far is ambiguous. Sometimes it is used to refer to those entities that characterize objects (events, substances, etc.); other times it is used to refer to those entities that unify objects, entities that are each a “one across many”. Now suppose that the characterizing properties are tropes: particularized properties, unique to each object. And suppose the properties unifying objects are something else—call these “types”. Types could be, for example, concepts, predicates, or resemblance classes of tropes. Now if the mental “properties” that are causally relevant to behavior are tropes, and the mental “properties” mentioned in the multiple realizability argument are types, then there's no reason to think that this argument rules out psychophysical property-identities in any way that leads to exclusion worries. The M-trope and the P-trope are one and the same trope falling under two distinct types, mental and physical. Note that this proposal allows for a single type pain that all creatures share; it's just that this type is not the same sort of entity (a trope) that is causally relevant in the production of behavior. (This approach is defended in Heil 1992; Robb 1997; Heil and Robb 2003. Macdonald and Macdonald 1986; 1995a defend what appears to be a similar view; see also Whittle 2007. Critics include Noordhof 1998; Raymont 2001; Gibb 2004; Macdonald and Macdonald 2006.).
Some philosophers might object to identity solutions on the grounds that such solutions merely shift exclusion worries from the properties of mental tokens (events or substances) to the “second-order” properties of the causally relevant properties themselves. Suppose a given property, stipulated to be both mental and physical, is unproblematically relevant to a bit of behavior. It's tempting to think that nonetheless, it is qua physical that the property is causally relevant, not qua mental. And one might want to say this for the same reasons that drive the original Exclusion Problem. (For discussion of the objection, see, e.g., Jackson 1995; Noordhof 1998; Robb 2001; Macdonald and Macdonald 2006.)
7. Problem IV: Externalism
7.1 Intentional Mental Properties
The final version of the property-based problem we'll look at is restricted to intentional mental properties. Suppose, as many philosophers do suppose, that externalism is true: the contents of representational states of mind—propositional attitudes, perceptual experiences, mental images, and so on—depend, not merely on intrinsic features of those states, but on relations—in particular, on the causal, historical, and social relations agents bear to their surroundings. In the simplest case, Lilian's thoughts about water are thoughts about water (H2O) because Lilian stands in the right sorts of causal relation to water. The key move here is to reject the idea that meaningful objects or states owe their meaning to their intrinsic make-up. The point is sometimes put as follows: intentional properties do not supervene on the intrinsic features of agents to whom they are ascribed.
The causally problematic feature here is this apparently ineliminable contextual or relational component of intentional mental states and goings-on. Suppose that mental representations are physical structures in the brains of intelligent creatures. Now suppose with the externalist that the content of mental representations is determined, not just by intrinsic features of agents, but by their contexts. Lilian (or Lilian's brain) represents a tree in the quad by going into state T. But T constitutes a representation of a tree in the quad, not by virtue of T's (or, for that matter, Lilian's) intrinsic makeup, but by virtue of T's (and by extension Lilian's) standing in the right kind of relation to the tree. The very same kind of state in a different context (in the brain of someone in different circumstances) might represent something very different—or nothing at all.
Now if the content of Lilian's thought that there is a tree in the quad is “broad”, if the significance of her thought depends on factors outside Lilian's body (Lilian's standing in an appropriate causal relation to the tree, for instance), then it is indeed hard to see how this content could figure in a causal account of Lilian's actions, including Lilian's expressing her belief that there is a tree in the quad by uttering the sentence, “There is a tree in the quad”. This is bad news for psychological theories that purport to explain why we do what we do by reference to the contents of our thoughts. It is hard to see how our understanding of ourselves and other intelligent creatures, much less a science of psychology, could survive the elimination of content.
Consider an analogy (cf. Fodor 1987, ch. 2). Gus inserts a quarter into a vending machine. The coin has a range of intrinsic qualities common to quarters, but its being a quarter does not depend solely on these intrinsic qualities: a quarter's intrinsic qualities would be shared by a decent counterfeit. The coin's being a quarter depends on its having the right sort of history: it was produced in a United States mint. This is something the vending machine cares nothing about. The machine reacts only to the coin's intrinsic features. You might put this by saying that the coin affects the machine, not qua quarter, but only qua possessor a particular kind of intrinsic makeup. (Vending machines are built to take advantage of the contingent fact that objects with the intrinsic makeup of quarters are almost always quarters.)
The worry is that we apparently operate, in important respects, as vending machines operate. We produce responses to incoming stimuli solely in virtue of our intrinsic makeup and the intrinsic character of the stimuli. If our thoughts possess whatever content they possess in virtue of our standing in complicated environmental-social-historical relations to our surroundings, it is hard to see how the contents of our thoughts could make a causal difference in our psychological economy, how they could figure in the production of behavior. Thoughts have contents perhaps, but these contents could have no direct influence on the operation of mental mechanisms. (For discussion of this problem, along with proposed solutions, see, e.g., Braun 1991; Owens 1993; Yablo 1997.)
7.2 Narrow Content
This version of the problem of mental causation has inspired a number of responses. One much-discussed response involves distinguishing narrow from broad content (Fodor 1991a; narrow mental content). Think of narrow content as the content of a representational state of mind minus its “broad” components. Consider Lilian (or Lilian's brain) and an intrinsically indiscernible brain in a vat wired to a supercomputer (as in Putnam 1981, ch. 1). Grant that Lilian and the envatted brain entertain intrinsically indiscernible thoughts with utterly different representational contents. Now imagine that we could abstract a common element from the contents of Lilian's and the brain's intrinsically indiscernible thoughts. This element is their narrow content. Because narrow content is something all intrinsic duplicates must have in common, the hope is that such content could have a role in producing behavior.
Some philosophers deny that the notion of narrow content is coherent (see, e.g., Adams et al. 1990). Return to the vending machine. The quarter Gus inserts in the machine has a particular value. It has this value owing to relations it bears to outside goings-on: it was minted in the Denver mint. A slug placed in the machine could have the very same intrinsic makeup as the quarter, but it would lack the quarter's value. It looks as though it is the quarter's intrinsic makeup, not its value, that matters to the operation of the machine. Insofar as that operation is concerned, the quarter's value is “epiphenomenal”. Now imagine someone arguing that a quarter and an intrinsically indiscernible slug do in fact share a kind of value: narrow value. Because narrow value accompanies an object's intrinsic qualities, we need not regard narrow value as epiphenomenal. But what could narrow value be? Whatever it is, could it in any way resemble value ordinarily conceived—broad value? Narrow value looks like a phony category posited ad hoc to accommodate an otherwise embarrassing difficulty. Nevertheless, some philosophers remain optimistic about the prospects of a viable internalist account of content, one that would allow fully fledged thoughts to have a role in the production of behavior (see Fodor 1991a; Martin and Heil 1998; Segal 2000; Heil 2003a, ch. 18).
7.3 Dretske's Proposal
A second, much different, attempt to preserve the causal relevance of intentional content can be found in the work of Dretske (1988; 1989; 1993). So far we've assumed that a behavioral event is distinct from the mental event that causes it. On Dretske's view, however, behavior is a process that includes, as a component, its mental cause. When mental event a causes bodily movement b, the behavior in this case is not b itself, but the process of a's causing b. When Lilian raises her hand because she wants to get the teacher's attention and she believes that raising her hand will accomplish this end, her behavior is not her hand's going up, but the process of this belief-desire pair's causing her hand to go up.
Dretske grants that when mental event a initiates (“triggers”) a process ending in bodily movement b, a does so solely in virtue of its intrinsic makeup. Nevertheless, a's relational, intentional properties have a causal role, for they can be relevant to the fact that a causes b. Reasons are “structuring causes” of behavior: it's because of what a indicates that it was “recruited” during the learning process as a cause of b. (“Indication” is a matter of reliable co-variation.) It's because, for example, Lilian's belief indicates what it does—raising one's hand (in these circumstances) is a way to get the teacher's attention—that it was (together with the relevant desire) recruited as a cause of her hand-raising. Relational, intentional mental properties thus become causally relevant to behavior, because they are relevant to structuring the very causal processes that, on Dretske's view, constitute instances of behavior.
Although Dretske's solution to the externalist problem is an original, intriguing position, it raises a number of questions (see, e.g., Block 1990; Horgan 1991; Kim 1991). One question is whether relational, intentional properties can in fact be seen as playing a causal role in the structuring (or “wiring”) of causal processes in the brain. Even during the learning process, the states of Lilian's brain would seem to be sensitive only to local, intrinsic features of one another, features that would screen off external goings-on. Dretske might be able to avoid such screening-off by appealing to the counterfactual dependence of behavior-structuring on these goings-on. His view would then stand or fall with the success of counterfactual theories of causal relevance (§5.3). A second question is whether intentional states, even if they were relevant in the way Dretske says they are, deliver the kind of causal relevance we want. When Lilian raises her hand, the structuring of the relevant processes in her brain has already occurred. If intentional properties are relevant at all, then, they are apparently relevant only to what happened in the past during the learning process. That seems odd. We normally regard mental properties as causally relevant to what's going on here and now, the very time when Lilian (or anyone) acts. Lilian's hand-raising is “rationalized” by her beliefs, desires, and intentions, because these cause her hand-raising (Davidson 1963; but cf. Owens 1993).
7.4 Broad Behavior?
Dretske's proposal is a version of the dual explanandum strategy considered briefly in §6.3. The idea is that physical and mental properties are causally responsible for different effects. For Dretske, the (triggering) physical properties are responsible for bodily motions, while the (structuring) mental properties are responsible for behavior.
Another version of this strategy begins with a point also made in §6.3, namely that the question of a property's causal relevance is really a question about its relevance to some property of the effect. The form of our central causal question, that is, is whether a mental cause qua F causes a behavioral effect qua G. Now when F is an intentional mental property, what G is the object of our question? One possibility is that it is a behavioral property that, like the mental property, is itself “broad”.
Consider a simple example: Suppose Lilian believes that a glass in front of her contains water, and this belief (together with her desires) causes her to reach for the glass. Her behavior is an instance of trying to get water, and it's the instantiation of this property (and not, say, the property of being a certain kind of bodily motion) that we're wondering about when we ask whether the intentional property of her belief is causally relevant. (If our interest lay solely in explaining a particular bodily motion, we would rest content with a non-psychological, purely physiological explanation.) But now the answer seems straightforward. For surely what makes Lilian's behavior a trying for water is that it's caused by a belief whose content concerns water. Once we realize that the behavioral property of the effect is itself broad, its connection to the intentional mental property seems clear.
This is not to say that the physical properties of Lilian's belief are irrelevant: it's just that they are relevant to a different property of the effect, say the property of being a forward arm-movement. The intentional properties of her belief are relevant to the effect qua (broad) behavior; the physical properties are relevant to the effect qua (narrow) bodily motion. And as we noted earlier (§6.3), such a solution can be aimed at the Exclusion Problem as well. If a mental property and its physical realizer are relevant to different properties of the effect, they need not compete for causal relevance.
Because it promises to solve two outstanding problems of mental causation, this approach is potentially quite powerful. (For discussion, see Fodor 1991a; Burge 1995.) One question to raise here, however, is whether the fact that some behavior can be described broadly makes the intentional mental property of its cause relevant. The undeniable conceptual connections between mental and behavioral descriptions might point to a kind of explanatory relevance, but it's a further question whether causal connections grounding these explanations involve broad properties. Those motivated by the original epiphenomenalist arguments will worry that narrow, physical properties are really doing all the work here: the apparent relevance of the broad properties is an illusion created by the way we, in describing and explaining behavior, conceptualize both cause and effect (see Owens 1993). This point leads to a fourth, related response to the problem.
7.5 The Appeal to Explanatory Practice
Some theorists would challenge the distinction—implicit in the forgoing discussion—between explanation and causation. Our concept of causality, they would insist, is bound up with the concept of explanation: causally relevant properties are those that figure in our best causal explanations (Segal and Sober 1991; Wilson 1992; Burge 1993; §6.3 above). We find out what causal relations amount to by starting with clear cases of causal explanation. Given that we (and the cognitive scientists) routinely explain physical events by citing mental causes (and mental events by invoking physical causes), questioning whether real causal relations answer to these explanations is to succumb to the kind of metaphysical hubris that gives metaphysics a bad name.
This appeal to explanatory practice has the potential to answer in one fell swoop all four of the property-based problems we've considered.
Doubtless our understanding of the notions of causality and causal relevance depends importantly on our grasp of causal explanations. But there are at least two areas of concern about the explanatory strategy (cf. Kim 1998, pp. 60-7). First, you might wonder whether the strategy addresses the right question. Earlier, we pointed out that the central question of mental causation is not so much whether mental properties are causally relevant but how they could be, given some alleged feature of mental properties (in the case at issue here the feature is their being relational properties). The explanatory strategy would at best seem to be addressing only the “whether” question, not the “how” question. Second, even when restricted to the “whether” question, the strategy rests on a conflation of what appears to be an epistemological notion (explanation) with metaphysical notions (causation and causal relevance). A full evaluation of the view would thus require a deeper look into how the two are related.
8. Metaphysics and the Philosophy of Mind
We have been treating the problem of mental causation as though it were a problem in applied metaphysics. Perhaps this approach is wrong-headed. Perhaps the problem really falls under the purview of the philosophy of science. What if we began with a look at actual scientific practice (as suggested in §§6.3, 7.5) and determined what exactly science requires for acceptable causal explanation. An examination of established special sciences reveals that the very features (multiple realizability, higher-level and “broad” properties, for instance) metaphysically inclined philosophers regard as posing apparently insuperable difficulties for mental causation, are routinely invoked in causal explanations in those sciences. This suggests that, rather than let a priori conceptions of causation (or properties, or causal powers) lead us to regard mental causation with suspicion, we should reason in the other direction: revise our conception of causation to fit our actual scientific beliefs and practices. If the metaphysicians were right about causation, no science would be possible beyond basic physics (biological properties, for instance, would not be causal).
This is one way to go. Another way to go, is to take a step backward and ask which features of our conception of the mental, features we commonly take for granted, might be the source of our difficulties. Eliminativists aside, all parties evidently agree that “realism about the mental” requires that mental predicates figuring in causal accounts of behavior designate distinctively mental properties. If we aim to honor psychology (and the other special sciences), our job is to show how these properties could be causally relevant to physical goings-on. Suppose, in contrast, that you took the goal to be, not the preservation of mental properties, but the preservation of mental truths. In that case we would seek an account of the mind that provides plausible truthmakers for psychological and psycho-physical claims, including claims concerning mental causation.
One possibility is that truthmakers for psychological truths include irreducibly mental properties. This is not the only possibility, however. Another is that psychological assertions are made true by physical states and properties, states and properties answering to predicates belonging to physics and chemistry. A view of this kind (which is close to Davidson's as spelled out in §5.5 and to the identity solution discussed in §6.5) would endeavor to resolve the problem of mental causation, not by tinkering with the causal concept, but by rejecting the idea that mental properties are distinct from physical properties. All parties agree that mental predicates and descriptions differ from physical predicates and descriptions. Application conditions for mental terms and physical terms diverge in ways that preclude definitional reduction of the one to the other. Perhaps it is a mistake, however, to move from this linguistic fact to a substantive ontological thesis: mental and physical predicates designate properties belonging to distinct families of properties.
Whether anything like this could be made to work is an open question. To the extent that you regard the current state of play as unsatisfying, however, it is perhaps a question worth pursuing.
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Other Internet Resources
- Bibliographies on Mental Causation and Externalism and Mental Causation (David Chalmers and David Bourget, Australasian National University). Includes links to online papers.
- Entry on Mental Causation (by Karen Bennett) in Philosophy Compass.
- Entry on Mental Causation (by Julie Yoo) in The Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy.
- Entry on Metaphysics of Mind (by John Heil) from A Field Guide to the Philosophy of Mind.
Related Entries
action | anomalous monism | causation: counterfactual theories of | causation: the metaphysics of | emergent properties | epiphenomenalism | functionalism | identity theory of mind | mental content: externalism about | mental content: narrow | multiple realizability | physicalism | properties | qualia | tropes
Acknowledgments
We are grateful to the editors for helpful advice on preparing this entry.