The Definition of Death

First published Fri Oct 26, 2007; substantive revision Fri Jul 10, 2026

The definition of death involves matters of philosophy and public policy. The philosophical investigation of death has focused primarily on two questions: What is human death? and How can we determine that it has occurred? A third question in the background is what relevance, if any, should ethical or practical considerations have on how we define and determine death? The first question is ontological or conceptual. An answer to this question will consist of a definition (or conceptualization) of death. Examples include death as the irreversible cessation of the integrated functioning of the organism as a whole or death as the irreversible loss of personhood. The second question is epistemological: How do we know when someone is dead? A complete answer to this question will include both a general physiological standard (or criterion) for determining that death has occurred and specific clinical tests to show whether the standard has been met. Examples of standards are the circulatory-respiratory standard or the whole-brain standard. Clinical tests are meant to establish that the standard has been met. Although clinical tests are primarily a medical concern, their validation is guided, in part, by certain ethical norms, the chief one being the imperative to minimize false positives as much as possible.

The philosophical issues concerning the definition of death are connected to other questions involving the philosophy of biology, personal identity, and biomedical ethics. How does the death of human beings relate to the death of other living things? Is human death an instance of organismic death, and therefore a matter of biology? If not, on what other basis should it be defined? Does human death have an essence—either de re or de dicto—that entails necessary and jointly sufficient conditions? Or do the varieties of death reveal only “family resemblance” relations? Are life and death exhaustive categories, or do some individuals fall into an ontological neutral zone between life and death? How do our deaths relate to our essence and identity as human persons if at all? Finally, does disagreement over these important questions justify a policy in which individuals are free to define death for themselves?

Such questions did not garner much public attention until well into the twentieth century (for historical background, see Pernick 1999). Irremediable injuries to our vital organs quickly brought about our demise. Sufficient destruction of the brain ensured respiratory failure leading to cardiac arrest. Conversely, prolonged cardiopulmonary failure led to total, irreversible loss of brain function. Hence, the traditional standard of unresponsiveness, breathlessness, and pulselessness observed over some number of minutes presumed that neurologic and cardiopulmonary functions were inseparable. However, with advances in mechanical ventilation in the 1950s, a previously lethal brain injury could coexist with continued cardiopulmonary functioning, which, then, sustained the rest of the body. Was such a patient alive or dead? The questions of what constituted death, and how we could determine it, emerged as issues both philosophically rich and urgent for public policy.

A landmark 1968 report published by a Harvard Medical School committee reflected these concerns and proposed defining, “irreversible coma”, a now dated term for brain death (Mollaret & Goulon 1959), “as a new criterion for death” (Harvard Medical School Ad Hoc Committee 1968: 337). [1] Soaring medical expenditures, concern over non-beneficial treatment, and emerging interest in organ transplantation, especially heart transplantation, motivated the need to efficiently determine that a patient had died without reference to cardiopulmonary (heart-lung) functions. At the time, removing a ventilator or a heart from a “hopelessly unconscious patient” (Beecher 1968) risked violating laws against homicide and the widely accepted moral rule against intentional killing innocent human beings (see the entry on doing vs. allowing harm). While there were—as there are now—individuals who supported procuring organs from moribund patients who had consented to donate (see the entry on voluntary euthanasia), this was, and remains, controversial. Therefore, if brain dead patients could be declared dead, physicians could act consistently with the law and standard medical ethics. The interest in determining death as soon as possible for practical purposes continues to influence how death is defined today.

Yet these medicine-centered interests along with the oddness of the “brain dead” condition, in which the patient is mechanically ventilated, retains a pulse, and appears asleep, continue to generate skepticism in families at the bedside and members of the public. The high-profile case of Jahi McMath, who was declared dead in 2013 on neurologic grounds under California law and declared dead again in 2018 on circulatory-respiratory grounds under New Jersey law, highlights the conflict between medicine’s authority to determine death and the public’s willingness to accept it (Aviv 2018; Shewmon & Salamon 2021). Many members of the public question whether brain death is death, and a substantial number of philosophers, lawyers, and physicians are sympathetic to their concerns (Ludka, Hurse, & Brummett 2025; Shewmon 2023).

The remainder of this entry takes a dialectical form, focusing more on ideas and arguments rather than on history and individuals. It begins with an overview of background issues that influence how the definition of death (1) relates to our identity and persistence conditions; (2) is approached from different levels of analysis, philosophical, legal, and medical; (3) is subject to different interpretations of modal constraint, either in terms of irreversibility or permanence; and (4) is conceptualized in terms of a process or an event. Moving from these background considerations, we explore an approach that nearly achieved consensus status: the neurologic approach. The discussion proceeds from an overview of the arguments for and against that approach and moves to a strict circulatory-respiratory approach. This approach is notable for its rejection of any determination or definition of death by neurologic criteria. Finally, we examine whether death is a “cluster concept” not amenable to standard definition. The entry is intended to identify the main philosophical issues connected with the definition and determination of death, leading approaches that have been developed to address them, and principal strengths and difficulties of these approaches viewed as competitors.

Background Issues

Four key issues influence how death is defined: the identity of what dies, the level of analysis it is defined at, the meaning of death’s “irreversibility”, and whether death is a process or an event.

1.1 Identity of the Object of Death

Conceptualizations of death are constrained by two assumptions about what the object that dies fundamentally is, and what it means for it to live. Death is the end of life, but without specifying the identity and nature of what lives, there is little else to say about death beyond this truism. Two popular options have dominated the discourse over human death: either a human organism or a human person is that which ceases to live (Van Inwagen 1990, Olson 1997, Baker 2000, DeGrazia 2005, Lizza 2006). Those two choices are not exhaustive, however. One might think a part of an organism such as an “embodied mind”— that is, a brain or part of a brain capable of having a stream of consciousness—is what ceases to live (McMahan 2002: chap. 1). The options involve fundamental matters of personal identity, human ontology, and the nature of our existence, the details of which are explained elsewhere (see the entries on Death and Personal Identity). For ease of exposition, we will use two frameworks, the biological approach and the psychological approach, to offer insights into what human beings are, and how their persistent conditions generate implications for what it means to die (see Olson 2007 for an overview of the options). The relevant issues involving identity will emerge as we survey the various approaches to defining death.

1.2 Levels of Analysis

Death is defined at different levels of analysis for different disciplinary purposes. The metaphysician, seeking to explain the fundamental nature of reality, may argue that death is the separation of the soul from the body (e.g. Plato). The lawyer, seeking to give guidance to society, may argue that this view is consistent with death as the loss of a civil status marked by the irreversible loss of all brain function. The physician, seeking consistency with certain epistemological and ethical standards in clinical diagnosis, may further argue that the irreversible loss of brain function can be determined by waiting five minutes after the loss of circulation. The goals of these different levels of analysis are specified by their discipline. For metaphysics, it is the satisfaction of inquiry at a high level of generality; for jurisprudence, it is for the just ordering of society; for medicine, it is for achieving diagnostic certainty. The analyses produced at each level may be faulty or they may not cohere with one another, so criticism can be directed to the content of each level individually, or to the logical relationships between the different levels.

How many levels of analysis there are remains unsettled. The standard view, represented by Bernat, Culver, and Gert (1981), is that there are three: a concept of death, a criterion (or criteria) for determining it, and medical tests for verifying it. In their view, the development of the concept is primarily a philosophical task; development of the criterion is both legal and medical; development of the tests is exclusively medical. By contrast, Capron and Kass (1972) argue that there are four: a basic concept, general physiological standards, operational criteria, and specific tests or procedures. Their advice to lawmakers is that basic concepts, operational criteria, and specific tests are not suitable for the level of generality needed to craft statutory law; general physiological standards are to be preferred (Capron 2022).[2]

A complete analysis of the definition of death involves an interdisciplinary project that seeks coherence between the various levels of analysis, making for a complicated endeavor. (A recent document that is attentive to at least three levels of analysis is the Academy of Royal Medical Colleges 2025 Code of Practice). The complexity of this endeavor underlies the argument that death, especially brain death, is socially constructed (Bishop 2019). According to this perspective, our definitions of death are built only for social purposes and adequately justifying them depends on arguments from ethical and legal perspectives that are underdetermined by scientific reasoning (Charo 1999; Dagi & Kaufman 2001).

1.3 Irreversibility versus Permanence

Irreversibility is a commonly accepted condition in the definition of death. It seems a matter of commonsense that death “cannot” be reversed, because if something could be done to reverse it, that would mean that the individual who died continues to exist, has the capacity to be alive, and needs some intervention to exercise this capacity. But continuing to exist, having the capacity to be alive, and being a potential beneficiary of life-extending treatment contradict commonsense assumptions about death: we cease to exist at death or lack the capacity to be alive or nothing can be done for us. Therefore, death cannot be reversed (for counterargument, see DiSilvestro 2012).

The problem is that natural-language modal terms like “cannot” are semantically flexible and context-dependent, especially in the context of determining death. For example, someone who suffers cardiac arrest but whose circulation can be restored with an intensive bypass technology called extracorporeal membrane oxygenation (ECMO) is in a condition that can be reversed in a way that is physiologically possible. However, ECMO may not be available for the patient, so the condition “cannot” be reversed practically. Or, if ECMO is available, but the patient issued a do-not-resuscitate order, the clinicians “cannot” initiate ECMO in a way that is morally acceptable. Alternatively, the patient may prefer to be resuscitated, but the clinicians know that ECMO “cannot” make a difference to the outcome, and therefore withhold it, which reflects the “cannot” of epistemic certainty about the futility of the proposed intervention.

Hence, the concept of “irreversibility” is subject to different “strengths” of impossibility, which impacts how death is defined and determined. This has been relevant for a proposal that has proven popular with clinicians and policymakers, but controversial among bioethicists: death can be declared when the cessation of circulatory-respiratory functions is observed, and it is known that this cessation will not reverse spontaneously, though it could be physically reversed by an intervention which will not be performed. This interpretation of “irreversibility” allows for the permissibility of the organ procurement practice known as donation-after-circulatory-determination of death (DCDD). In DCDD, surgeons are permitted to remove organs from a donor who progresses to pulselessness after a shared decision to withdraw life-sustaining measures is made. Before opening the body, the surgeons must wait some number of minutes (usually five) to rule out the possibility of spontaneous recovery of circulation (Lomero et al. 2020). Thus, if the cessation of circulation will not reverse spontaneously and nothing will be done to restart it for ethical reasons, death can be validly declared (Tomlinson 1993). Interpreting “irreversibility” this way satisfies what has become known as the “permanence principle” (Manara et al. 2020). The language of “permanence” has been recommended over the language of “irreversibility” at the policy level because it is thought to better represent the clinical practice of determining death by circulatory-respiratory criteria when the patient has a “do-not-resuscitate” order (Bernat 2010). Whether the permanence principle applies to determining death by neurologic criteria, however, remains unsettled (Swiss Academy of Medical Sciences 2017; Verheijde et al. 2018; Hanley 2020: 178–89; McGee & Gardiner 2022; Omelianchuk 2025; Lewis et al. 2026).

Critics of the permanence principle argue that pragmatic considerations can only describe the circumstances under which one chooses to declare death but these circumstances are not the same as the conditions for death, one of which is consistency with the laws of nature (Marquis 2018; Nolan 2020). Conflating criteria for when life-sustaining measures should be withheld or when organs should be procured with the criteria for knowing when death occurs is a mistake (Fost 1999, Marquis 2010). The mistake, critics allege, not only involves confusing ontology with epistemology, but an epistemology that is subject to serious conflicts of interests (Nair-Collins 2015). On the other hand, there are questions to be settled about what the metaphysical facts are (organism v. person; process v. event) and whether there are legitimate reasons for defending a more relativized view of irreversibility (e.g. Lizza 2005, 2020; McGee & Gardiner 2022). Nonetheless, it may be that those reasons involve values that justify a declaration of death before “true irreversibility” occurs because little benefit is gained by determining when that occurs, leading to an increasingly recognized discordance between the conceptualization of death and the tests used for determining it (Bernat 2022).[3]

1.4 Process versus Event

The philosophy of biology contains an enduring debate over whether death is a process or an event (Morison 1971; Kass 1971). Process-views tend to resonate with clinicians who do not observe sharp boundaries between life and death (Azevedo & Bitencourt Othero 2020; Magnus 2018), whereas event-views resonate with lawyers and policymakers who need a definite time at which to change one’s civil status (see Grisez & Boyle 1979: chap. 3). Although policy choices are influenced by this debate, some argue it is practically irrelevant because “death” only names a state whose functional description is what matters for decision-making (DuBois 2002).

For adherents of the process-view, the change from life to death, excluding sudden and violent causes, looks more like the change from dawn to dusk, a gradual one marked by small, imperceptible changes, none of which can be reasonably identified as the single determinant point at which death occurs. Different organs fail at different times depending on their sensitivity to oxygen and nutrient deprivation. The brain may fail because of a prolonged lack of oxygen, but the heart and lungs may continue to function, something observed in cases of brain death. If the brain dead body progresses to cardiac arrest, the soft tissues will necrotize, but parts of the skeletal system may stay intact for quite some time. The process of entropic deterioration admits of no sudden change from life to death (McGee & Gardiner 2022). Therefore, determining when death occurs is a matter of choosing a point along a continuum at which someone has crossed a “point of no return” (Pallis & Harley 1996: 4), and the choice of that point should be guided by a well-defined and reliably testable physiological standard consistent with our values (Magnus 2018).

Must there be a single line? Some argue that multiple lines can be drawn for different purposes (Halevy & Brody 1993). For example, there could be a definition of death for organ donors, and another for life-insurance claims, and another for medical “futility” cases. In this view, although life and death are mutually exclusive states, they are not exhaustive:

Although no organism can fully belong to both sets [{the living} and {the dead}], organisms can be in many conditions (the very conditions that have created the debates about death) during which they do not fully belong to either […] Death is a fuzzy set. (Brody 1999: 72)

On the contrary, even if this argument shows that death is more process-like than event-like—and to do this it must show that it is death itself, not dying, that is process-like—it does not follow that we ought to draw several lines for the determination of death. Consider the confusion that would likely result from such statements as “Grandmother is partly dead, but less dead than Grandfather, although he’s not fully dead”. People are accustomed thinking of life and death as mutually exclusive exhaustive sets, because it is plausible to assume that existence and non-existence are mutually exclusive exhaustive sets. For we generally assume that one goes out of existence at death (at least in this world; cf. DiSilvestro 2012). Nonetheless, proponents of the process-view might reply that we could reserve the language of death for a point near the end of the process marked by the circulatory-respiratory standard but still allow organ procurement at the beginning of the process marked by brain death (Rix 1990). Or we could get used to the language of someone’s being “partially dead” as they may be when brain dead (McGee, Gardiner, & Jansen 2023), or we could appreciate that existence is sometimes partial because we have good reasons to accept ontic vagueness (Van Inwagen 1990).

The event-view of death, by contrast, is more consistent with our linguistic practices (Shewmon & Shewmon 2004), which distinguish the process of dying from the process of decomposition (Bernat, Culver, & Gert 1981). Instead of viewing death as a prolonged process, beginning with our existence and overlapping with the process of living, the event-view separates dying from decomposition by locating death at a discrete moment in time. This moment need not be identifiable when it occurs but retrospectively verifiable so as to avoid false positives in examination. The faulty assumption of the process-view, critics allege, is that it is needlessly committed to accounting for the death of the whole organism—its constituent organ systems and tissues that disintegrate at different times—rather than accounting for the death of an organism as a whole, which can occur all at once (Kass 1971; Shewmon 2022). This “organism as a whole” concept has been influential in the philosophy of biology in general (Loeb 1916), and in the brain death debate in particular (Bonelli, Prat, & Bonelli 2009). It has also generated much discussion about the nature of the organism’s “integrative unity”, a property that features prominently in biological approaches to defining death (Shewmon 2001; Moschella 2016b; Huang & Bernat 2019; Scherz 2022).

2. The Neurologic Approach

Although determining death by neurologic criteria is widely accepted around the world there is some notable variation about what the precise physiological standard is, and even more variation as to why satisfying it is thought to indicate death. Before describing the various standards and their rationales, it is worth understanding two ways the relationship between the brain and the rest of the body’s organ systems plays a role in conceptualizing the neurologic approach.

2.1 Interdependence v. Neurocentrism

The interdependence view focuses on integrated functioning between the brain, heart, and lungs such that if any one of them fails, the other two cannot function together in some life-defining sense. The interrelationship between these organ systems is taken to be “basic” (Khushf 2010: 359). In death, their functions dis-integrate from one another, and only circulatory and respiratory functions can be held together artificially. In this view, both neurologic and circulatory-respiratory criteria are taken to be individually sufficient ways to determine death as they both “provide a window on the same phenomenon” (President’s Commission 1981: 33; cf. Capron & Lynn 1982; Capron 1998; Khushf 2010). What the nature of this “phenomenon” is and how the criteria stand in relationship to it tends to be underexplained, raising questions about whether it is possible to irreversibly lose circulatory-respiratory function but retain brain function (Capron 1999).

By contrast, the neurocentric view claims that the cessation of brain function is both necessary and sufficient for death. In this view, “all death is brain death” making circulatory-respiratory criteria a causal surrogate for neurologic death (Posner 2007; Manara 2019; cf. Bernat, Culver, & Gert 1981). A potential problem for this view is that it excludes human embryos and early-term fetuses from the set of living humans simply because they do not yet have brains (Howsepian 1998). Moreover, there are coherent ways to determine the death of embryos without reference to the brain like focusing on the irreversible cessation of cell-division (Landry & Zucker 2004). In response, defenders of the neurocentric view can deny there is a problem because their view derives from a psychological approach to personal identity, which depends on the existence of a functioning brain. Or, if they prefer to avoid such metaphysical issues, they can stipulate that “brain life” is the mirror image of “brain death” for policy purposes (Sass 1989). Less controversially, one can just restrict the domain of “individuals-to-be-examined” to those who have completed the normal course of natal development (Moschella 2016a).

2.2 The Whole-Brain Approach

According to the whole-brain approach, death is the irreversible cessation of all functions of the entire brain, including the brainstem. This approach (and §2.3 the brainstem approach) assigns significance to the difference between assisted and unassisted respiration. By moving air in and out of the lungs, a ventilator can enable adequate gas-exchange to support cardiac contractions for oxygenated circulation in a patient whose entire brain is irreversibly nonfunctional. But such a patient lacks the capacity for unassisted respiration since the drive to breathe is controlled by the brainstem. In the whole-brain approach, such a patient is dead; hence, it is sometimes said that mechanical ventilation “masks” death (President’s Commission 1981: 35; President’s Council 2008: 63).

Before evaluating the whole-brain approach, it is helpful to review some basic brain anatomy. The brain comprises two major portions: (1) the higher brain, consisting of both the cerebral cortex, the primary vehicle for the content of consciousness (awareness, cognition), and (2) the lower brain or brainstem. The brainstem includes the medulla, which controls spontaneous breathing and blood pressure, the reticular activating system, which regulates wakefulness and attention for the capacity for conscious awareness (alertness), as well as the mesencephalon and pons, which organize sensory information, motor control, and respiratory rhythm.

With this neuroanatomy in view, it is important to contrast brain death with various disorders of consciousness (for a helpful overview, see Young et al. 2021). Whole-brain death involves an irremediable injury that leads to the nonfunctioning of both the higher brain and the brainstem. By contrast, in the vegetative state (VS, or “unresponsive wakefulness syndrome” UWS), it is possible for the higher brain to be damaged, causing loss of awareness, and the brainstem intact, maintaining the capacity for alertness. Thus, a patient in a UWS/VS is alive according to the whole-brain standard. Retaining brainstem functions, UWS/VS patients can exhibit unassisted breathing, sleep-wake cycles, pupillary reaction to light, eye movements, and gagging/coughing reflexes. In general, if the body retains even partial brainstem functioning, it is alive on the whole-brain view. With this background, we turn now to the appeals and problems of the whole-brain approach.

2.2.1 The Appeal to Decapitation

The whole-brain approach aligns with certain intuitive judgments about our persistence conditions resembling those made in the case of decapitation. Decapitation is normally associated with an act of violence that causes rapid blood loss and death. Yet, it need not be because surgical experiments involving dogs and monkeys demonstrated the possibility of removing the head from the body while maintaining adequate perfusion to support, albeit minimal, brain function (White, Wolin, et al. 1971; cf. Wijdicks 2020; Schillace 2021). Moreover, the possibility of head (or is it body?) transplantation strongly suggests that we go where the head goes, or more importantly, where the brain goes (Puccetti 1969). Just as it is difficult to believe one would survive the process of receiving a new head, it is similarly difficult to believe one would survive the process of receiving a new brain (Parfit 2008). Decapitation purportedly shows that the brain has a privileged place in our persistence conditions, such that we die if it dies regardless of what happens to the rest of us (Lizza 2011). Decapitation causes death because of the loss of brain circulation, and therefore brain function. If the rest of our body were maintained by artificial means, its continued existence would not make a difference to the fact that we are no longer alive. Yet, if our severed head or isolated brain were to be maintained with some degree of preserved awareness, we would be justified in believing our life continues (Khushf 2010). Surgical experiments isolating the brains of monkeys reinforce this intuition (White, Albin, & Verdura 1963; Wijdicks 2020). Hence, whole-brain death, which involves a lethal drop in blood flow to the brain, results in a kind of “physiological decapitation” indicative of death (Bernat 2018; Sulmasy 2019).

2.2.2 The Appeal to Integrative Unity

The appeal to decapitation is subject to conflicting interpretations of personal identity and does not necessarily exclude the higher-brain approach (Lizza 2011). The whole-brain approach goes further, attributing significance to all functions of the entire brain, because of their alleged contribution to integrative unity. Integrative unity is deeply significant to the whole-brain approach because it relates all functions of the brain to the survival of the organism, not just to the survival of the mind or consciousness. In this view, life involves integrated function, which unifies disparate organ systems into a dynamic whole (Bonelli et al. 2009). According to the mainstream approach, death is the loss of the integrated functioning of the organism as a whole and the brain integrates the major bodily functions such that the total failure of all brain function is, at least, sufficient for death (President’s Commission 1981). Spontaneous circulation and respiration depend on neurologic integration by way of the brain’s regulation of blood pressure and the drive to breathe. The maintenance of body temperature, hormonal regulation, and various other functions associated with homeostasis—in humans and other organisms—depend on brain function (Bernat, Culver, & Gert 1981). Therefore, whole-brain death marks the irreversible loss of integrative unity, which indicates the loss of the organism as a whole. Remaining organ function below the neck does not contraindicate death in the whole-brain approach for the same reason it does not contraindicate it in an artificially sustained decapitated body: the integrative unity of the organism is lost.

2.2.3 Problems with Integrative Unity

The integrative unity rationale has been empirically challenged, allegedly showing that integrated function can continue after whole-brain death (Shewmon 1998). Many integrative functions, according to the challenge, are not mediated by the brain and can persist in individuals who meet whole-brain criteria for death. Such functions include homeostasis, assimilation of nutrients, detoxification and recycling of cellular wastes, wound healing, fighting of infections, and cardiovascular and hormonal stress responses to unanesthetized incisions; in a few cases, brain dead bodies have even gestated a fetus, matured sexually, or grown in size (Shewmon 2001; Shewmon 2018; Shewmon 2022). The claim is that most brain functions commonly cited as “integrative” merely sustain an existing functional integration, suggesting that the brain is more an enhancer than a dispenser of integrative unity throughout the body (Shewmon 2001). A key question is what counts as an “integrative function” and some defenders of the whole-brain approach argue that the proposed functions in the challenge are not truly integrative (Condic 2016; Moschella 2016b, 2019; Scherz 2022).

Critics further contend there is no reason to think what allegedly mediates integrative unity, the brain, is not replaceable, meaning the source of integrative unity need not be neurological. Technological resources may, in principle, be able to replace the integrative functions, and therefore the irreversible loss of brain function is neither necessary nor sufficient for death; all that matters is that the relevant functions be performed (Meier 2022). In response, defenders argue that (1) the brain is, in fact, irreplaceable in the sense that it cannot be substituted for relating the surviving integrative functions to us qua organism (Tollefsen 2016), and that (2) biologically mediated integrative unity depends on the property of “self-integration” which comes in degrees and admits of a threshold at which becoming dependent on medical care or technology for integrative unity indicates the loss of one’s biological life (Sulmasy & DeCock 2023; Sulmasy, Decock, et al. 2024; DeCock 2024; cf. Moschella 2016b; Eberl 2025).

2.2.4 Problems with Requiring All Brain Functions to Cease

A practical problem for the whole-brain approach relates to its demand that all functions of the brain cease irreversibly. The standard clinical exam method by which death is neurologically determined does not test for all functions (Bernat 1992). Rather, the tests examine responsiveness and brainstem function, one of which is the breathing reflex (Greer, Kirschen, et al. 2023). An injury that leads to, and explains, the cessation of these functions must be documented, and confounders must be excluded. Usually, it is inferred from imaging studies that consciousness is irretrievably lost when there is clear evidence of irremediable damage to the cerebral cortex. However, there are parts of the brain that can survive the pathological process of brain death, namely the hypothalamic-pituitary axis responsible for neuroendocrine function. Several studies show that many patients diagnosed as brain dead continue to exhibit regulated secretion of vasopressin, a hormone critical to maintaining homeostasis (Nair-Collins 2022). Neuroendocrine regulation is thought to be an integrative function of the organism as a whole (Nair-Collins & Joffe 2023; Shewmon 2022).

Answering this challenge depends on what counts as an “integrative function” in the whole-brain approach (Molina Pérez 2022; Molina Pérez et al. 2023). A distinction made at the policy-level between “function” and “activity” is thought to permit examiners to forgo testing whatever is classified as an “activity”. According to the President’s Commission,

After an organ has lost the ability to function within the organism, electrical and metabolic activity at the level of individual cells or even groups of cells may continue for a period of time. Unless this cellular activity is organized and directed, however, it cannot contribute to the operation of the organism as a whole. (President’s Commission 1981: 75)

Consequently, some argue that neuroendocrine regulation is a mere activity (Shemie, Hornby, et al. 2014: 791). Others argue that the universal quantifier ranging over “all” functions is restricted to “clinical” or “critical” functions and that preserved hypothalamic function is neither (Bernat 1992, 1999***latter not in bib*). Others invoke “fuzzy logic” to account for the ineliminable vagueness in the process of death and permit actions at different points of functional decline in that process, for example, organ procurement at the permanent loss of consciousness and breathing (Halevy & Brody 1993). Still others contend that any downgrade of the continued work of the hypothalamus is unacceptable (Nair-Collins 2022).

2.3 The Brainstem (“Brain as a Whole”) Approach

The concept of brain death evolved differently in the United Kingdom in contrast to the United States (Gardiner & McGee 2022). In the UK, the so-called “brainstem” standard was recognized in the 1970s by the Academy of Royal Colleges of Medicine, and it received its most rigorous clinical and philosophical defenses in the 1980s and 90s (Academy of Royal Colleges 1976, 1979; Lamb 1985, Pallis 1990, 1999; Pallis & Harley 1969). Although the whole-brain and brainstem standards differ in their anatomical focus, the clinical tests used to determine whether they are met are the same (Wijdicks 2012). What the clinical tests used throughout the world examine is threefold: the irremediable loss of the capacity for consciousness, brainstem reflexes, and the capacity for spontaneous breathing (Greer, Shemie, et al. 2020). Since the material capacity for these functions are localized in the brainstem and the clinical tests easily assess them, “brain death” is more accurately described as “brainstem death”. Proponents of the brainstem approach have contrasted it with the whole-brain approach, claiming that “The irreversible cessation of brainstem function implies the death of the brain as a whole” (Pallis & Harley 1996: 11 emphasis added). The American Academy of Neurology’s 2023 Guideline for determining death by neurologic criteria instructs examiners to show “no evidence of function of the brain as a whole, a state which must be permanent” (Greer, Kirschen, et al. 2023: 1113 emphasis added).

2.3.1 The Appeal to Consistency

The brainstem approach maintains a consistent relationship between three levels of analysis, the definition of death, the criterion for determining it, and the diagnostic tests used to verify it. Its concept is meant to be both biologically and socially adequate, defining death both in biological terms of the “dissolution of the organism as a whole” (as opposed to the whole organism) and in cultural terms of the loss of the “conscious soul” and “the breath of life” (Pallis & Harley 1996: 3). The criterion derived from this definition is the irreversible loss of the capacity for consciousness combined with the loss of the capacity for spontaneous breathing. The clinical tests are justified because they directly focus on the brainstem from its top to bottom to verify that these neurologic functions are lost; the documentation of an irremediable injury that explains the exam results and the elimination of confounders establish irreversibility. In this view, the brain is the “critical system” of the organism, and the brainstem the “critical system of the critical system” (Pallis & Harley 1996: 6). So, when the “brain as a whole” is lost, the “organism as a whole” is lost and degradation of the whole body is only a matter of time. Worries about continued hypothalamic function are simply irrelevant to the definition and determination of death, something that reflects clinical practice around the world (Greer, Shemie, et al. 2020).

2.3.2 The Appeal to Neurocentrism

Because the brainstem approach focuses on the “critical system of the critical system” it is neurocentric (Pallis & Harley 1996: 10). One can determine death by circulatory-respiratory criteria only because the lack of circulation causes the brainstem to fail. Circulatory-respiratory criteria are not just another way to determine if “integrative unity” is lost. Rather, their validity depends on how they relate to the critical system of the brain; if there is no circulation to the brain, there is no brainstem function; if the cessation of brain circulation is permanent, it can be concluded that death has occurred (Academy of Royal Medical Colleges 2025). This markedly causal account of circulatory criteria for determining death stands in contrast to the disjunctive standard codified in the Uniform Determination of Death Act (UDDA), the American legal standard for death, which is satisfied either by the whole-brain standard or the circulatory-respiratory standard, whichever comes first:

An individual who has sustained either (1) irreversible cessation of circulatory and respiratory functions, or (2) irreversible cessation of all functions of the entire brain, including the brain stem, is dead. A determination of death must be made in accordance with accepted medical standards. (President’s Commission 1981: 2)

The alternative to the UDDA’s disjunctive approach is the “unified brain-based” approach (Bernat 2024). The unified brain-based approach is reflected in the UK’s Code and elsewhere because its commitment to neurocentrism is thought to be more scientifically justified (Academy of Medical Royal Colleges 2025; Swiss Academy of Medical Sciences 2017; Shemie et al. 2023).

2.3.3 Diagnostic and Definitional Problems

Objections to the brainstem approach typically begin with the possibility of it furnishing misleading results. The worry is that an unusually specific injury to the brainstem

could selectively impair all brainstem function that can be clinically assessed while preserving some residual (but clinically undetectable) function of the ascending reticular activating system sufficient to warrant some residual, fluctuating form of awareness,

and thereby produce a false-positive (Laureys 2005: 901). Those who defend the brainstem approach reply that it is not committed to the view that all pathological changes in the brain are confined to the brainstem, and that a proper diagnosis begins not with the tests for brainstem functions, but the documentation of an injury that affects the upper brain as well as the lower (Pallis 1990: 443–4). If so, the brainstem approach might better be named the “brain as a whole” approach since it is not exclusively focused on the of the brainstem, but other parts of the brain as well, namely “the loss of the functional activity of the brain stem [sic] and cerebral cortex” (Magnus, Wilfond, & Caplan 2014: 892).

In terms of the definition of death, it is not clear what concept is satisfied when the criteria of the irreversible loss of the capacity for consciousness, brainstem reflexes, and spontaneous breathing are satisfied—sometimes called “neurorespiratory criteria” (Omelianchuk et al. 2022). Some argue that these criteria can only identify a state of “irreversible apneic unconsciousness” and satisfying this condition suffices for legal, but not biological, death (Truog et al. 2020). Because continued hypothalamic function is consistent with the “brain as a whole” approach, the appeal to decapitation is less compelling than it is in the whole-brain approach (Sulmasy 2019). Therefore, critics conclude, neurorespiratory criteria do not satisfy an adequate biological account of death (Sulmasy & DeCock 2023).

It can be replied that the necessity of including the loss of spontaneous breathing tracks an important biological function, at least for organisms that have grown beyond their embryonic stage. The President’s Council of Bioethics advances the notion that “total brain failure” (their name for “brain death”) represents the loss of the organism’s capacity to perform it’s “fundament vital work”, a life-defining activity that is more concrete than the abstraction of integrative unity. The fundamental vital work of an organism is characterized by: (1) receptivity to stimuli from the surrounding environment; (2) the ability to act upon the world to obtain, selectively, what the organism needs; and (3) the basic felt need that drives the organism to act as it must to obtain what it needs (President’s Council 2008: 61). The spontaneous drive to breath (as well as consciousness) signifies all three. Critics reply that these criteria are incoherent (Miller & Truog 2009), ad hoc (Nair-Collins & Miller 2017), and subservient to the more fundamental property of “integrative unity” (Thomas 2012) that is necessary to be—not just stay—alive (Shewmon 2022: 36). Defenders contend that these criteria are not ad hoc but descriptive of a principled biology that takes interaction with the environment seriously (Rubenstein 2009; Scherz 2022), especially the activity of “self-movement” towards an organism’s teleologically defined end (Omelianchuk 2021). The biological concepts marshalled to ground the “brain as a whole” approach tend to be non-standard, drawing upon phenomenological and classical resources that view sentience and purposeful movement as defining characteristics of life (Kass 1995; Lee & Grisez 2012; Lee 2016).

2.4 The Higher-Brain Approach

So far, our survey of the neurological approach has been concerned with maintaining consistency with a biological approach to human ontology. Thus, it has been informed by the philosophy of biology and avoided focus on personhood. By contrast, the higher-brain approach is not so concerned with biology and instead seeks consistency with a psychological approach to personal identity. Thus, it is of interest to philosophers who seek conceptual clarity about human nature and what is ultimately valuable in human life with less focus on specifying legal criteria or clinical tests for determining it.

According to the higher-brain approach, death is the irreversible loss of the capacity for consciousness. “Consciousness” is used here to broadly include any subjective experience, so that both wakeful and dreaming states count as instances. The capacity for consciousness refers to the neurological hardware needed for awareness, which is possessed by individuals in a dreamless sleep or reversible coma. One dies on this view when the brain is incapable of returning to awareness. This implies that a patient in UWS/VS or a coma that cannot be reversed is dead despite continued brainstem function that permits spontaneous breathing. Among philosophers and bioethicists, it enjoys broad support with a substantial record in the literature (Veatch 1975; Engelhardt 1975; Green & Wikler 1980; Shewmon 1985; Gervais 1986; Bartlett & Youngner 1988; Puccetti 1988; Rich 1997; Baker 2000; Lizza 2006, 2018, 2020, 2025; McMahan 2002, 2009; Sarbey 2016). These scholars conceptualize death in different ways—though in each case as the irreversible loss of some property for which the capacity for consciousness is necessary.

It must be noted that the higher-brain approach is not legal anywhere in the world and there are no validated tests to determine it. At one point, it was thought there were reliable ways to determine it (Veatch 1993), but advances in neuroscience discovered confounding conditions such as the minimally conscious state and cognitive motor disassociation that complicate the diagnosis and prognosis of patients with persistent disorders of consciousness (Owen et al. 2006; Merker 2007). Guidance from neurology authorities recommend that the term “vegetative state” be replaced with “unresponsive wakefulness syndrome” and have rejected the so-called “permanent vegetative state” as a valid diagnostic category (Giacino et al. 2018). The intolerance of false-positives in death determination makes the higher-brain standard practically untenable. Practical problems aside, the higher-brain approach may yet inform how the accepted standards for determining death by neurologic criteria are to be understood. That is to say, the tests used in the whole-brain or brain as a whole approaches provide a high degree of certainty that the higher-brain standard has been satisfied (Gelb 2021). Therefore, the following usage of the “higher brain approach” or “higher brain standard” will be associated with its concept of death and not any clinical or diagnostic standards.

2.4.1 The Appeal to the Essence of Human Persons

A prominent defense of the higher-brain approach appeals to the essence of human persons, and argues this essence requires the capacity for consciousness (see, e.g., Bartlett & Youngner 1988; Veatch 1993; Engelhardt 1996: 248; Rich 1997; Baker 2000: 5; Lizza 2006, 2018, 2020, 2025; McMahan 2009). “Essence” is used here in a strict ontological sense, referring to the property or set of properties without which an individual cannot exist. From this perspective, human persons are essentially beings with the capacity for consciousness such that they cannot exist at any time without having it.

Those who advance this reasoning hold different positions about what exactly it is that is essential for our existence. Some appeal to personhood in a robust sense using “person” to refer to beings with relatively complex psychological capacities such as self-awareness over time, reason, and moral agency (Engelhardt 1996; Baker 2000). Others apparently hold that any member of our species who retains the capacity for consciousness, no matter how diminished, qualifies as a person (Shewmon 1985; Bartlett & Youngner 1988; Lizza 2006, 2018, 2020, 2025). Still, others avoid invoking personhood but claim that we are essentially “human beings”, a category that ranges over any member of our species who has the capacity for consciousness (Veatch 1993). Some who defend the higher-brain approach assert that we are essentially “embodied minds” which is to say brains, or parts of brains, with the capacity for consciousness (McMahan 2002). In each case, an appeal to our essence is advanced to support the higher-brain approach (for critiques of these views, see DeGrazia 2005).

2.4.2 The Appeal to Morality

Another prominent defense in support of the higher-brain approach contends that the definition of death is a moral issue and that properly confronting it vindicates the higher-brain approach (see Veatch 1975, 1976, 1993; Gervais 1986: chapter 6; Nowak 2023; Aas 2024; Lizza et al. 2025). In asking how to determine that a human has died, what we are really asking is when we ought to discontinue certain activities such as life-support efforts or initiate organ donation, transfer to the morgue, autopsy investigations, burial or cremation, grieving rituals, change of a survivor’s marital status, and transfer of property. The question, in other words, is when “death behaviors” are appropriate (Veatch 1976: 26). This, the argument continues, is a moral question, so an answer should involve an appeal to a judgment about the individual’s moral status (Nowak 2023). Understood thus, the issue of defining human death is best addressed with the recognition that the permanent loss of the capacity for consciousness marks the time at which it is appropriate to commence death behaviors (Lizza et al. 2025).

Critics question whether the definition of death is any sense a moral issue (Marquis 2018). To be sure, saying that someone has died is tantamount to saying that certain behaviors are now appropriate while certain others are no longer appropriate. But it hardly follows that the declaration of death is a claim about who ought to be treated as dead. Moreover, the concept of death is rooted in biology, which is inclusive of non-human determinations of death—say, of a gnat or a clover—that are morally unimportant. Rather than asserting that death itself is a moral concept, it might be more plausible to assert that death is a biological phenomenon that is morally important—at least in the case of human beings. The interests of ICU managers, organ procurement organizations, and other civil institutions ought to be separated from how death is conceptualized so as to avoid conflicts of interest (Capron & Kass 1972).

Defenders of the moral approach argue that the biological paradigm is rife with value-laden problems (Lizza et al. 2025). For example, the concept of “organism” is ambiguous and value-laden choices are made in the selection of an organism concept to arrive at pre-selected valuable outcomes (Nowak & Stencel 2022). Also, the interpretation of “irreversible” is subject to practical and ethical constraints involving technological capabilities, resource constraints, and valid decisions to forgo life-sustaining treatment (DuBois 2002; Lizza 2020). Even so, it hardly follows that the higher-brain approach is preferable to other approaches. One might reasonably think the whole-brain or brain-as-a-whole approaches are preferable because they link to biological concepts that are not anthropocentric and cover a wider range of cases across the natural world (Bernat 2002). The right to be declared dead on such anthropocentric criteria, which could permit a clinical exam less demanding than those used in the whole-brain approach, must be grounded, then, in autonomous choice. As we shall see, the strongest specification of the present line of reasoning relies upon the next (and final) defense to be considered, one that concludes that we should permit individuals to select among several standards of death.

2.4.3 The Case for Choice

The case for choice proceeds from the enduring controversies over the definition death (Veatch & Ross 2016). These controversies reflect a plurality of concepts and values held by reasonable people across the globe (Díaz-Cobacho & Molina-Perez 2024). Some believe that our embodied existence in the world remains valuable even if we come to permanently lack all brain functions. Others believe that the presence of a gag reflex makes no difference to the diagnosis of death. That these views are rooted in ideas that do not reflect the current medical-legal consensus is of no concern and perhaps strengthens the reasons to respect them if they are held by vulnerable minorities (Johnson 2016). The definition of death, the argument goes, can only be settled by making controversial and value-laden choices that go beyond the biological sciences; if so, then individuals are entitled to choose among three reasonable options: circulatory-respiratory criteria, whole-brain/brain-as-a-whole criteria, and higher brain criteria (Veatch 2019). To prohibit choice is to act paternalistically, privileging some ideas above others arbitrarily, and permit unjust and coercive actions against dissenters such as certain Orthodox Jews, members of Japanese heritage, or others skeptical of the concepts behind brain death (Choi 2024). At the policy level, these liberty interests were recognized by the state of New Jersey (Olick 1991). There, an individual can “opt out” of being determined dead by neurologic criteria by making their objection known in their medical record, though one cannot be declared dead by higher-brain criteria. This policy has received growing support among bioethicists in recent years (Shewmon 2023).

Critics of the case for choice argue that it fails to be neutral with respect to the choices and is likely to cause chaos (Sulmasy 2019; Omelianchuk & Magnus 2022). A hidden assumption is that the circulatory-respiratory standard reflects true, biological death because its rationale does not go beyond biology, and therefore cannot be “opted out of” unlike the competing neurologic standards. The implication is that those who opt for the neurologic standard opt for one that is beholden to concepts that cannot be rationally justified within society or applied to other animals that have brains. Furthermore, how the choice is to be represented is fraught with difficulty. Why should pediatric patients who have had no view on the matter be subject to the choices of their parents? The liberty to define the terms and conditions of one’s moral status infringe on compelling communal and government interests, which involve assumptions that outstrip the justificatory framework of political liberalism (Williams 2017). For example, health care providers would have to treat patients in similar conditions in radically dissimilar ways. The providers would have a fiduciary duty to care for brain dead patients who objected to brain death and, for patients who endorse it and are organ donors, cut them up for donation purposes. The difference between murder and aggravated assault would hinge on how an individual or family perceives the brain dead condition of the victim, which is arbitrary and unjust.

Defenders reply that these outcomes are more tolerable than those caused by the coercive practices that happen under a policy that does not permit choice (Nair-Collins 2023). Privileging circulatory-respiratory criteria is rational because they are considered scientifically justified (Nair-Collins 2015), unlike neurologic criteria, which can only be justified as a “legal fiction” (Shah, Truog, & Miller 2011). Consistent with this view is Japan’s policy of treating the circulatory-respiratory standard as the default for everyone and the neurological standard as something people can “opt in” to for organ donation purposes (Bagheri 2007).

3. The Strict Circulatory-Respiratory Approach

Although the neurologic approach achieved near-consensus status in law and medicine, dissatisfaction with its philosophical and scientific justification renewed interest in focusing exclusively on a circulatory-respiratory standard. Contributing to this renewed interest is the controversy over DCDD organ donation (see §1.3). Critics charge that the loss of circulatory-respiratory functioning after five minutes of pulselessness is often reversible; they argue that if one can be resuscitated, one cannot be dead (Joffe 2018). Because both neurologically determined death and DCDD only serve to facilitate organ donation, a true understanding of death is clouded by conflicts of interests; an intuitive understanding of death is therefore to be preferred, one that is associated with coldness, stiffness, and a total lack of movement along with visible signs of decay (Nguyen 2018). Thus, only a strict circulatory-respiratory approach—one that focuses on the cessation blood moving through the body— that applies to all functions of the body and satisfies a strong sense of irreversibility, is justified.

3.1 The Appeal to Thermodynamics and Moral Certainty

Because the concept of death in this view is intuitive and easily identifiable when it manifests, clearly articulated definitions of the strict circulatory-respiratory standard are largely absent from the literature. Those that are articulated tend to appeal to thermodynamic conceptions of life that envisage organisms as entropy-resisting individuals. Death is defined as the event “when the entropy-increasing forces have irreversibly exceeded those that are resisting this process” (Miller & Truog 2012: 69–70). The organism’s ability to resist entropy depends on its ability to maintain homeostasis; therefore, “when the organism no longer has the ability to restore homeostasis, the organism has died” (Nair-Collins 2018: 32). Even those who define death in terms of the soul separating from the body for theological reasons support the appeal to the thermodynamic model for empirical purposes (Nguyen 2018: 381–83).

Some advocates of the strict circulatory-respiratory approach advise policymakers to define death as, “the permanent and irreversible loss of the integrated functioning of an organism as a whole” and the standard for determination as, “the permanent and irreversible cessation of circulatory, respiratory, and neurological functions, beyond the possibility of resuscitation” (James Bopp’s proposal to the Uniform Law Commission Determination of Death Act Committee, April 2022, cited in DeCock 2024; cf. Shewmon 2022: 42). Others advise that, “An individual who has sustained irreversible cessation of circulatory and respiratory functions is dead”, because such a standard satisfies their preferred biological concept of death, “the irreversible cessation of integrative, homeostatic functioning of the organism as a whole” (Miller & Nair-Collins 2020 [Other Internet Resources]). The chief advantage of such proposals, according to proponents, is that they adequately characterize the difference between life and death in a full range of cases and satisfying their clinical criteria guarantees that there will be no false positives.

3.2 Problems with Determining Irreversibility and Changing Policy

A major challenge for the strict circulatory-respiratory approach is knowing when irreversibility obtains. There is no agreement on what establishes clinical benchmarks for irreversibility and the appropriate amount of observation time needed to achieve them. The strictest approach advocates putrefaction as the only sure sign of death, which is thought to begin as little as ten minutes after circulatory arrest and is clinically determined whenever algor (ambient temperature change), rigor (stiffening), and livor (fluid drop) mortis set in (Oderberg 2019). Another proposal recommends that death should be determined only when algor and pallor (paleness) mortis are noticeable (Symons & Chua 2018). When these signs become observable will vary with the circumstances (age, body temperature, disease state, etc.), so no definitive number of minutes can be made (Shewmon 2010). The value of determining death in a timely manner is set aside in order to achieve the highest possible degree of moral certainty that death has occurred (Oderberg 2019).

It is worth noting that this general lack of knowledge about the amount of time needed to determine a strong sense of irreversibility by means of the cessation of circulation applies to both neurocentric and interdependent accounts of death in the neurologic approach. On the one hand, some proponents of a neurocentric approach recommend that death be declared by circulatory-respiratory criteria after one hour of unresponsiveness, breathlessness, and pulselessness to be sure the brain is irreversibly non-functional (Grisez & Boyle 1979: 79). While that may be too demanding, the question about how long a brain can survive without adequate perfusion is of central importance to DCDD organ procurement protocols that involve certain organ-preservation techniques that restart circulation in the body but not the brain (Bernat 2024; Kirschen et al. 2024). On the other hand, the most capable critic of the neurologic approach to defining death argues that a patient could be said to be “deceased” or to have “passed away” after the final heartbeat occurs, and that validly saying so does not depend on any arbitrary or vaguely defined point at which an irreversible change of “deamination” is identified (Shewmon 2010).

Another challenge confronting the strict circulatory-respiratory approach is that highly unpalatable practical consequences would follow from adopting it (Magnus, Wilfond, & Caplan 2014). Unless the dead-donor rule is rejected, taking organs from brain dead patients or those that have endured only five minutes of pulselessness would be illegal. There is broad agreement that having to wait beyond five minutes to procure organs would constitute a great setback to organ transplantation, depriving many of the opportunity to donate and help those in need of a life-preserving organ. Moreover, physicians would lose the authority to discontinue treatment unilaterally upon a determination of brain death despite what many would consider the inappropriateness of further treatment. Furthermore, waiting to declare death until the patient starts decomposing poses serious health risks to both clinicians and other patients in the hospital setting (Sulmasy 2019). Lastly, laws for determining death would have to be revised, which would likely lead to non-uniformity across different jurisdictions.

A defender of the strict approach could respond that we can avoid most of these consequences while legally adopting the strict circulatory-respiratory approach (see, e.g., DeGrazia 2005: 152–8). We could abandon the dead-donor rule, permitting the procurement of vital organs when authorized by appropriate prospective consent of the donor even though taking the organs would constitute “organ donation euthanasia” (Wilkinson & Savulescu 2012). We could appeal to “double effect” reasoning to argue that procurement surgery causes death as a “side-effect” of the intention to remove organs to help the donor donate (Bronner 2019; Camosy & Vukov 2021). We could authorize physicians to unilaterally withdraw life-support upon a declaration of brain death in cases where continued treatment is unnecessary for organ procurement and therefore inappropriate. Not all of what are traditionally considered “death behaviors” need to be anchored to a declaration of death. Death could be disentangled from what it means to be “beyond harm” (Glannon 2013), and the wrongness normally associated with causing death could be better explained by causing “total disability” (Sinnott-Armstrong & Miller 2013). Thus, despite rowing against the tide of the neurologic approach the strict circulatory-respiratory approach is a serious contender in the debate over the definition of death.

4. Death as a Cluster Concept not Amenable to Classical Definition

The definition of death has generally been understood as a competition between the approaches discussed here: whole-brain, brainstem, higher-brain, and circulatory-respiratory standards and their corresponding conceptualizations. Each of them, however, makes a contestable assumption: that there is a uniquely correct definition of death. Definitions, classically understood, are supposed to state necessary and jointly sufficient conditions for the correct application of a word or concept. They may be thought to capture de re essences existing independently of human thought, language, and interests, or de dicto essences determined solely by linguistic meaning. The major approaches we have considered have tried both to define death by capturing its essence and to advance a standard for determining death that coheres with the definition and allows for it to be empirically testable. But what if the term “death” cannot be defined in any such way?

Two shortcomings in the debate between organism-centered and personhood-centered approaches is that they produce counterintuitive results. First, the organism-centered definition—death as the irreversible cessation of functioning of the organism as a whole—makes no reference to consciousness. Yet surely, any individual that maintains consciousness should count as being alive even if the individual qua “organism as a whole” has irreversibly ceased to be (e.g., a blinking, feeling severed head that is artificially maintained). Second, personhood-centered definitions implausibly imply that those in “vegetative” states are dead despite exhibiting sleep-wake cycles, spontaneous breathing and circulation, brainstem-mediated reflexes (the infamous “philosophical zombie” is another curious example of a non-living thing on this view). The best explanation for the shortcomings of leading efforts to define death is that death is not amenable to definition in terms of necessary and sufficient conditions (Chiong 2005).

One might argue that the concept of death exhibits only “family resemblance” relations among its instances, as Wittgenstein argued was the case for the concepts of game, language, and many others (Wittgenstein 1953). There are various features of an organism that count towards its being dead, yet there is no authoritative list of features, all of which must be satisfied for it to be dead. Each of the following, for example, seems relevant: unconsciousness, absence of spontaneous efforts to breathe, absence of heartbeat, inertness, lack of integrated bodily functions, incapacity to grow, and physical decay. If all of these conditions are present, an organism has surely died. But producing an authoritative shortlist of necessary and sufficient conditions seems futile. One scholar has advanced a parallel claim about the concept of life:

When some property is central to the cluster—as I’ve argued consciousness is—then possessing only this one property may be sufficient for membership in [the class of living things]. However, merely possessing one or several properties that are peripheral to the cluster may not be sufficient for membership. [S]ome robots are organizationally complex and functionally responsive, though intuitively not alive. (Chiong 2005: 26)

If death has no essence and resists definition, what is the upshot? One possible inference—that the boundaries of death are vague—would partially merge the cluster approach with the view that death is a process (see §1.4). The advantage of the process-approach is to embrace several lines, each for a different purpose, in determining death. So long as a particular standard does not have clear and highly implausible implications, it is admissible for consideration on this view. Society may then select, among standards, whichever is most attractive for practical purposes. It has been argued, along these lines, that the higher-brain standard is inadmissible for implying that those in a vegetative state are dead while the traditional cardiopulmonary standard is inadmissible for implying (in principle) that a still-conscious individual might be dead (as the case may be in certain DCDD protocols, see Manara et al. 2020; Bernat 2024), clearing the ground for the whole-brain standard, which has few unacceptable implications and is attractive from a practical standpoint (Chiong 2005). That would moreover be consistent with the President’s Commission’s assertion that “what is missing in the dead is a cluster of attributes, all of which form part of an organism’s responsiveness to its internal and external environment” (1981: 36).

How might we evaluate the more general thesis that death is not amenable to classical definition? One strategy open to critics is to argue that some definition is adequate (Shewmon 2022: 28). Another strategy would be to argue that our failure thus far to produce an adequate definition does not mean that none is possible. Some concepts can be adequately captured by classical definitions even if it is difficult to produce them.

In any event, it would appear premature to render a judgment on the success of the present approach to understanding death. Be that as it may, “death” may be like “health” insofar as it resists simple definition (Blumenthal-Barby 2025). Because of the intractable disputes about the metaphysical, biological, social, political, and ethical commitments involved, it is hard to imagine that a single, unified theory of death could settle all the issues surveyed in this entry.

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  • Veatch, Robert M. and Lainie Friedman Ross, 2016, Defining Death: The Case for Choice, Washington, DC: Georgetown University Press.
  • Verheijde, Joseph L., Mohamed Y. Rady, and Michael Potts, 2018, “Neuroscience and Brain Death Controversies: The Elephant in the Room”, Journal of Religion and Health, 57(5): 1745–1763. doi:10.1007/s10943-018-0654-7
  • White, Robert J., Maurice S. Albin, and Javier Verdura, 1963, “Isolation of the Monkey Brain: In Vitro Preparation and Maintenance”, Science, 141(3585): 1060–1061. doi:10.1126/science.141.3585.1060
  • White, Robert J., Lee R. Wolin, Leo C. Massopust, Norman Taslitz, and Javier Verdura, 1971, “Cephalic Exchange Transplantation in the Monkey”, Surgery, 70(1): 135–139.
  • Wijdicks, Eelco F. M., 2012, “The Transatlantic Divide over Brain Death Determination and the Debate”, Brain, 135(4): 1321–1331. doi:10.1093/brain/awr282
  • –––, 2020, “Suspended (but No Animation) White’s Isolated Brain Experiments”, Neurocritical Care, 33(3): 840–843. doi:10.1007/s12028-020-00920-8
  • Wittgenstein, Ludwig, 1953, Philosophical Investigations, G. E. M. Anscombe (trans.), Oxford: Blackwell.
  • Wilkinson, Dominic and Julian Savulescu, 2012, “Should We Allow Organ Donation Euthanasia? Alternatives for Maximizing the Number and Quality of Organs for Transplantation”, Bioethics, 26(1): 32–48. doi:10.1111/j.1467-8519.2010.01811.x
  • Williams, Jeremy, 2017, “Death and Consensus Liberalism”, Philosopher’s Imprint, 17: article 20. [Williams 2017 available online]
  • Young, Michael J., Yelena G. Bodien, Joseph T. Giacino, Joseph J. Fins, Robert D. Truog, Leigh R. Hochberg, and Brian L. Edlow, 2021, “The Neuroethics of Disorders of Consciousness: A Brief History of Evolving Ideas”, Brain, 144(11): 3291–3310. doi:10.1093/brain/awab290

B. Other Important Works

  • Arnold, Robert M., and Stuart J. Youngner (eds), 1993, “Ethical, Psychosocial, and Public Policy Implications of Procuring Organs from Non-Heart-Beating Cadavers”, Special issue, Kennedy Institute of Ethics Journal, 3(2): 103–278.
  • Culver, Charles M. and Bernard Gert, 1982, Philosophy in Medicine: Conceptual and Ethical Issues in Medicine and Psychiatry, New York: Oxford University Press, chapter 10.
  • DeGrazia, David, 2014, “The Nature of Human Death”, in The Cambridge Companion to Life and Death, Steven Luper (ed.), New York: Cambridge University Press, 80–98 (ch. 5). doi:10.1017/CCO9781139149129.007
  • Institute of Medicine, 2006, Organ Donation: Opportunities for Action, James F. Childress and Catharyn T. Liverman (eds), Washington, DC: National Academy Press.
  • Jonas, Hans, 1974, “Against the Stream: Comments on the Definition and Redefinition of Death”, in his Philosophical Essays: From Ancient Creed to Technological Man, Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall, 132–140 (ch. 6).
  • Korein, Julius, 1978, “The Problem of Brain Death: Development and History”, Annals of the New York Academy of Sciences, 315(November): 19–38. doi:10.1111/j.1749-6632.1978.tb50327.x
  • Lewis, Ariane and James L. Bernat (eds), 2022, Death Determination by Neurologic Criteria: Areas of Consensus and Controversy (Advances in Neuroethics), Cham, Switzerland: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-3-031-15947-3
  • Lizza, John P. (ed.), 2009, Defining the Beginning and End of Life: Readings on Personal Identity and Bioethics, Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press.
  • Ramsey, Paul, 1970, The Patient as Person: Explorations in Medical Ethics (The Lyman Beecher Lectures at Yale University), New Haven, CT: Yale University Press, chapter 2.
  • Sorondo, Marcelo Sánchez (ed.), 2007, The Signs of Death: The Proceedings of the Working Group 11–12 September 2006 (Pontificiae Academiae Scientiarvm Scripta Varia 110), Vatican City: The Pontifical Academy of Sciences. [Sorondo 2007 available online (pdf)]
  • Warfield, Ted A., 2002, “When Doctors Kill Patients: Vital Organ Transplants”, Philosophic Exchange, 32(1): 51–67. [Warfield 2002 available online]
  • Youngner, Stuart J., Robert M. Arnold, and Renie Schapiro (eds), 1999, The Definition of Death: Contemporary Controversies, Baltimore, MD: Johns Hopkins University Press.
  • Zaner, Richard M. (ed.), 1988, Death: Beyond Whole-Brain Criteria (Philosophy and Medicine 31), Dordrecht/Boston: D. Reider/Kluwer. doi:10.1007/978-94-009-2707-0

Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

As of the 2026 update, Adam Omelianchuk has taken over responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry.

Copyright © 2026 by
Adam Omelianchuk <adam.omelianchuk@bcm.edu>
David DeGrazia

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