Reid’s Ethics

The moral theories defended by modern philosophers are said to fall into two categories. On the one hand, are the rationalist positions developed by thinkers such as Samuel Clarke, William Wollaston, and Richard Price. The rationalists, it’s claimed, believe that reason is the basis of morality—where this means that moral reality is grasped by (and perhaps grounded in) reason. On the other hand, are the sentimentalist positions championed by philosophers such as the Third Earl of Shaftesbury, Francis Hutcheson, and David Hume. The sentimentalists, it’s said, hold that affect is the basis of morality. According to the standard classification, the sentimentalists believe that morality has relatively little to do with reason, as it is both discerned by and grounded in sentiment.

Thomas Reid’s (1710–1796) moral philosophy doesn’t neatly fit into this classificatory scheme. To be sure, some characterize Reid as a rationalist working within the tradition of Clarke and Price (MacIntyre 1966 and Rawls 2000, Introduction). One can see why. Reid affirms core rationalist claims, such as that there is a body of necessary moral principles that are self-evident to the ordinary person. But there are important elements of Reid’s thought that don’t fit the rationalist paradigm. For example, Reid defends the view that all normal, mature human beings are endowed with a moral sense. Like philosophers such as Hutcheson and Hume, Reid claims that the moral sense yields sentiments of various sorts that themselves occasion “our first moral conceptions,” such as the apprehension that an act is approbation-worthy (EAP V.ii: 279). According to one way of understanding sentimentalism, which states that our moral concepts are formed by affective responses to the world, this would make Reid’s position a version of the view (D’Arms 2005). In this respect, Reid’s position resembles not Clarke’s and Price’s but Hutcheson’s and Hume’s views.

Reid’s moral philosophy, then, resists ready categorization. It is neither a version of rationalism nor sentimentalism, but an attempt to incorporate features from both these traditions, as well as those from the Protestant natural law and Stoic traditions (Heydt 2018). This isn’t to suggest that his view is without analogues. Anyone familiar with contemporary moral philosophy couldn’t fail to miss the resemblance that Reid’s position bears to the position defended some one hundred and fifty years later by W. D. Ross (Ross 1930/2002). Although Ross never mentions Reid as an influence, both thinkers operate within a broadly non-naturalist framework according to which the sciences offer us limited insight into the nature of moral reality. In so doing, they both stood against powerful trends in their day to “naturalize” ethics. Moreover, both reject monistic accounts of the moral domain, such as those defended by Kantians and consequentialists, according to which there is one master ethical principle from which all others are derived. Finally, both are intuitionists who hold that agents can “perceive” the truth of moral first principles and, in some cases, what to do in a given situation.

In light of this, we might describe Reid’s position as a proto-Rossian version of ethical intuitionism. While such a description may be tempting, it would probably be misleading. For the parallels between Reid and Ross extend only so far. The most important difference between them is this: Ross frames his project in light of Moore’s Open Question Argument and Mill’s utilitarianism—two developments about which Reid knew nothing. Reid, by contrast, articulated his version of ethical intuitionism within the context of a particular account of human agency, whose core commitment is that human agents are endowed with “active power,” the exercise of which causes action. Otherwise put, Reid embraces an agency-centered approach to ethical theorizing, according to which agency intersects with the subject matter of ethics in a sufficiently wide range of important ways that we cannot satisfactorily engage in ethical theorizing without committing ourselves to, and ultimately developing, particular understandings of agency. This approach leads Reid to develop his view in a way that sharply diverges from Moore, Ross, and others in the rational intuitionist tradition. Rather than start his theorizing by scrutinizing the character of ethical concepts or the objectivity of morality, Reid begins by asking what it is to be an agent, what sorts of considerations can move agents to act, and whether any are distinctive of practically rational agency. Accordingly, Reid dedicates nearly half of Essays on the Active Powers of Man to providing a detailed taxonomy of motives for acting, a strategy that no other theorist in the rational intuitionist tradition pursues (Cuneo 2020).

This entry presents both the motivations for and fundamental contours of Reid’s agency-centered view. Before diving into the details of Reid’s position, it may be worth saying a word about Reid’s influence on contemporary ethics. If one were to gauge this influence by the number of books or articles written in the last one hundred years about Reid’s ethics, one would have to conclude that his influence is negligible. Little has been written about Reid’s moral philosophy. Indeed, Reid is not even included in what is perhaps the standard anthology on the British Moralists, the two-volume work edited by Selby-Bigge of the same title (Selby-Bigge 1965). Moreover, one would also have to conclude that Reid’s influence on moral philosophers who receive a great deal of attention, such as Moore, is marginal. For example, in the flurry of work produced in 2003 on the centenary of the publication of Moore’s Principia Ethica, no one mentions Reid as an influence on Moore’s ethical views.

The reality of the matter is that Reid has exercised considerable influence on contemporary moral philosophy, albeit indirectly. This influence runs primarily through Henry Sidgwick, who knew Reid’s work well (Sidgwick 2000, Ch. 16). Sidgwick, it seems, exposed his student, G. E. Moore, to Reid’s views (Beanblossom 1983). Reid’s broadly commonsense methodology and some of his positive views were subsequently embraced by Moore. For example, both thinkers were interested in whether fundamental moral properties are definable. Reid claims they are not; fundamental moral properties are, in Reid’s estimation, simple, indefinable, and sui generis; cf. EAP III.iii.v). Famously, Moore said the same, although for somewhat different reasons. One might view this history as one in which Moore finally put metaethics on the right track or, alternatively, pushed it off the rails. Whatever one’s opinion on this issue, Reid seems to have had a role in its direction.

• 1. The System of Necessity
  • 1.1 Reid’s alternative
  • 1.2 Reid’s moral non-naturalism
• 2. The Rational Principles of Action
  • 2.1 Reid’s defense of The Hierarchy Thesis
• 3. Moral Principles
  • 3.1 The objectivity of moral principles
• 4. The Moral Sense
  • 4.1 Reid’s view compared with Hutcheson’s
  • 4.2 Reid’s defense of the reliability of the moral sense
• 5. Conclusion
• Bibliography
  • Primary Literature
  • Secondary Literature
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. The System of Necessity

Given the synthetic character of Reid’s thought, it is natural to ask how best to enter into it. A promising avenue involves noting a pattern present in Reid’s work. In his work in epistemology and philosophy of mind, found primarily in An Inquiry into the Human Mind (I) and Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man (EIP), Reid frames his project as a response to a general position that he calls the “Way of Ideas.” This position, which Reid says unites philosophers as diverse as Aristotle, Locke, Berkeley, and Hume, holds that we are never acquainted with the external world but only with “images” or sense data in the mind. What Reid says positively about our perception of the external world is couched as a response to this view (which he acknowledges he once accepted). Reid’s primary work in ethics, Essays on the Active Powers of Man (EAP), is also framed as a response to a general position, which he claims is adopted by philosophers as diverse as Spinoza, Leibniz, and Hume. This position Reid dubs the “System of Necessity.” In order to better understand Reid’s own positive views about the nature of agency and the moral domain, it will be helpful to have the rudiments of the System of Necessity before us.

Suppose you have fallen asleep in your bed after a long day of work. You briefly wake during the night, noting that someone in your household has left the kitchen lights on. You don’t want to get out of bed at this hour. Still, after pondering the issue for a moment, you know that this is the thing to do. So, you drag yourself out of bed and turn the lights off.

How should we describe your behavior? According to advocates of the System of Necessity, there is a sense in which the performance of this action is up to you. No one forced you to rise from your bed. There is also a sense in which you did it because you believed you should. It is this belief, coupled with a desire—perhaps to do what is right or prudent—that moved you to leave the warmth of your blankets. Finally, there is an explanation of your action that is perfectly law-like. Because your desire to do what is right or prudent was stronger than your desire to stay put, it won out. Under the supposition that stronger motivations win, there is a perfectly general, law-like explanation of why you acted as you did.

Put more abstractly, proponents of the System of Necessity affirm these three claims:

(1) Every human action has a sufficient cause.

(2) Provided normal background conditions obtain, the sufficient cause of a human action is its motive, which is a mental state of an agent.

(3) Every human action is subsumable under a law, which specifies that for any agent S, set of motives M, and action A at t, necessarily, if S performs A, then there is some member of M that is S’s strongest motive, which causes S to perform A at t.

Viewed from one angle, these claims appear not to fit tightly together. One could accept any one and reject the others. Viewed from another angle, however, they express a unified picture of human action, one according to which human action is a natural phenomenon that is subsumable under laws in much the same way that other ordinary natural events are. If one is attracted to this broadly naturalistic position, as Reid claims figures such as Spinoza, Hume, Priestley, and Kames were, then these claims form a natural package (Cuneo 2011).

Reid believed this package of claims to yield a deeply distorted picture of human action. That is because he couldn’t see how it could account for genuinely autonomous human agency in at least two senses of this multivalent term. In the first place, autonomous actions are ones that can be properly ascribed to an agent. But if the System of Necessity were true, Reid claimed, there is no proper sense in which actions that appear to be performed by an agent could justly be attributed to that agent—the human agent being simply a theater in which various drives and impulses vie for dominance. One could, if the System of Necessity were correct, attribute actions to mental states such as desires. This might adequately describe the behavior of animals and addicts, Reid claims. But it wouldn’t adequately describe purposeful human action. For human action, in Reid’s view, must be attributable to the person as a whole, not some force working in or on her (Korsgaard 2009, xii).

Secondly, autonomous agency is such that an agent can exercise a certain type of control over the various impulses that present themselves when deliberating. Return to the case in which you wake during the night, noting that someone has left kitchen lights on. You want not to get out of bed at this hour. Must you capitulate to your strongest desire? Not if you are autonomous. For genuinely autonomous agents, according to Reid, are reflective. Any desire is such that an autonomous agent can direct his attention not only to its object, but also to the desire itself, asking: Should I act on it? That is, any such agent can ask these two questions: First, would acting on this desire contribute to my genuine well-being? And, second, is there a sufficient moral reason or obligation for acting on or ignoring it? These two questions advert to what Reid calls the rational principles of action (EAP III.iii.i). The first principle Reid calls the principle with “regard to our good on the whole,” the second the “principle of duty.” The fact that you needn’t capitulate to your desire to stay in bed but can step back and critically assess it with reference to these two rational principles of action, in Reid’s estimation, is what separates normal, mature human beings from the rest of the natural order.

The point was important enough to Reid that he highlights it in the Introduction to the Active Powers and elsewhere:

The brutes are stimulated to various actions by their instincts, by their appetites, by their passions: but they seem to be necessarily determined by the strongest impulse, without any capacity of self-government…. They may be trained up by discipline, but cannot be governed by law. There is no evidence that they have the conception of a law, or of its obligation.

Man is capable of acting from motives of a higher nature. He perceives a dignity and worth in one course of conduct, a demerit and turpitude in another, which brutes have not the capacity to discern….

[Men] judge what ends are most worthy to be pursued, how far every appetite and passion may be indulged, and when it ought to be resisted…. In them [the brutes] we may observe one passion combating another, and the strongest prevailing; but we perceive no calm principle in their constitution that is superior to every passion, and able to give law to it. (EAP, 2 and II.ii: 57)

When Reid talks about our capacity to be governed by law, he has in mind our capacity to regulate our behavior by assessing it in terms of the two rational principles of action.

Reid, in effect, champions the following two claims. First, contra the Aristotelian tradition, Reid rejects the idea that agents ultimately do (or rationally should) act on the basis of what secures their own eudaimonia. Instead, Reid accepts a version of the “doctrine of dual affections,” a view that traces back to Anselm and Scotus, according to which rational agents deliberate in light of two primary principles, namely, their own well-being and what morality calls for. Second, Reid embraces what we might call a regulation account of autonomy. We are autonomous, rational agents, in Reid’s estimation, in virtue of the fact that we can regulate or govern our behavior by stepping back from our various impulses, desires, instincts, and assess prospective actions in light of these two rational principles of action. It is this dimension of human action, according to Reid, that is missing altogether from the description of agency offered by advocates of the System of Necessity.

1.1 Reid’s alternative

In Reid’s judgment, the System of Necessity fails to offer a satisfactory account of human agency. Reid’s alternative endorses the following three claims:

(1′) Every human action has a cause, which in the case of free human action is not a motive, but the agent herself.

(2′) Motives are not mental states but considerations in light of which and for which agents act.

(3′) Human action is nomic only to this extent: If an agent S fails to exercise autonomy when deliberating (and is not in a state of indifference), then S’s strongest desire to act in a certain way will prevail. If S exercises autonomy when deliberating, however, then S will act on the motive that, from S’s own perspective, seems most rationally appropriate.

The first claim, (1′), expresses Reid’s commitment to an agent causal account of human action, in which agents themselves cause action. It is a live question whether Reid’s invocation of the agent when explaining action is a version of what has subsequently been called “agent causation” (Cuneo and Harp 2019; cf. van Cleve 2015, Chs. 14–15). However that may be, Reid presents various arguments for this view in the Active Powers. Interestingly, a central consideration furnished in its favor appeals not to common sense but to what natural science appears to tell us. Reid, like most of his contemporaries, was a staunch Newtonian. In Reid’s judgment, Newtonian science is committed to the claim “that matter is a substance altogether inert, and merely passive; that gravitation, and the other attractive or repulsive powers … are not inherent in its nature, but impressed upon it by some external cause” (EAP I.vi: 34). Under this view, matter cannot cause anything. Given the assumptions that there is genuine causality in the world and that agents are causes, it follows that agents (who are not material things) are the only causes. In other words, Reid takes Newtonian science to support a version of occasionalism according to which the only genuine causes in the world are agents. When it comes to the natural world described by the natural sciences, in which electrons bounce against one another and sunlight causes photosynthesis, the agent is God (or agents under God’s direction). When it comes to the world of human affairs, in which bridges are built and satellites launched, the agents are human beings.

The second statement above, (2′), expresses Reid’s commitment to a broadly teleological account of human agency, according to which autonomous human action is explained by not the impulses that present themselves to agents when deliberating but the ends in light of and for which they act. In his defense of this view, Reid argues that, contrary to the adherents of the System of Necessity, motives are not mental states that cause us to act, for motives are not the right sort of thing to be causes: they are not agents. In some places, Reid says that motives (as he thinks of them) have no “real existence” (EAP IV.iv: 214).

These claims might take us aback: motives are not causes and have no real existence? How could that be? When evaluating these claims, three things should be kept in mind. First, recall that Reid is working with an understanding of causality according to which only agents are causes—an understanding he thinks fits best with a Newtonian understanding of the world. Second, in saying that motives don’t exist, Reid is claiming that they lack “real” existence by which he seems to mean that they are abstracta and, so, not part of the spatio-temporal manifold (cf. van Cleve 2015, Ch. 10 and Cuneo 2016). Third, Reid’s considered view about motives is actually more complicated than (2′) would have us believe (Kroeker 2018a). (2′) expresses the view that Reid defends in Essay IV of the Active Powers, “Of the Liberty of Moral Agents.” But anyone who has read Essay III, “Of the Principles of Action,” knows that Reid claims that motives or “principles of action” divide into three kinds: mechanical, animal, and rational. Mechanical principles of action are what we would call instincts, such as the unreflective impulse to protect oneself from threats. Animal principles of action are a more varied lot. Under this category, Reid places the so-called benevolent and malevolent affections. The former include affection between kin, gratitude to benefactors, pity and compassion, friendship, and public spirit, (EAP III.iii.iv), while the latter include the desire to dominate others and resentment (Kroeker 2014).

All this complicates Reid’s picture. Reid seems to want to allow that motives come in two varieties. On the one hand, Reid says that rational motives function as “advice” or “exhortation” which do not push but pull us to action. On the other, he describes the mechanical and animal motives as “impulses,” which do not pull but push us to action (EAP II.ii and IV.iv). Perhaps the best conclusion to draw is that Reid does not have a unified account of motives. A range of the rational motives are best described as being either those ends for which we act or principles in light of which we evaluate those ends for which we act. Other motives—the mechanical and a range of the animal ones—do not play these roles but are what push or impel us to action.

Are these latter motives best described as having a causal influence on behavior? They might be so described according to a more relaxed understanding of causality than Reid officially works with. For suppose we agree that there are processes instigated by the exercise of active power, such as the process that is instigated by an agent’s willing to raise her arm. In Reid’s estimation, this process includes: the exercise of an active power, the agent’s willing to raise her arm, the activity of nerves and muscles and, finally, the raising of her arm. If we allow ourselves to talk of elements of this process as being causes in a “lax and popular sense,” then perhaps Reid would agree that some motives—namely, the mechanical and some animal ones—are aptly called causes. Of course Reid would have to say that in some cases the motives that “cause” agents to act are not part of a causal process that they instigate. Not every desire or mental state agents have is the causal consequence of their having exercised active power. Reid would have to say, then, that those mental states and events that are not simply the causal consequence of the exercise of active power are parts of processes instigated by some other agent cause, such as God. While this may seem odd, it seems to be the broader, occasionalist picture within which Reid operated. All causal processes in nature (which are not due to us) are instigated by the exercise of God’s active power (or that of subsidiary agents). A typical case of human action involves the coincidence of the exercise of our active power with God’s (EAP I.vi).

Let’s now turn to the third statement above, namely, (3′). This claim expresses Reid’s two-fold conviction that (i) free human action is not in any interesting sense nomic, and (ii) that we can assess motives along two dimensions: according to their psychological strength and according to their rational authority.

That free human action is not nomic is simply an implication of Reid’s conviction that human agents are endowed with libertarian free will, the exercise of which does not fall under any natural law described by Newtonian science. That our motives can be assessed along two dimensions, by contrast, is an implication of Reid’s regulation account of autonomy.

To see how Reid is thinking about the strength of motives, consider a case in which you are moved to action by some animal principle of action. Imagine, for example, you are incited to reprimand someone in your family because they’ve (once again!) acted irresponsibly by leaving kitchen lights on during the night. One way to assess the action of reprimanding would be to ask whether it conforms to the rational principles of action. While repeated careless behavior is annoying, it is often not morally bad. And it isn’t in this case; so there is no strong moral reason to reprimand whoever left the lights on. Moreover, were you to reprimand the culprit, you’d risk alienating yourself from those with whom you live; that does not contribute to your good on the whole. Your circumstances call for a different response than reprimanding, such as installing timers on the kitchen lights so that they automatically shut off. Accordingly, the impulse to reprimand lacks rational backing or authority.

Now consider the same motive not with respect to its rational authority but with regard to its psychological strength. Is this motive the strongest of your motives? Reid maintains that the question is difficult to answer. A complaint Reid raises about the System of Necessity is that it sheds no light on the matter. Although advocates of the System of Necessity claim that human actions can be subsumed under natural laws, the laws to which they appeal in order to assess the strength of motives are either false or trivial. For recall that, according to the System of Necessity

(3) Every human action is subsumable under a law, which specifies that for any agent S, set of motives M, and action A at t, necessarily, if S performs A, then there is some member of M that is S’s strongest motive, which causes S to perform A at t.

Reid finds this claim totally unpersuasive:

It is a question of fact, whether the influence of motives be fixed by laws of nature, so that they shall always have the same effect in the same circumstance. Upon this, indeed, the question about liberty and necessity hangs. But I have never seen any proof that there are such laws of nature, far less any proof that the strongest motive always prevails. However much our late fatalists have boasted of this principle as of a law of nature, without telling us what they mean by the strongest motive, I am persuaded that, whenever they shall be pleased to give us any measure of the strength of motives distinct from their prevalence, it will appear, from experience, that the strongest motive does not always prevail. If no other test or measure of the strength of motives can be found but their prevailing, then this boasted principle will be only an identical proposition, and signify only that the strongest motive is the strongest motive … which proves nothing. (C, 176–77)

According to Reid, (3), then, is either false or trivial (Yaffe 2004, Ch. 6).

1.2 Reid’s moral non-naturalism

Reid’s worldview was Newtonian. While he was convinced that the natural sciences should conform to Newtonian methods, Reid held that these methods have their limitations. In a passage from an unpublished review composed toward the end of his life, Reid writes:

There are many important branches of human knowledge, to which Sir Isaac Newton’s rules of Philosophizing have no relation, and to which they can with no propriety be applied. Such are Morals, Jurisprudence, Natural Theology, and the abstract Sciences of Mathematicks and Metaphysicks; because in none of those Sciences do we investigate the physical laws of Nature. There is therefore no reason to regret that these branches of knowledge have been pursued without regard to them. (AC, 186)

In this passage, Reid writes that Newton’s rules pertain only to the physical laws of nature and what is subsumable under them. But the rational principles of action are not themselves the physical laws of nature. They do not concern how the universe in fact operates. Rather, they concern how agents endowed with active power ought to conduct their behavior. Nor are these principles subsumable under Newton’s laws (EAP IV.ix: 251). They are, in Reid’s view, not part of the spatio-temporal manifold. It follows that Newton’s methods should not guide our theorizing about the rational principles of action. Since moral principles are among the rational principles of action, it follows that they are not subsumable under Newton’s laws. Given the additional assumption that natural science must conform to Newton’s rules, Reid concludes that morality is not the subject matter of natural science. That this is so, Reid continues, is “no reason to regret.” It is a matter of simply acknowledging the implications of Newton’s system—implications, Reid maintains, that philosophers such as Hume and Priestley, who also took themselves to be followers of Newton, had failed to appreciate.

Reid never used the term “non-naturalism” to describe his view (the label, after all, was introduced roughly one hundred and fifty years after the publication of the Active Powers). Still, it is fair to characterize Reid’s view as nonnaturalist. Under the standard account of moral naturalism, moral facts are natural insofar as they’re fitted to be the subject matter of the natural sciences (Wiggins 1993). Reid maintains that Newtonian methods exhaust the limits of natural science. Newtonian science, however, does not investigate the rational principles for which and in light of which agents act; it is not suited to do so, as these principles are neither identical with nor fall under Newtonian laws. But moral principles, Reid says, are among the ends or rational principles for which and in light of which agents act. It follows that, in Reid’s view, moral principles are not the proper object of scientific inquiry. In this sense, the moral domain is autonomous (Cuneo and Harp 2017).

2. The Rational Principles of Action

Philosophers such as Hume and Priestly were eager to apply Newton’s methods to the moral domain. Reid, in contrast, viewed attempts to use Newtonian methods to understand the moral domain as mistaken—not, once again, because he viewed Newtonian science as suspect, but because proper understanding of these methods reveals them to have no application to the moral domain. That said, there is a sense in which Reid believes that human action is law governed. Agents can regulate their behavior by reference to the two rational principles of action: their good on the whole and duty. (It bears emphasizing that while Reid speaks of the second rational principle as concerning duty, he has something broader in mind. The principle of duty also concerns a variety of moral considerations, especially virtue.) Reid holds that these principles stand in a certain kind of relation to one another.

Rational principles of action have (at least) two related functions. First, they are motives in the sense that they specify considerations in light of which agents may act, which can guide their behavior. Second, they are ends in the sense that they specify considerations that agents may endeavor to realize in acting. To illustrate, in acting some way, you may aim to bring about your children’s flourishing. And that end may also be that in light of which you act: you take it to favor acting in that way, and it guides your acting. Yet these two functions needn’t be correlated. You may block from view the end for which you are acting because doing so will make you less likely to achieve it. Some consequentialists believe, for example, that while the end of morally required action is maximizing value, acting in light of this end often makes it less likely that you’ll achieve it.

The ends of action can be deliberatively ranked, as when an agent acts to realize end E in order to bring about an end F. Accordingly, some ends may enjoy deliberative priority over others. Let’s say that end E has deliberative priority over end F for an agent S if and only if S acts so as to realize E but not simply because, and not simply in light of the fact that, in realizing E, S would thereby realize F. For example, imagine that you give a gift in order to express your affection for a loved one. The end has deliberative priority over the end of taking pleasure in your action just in case you act in order to express affection but not simply because, and not simply in light of the fact, that doing so makes you feel good. Indeed, you would give the gift in order to express affection even if you realized that it would leave you feeling pained. Let’s add, finally, that some ends may deserve deliberative priority in the sense that the balance of reasons favors granting them such priority in deliberation.

2.1 Reid’s defense of The Hierarchy Thesis

We can now identify a centerpiece of Reid’s discussion of rational motivation, namely:

The Hierarchy Thesis: In any case in which an agent must decide what to do, considerations of what is morally called for deserve deliberative priority. Specifically, what is morally called for deserves deliberative priority over what an agent takes to be his good on the whole.

Eudaimonist positions, such as those defended in the broadly Aristotelian tradition, reject The Hierarchy Thesis. They maintain that when an agent deliberates about what to do, he assumes, or ought to assume, that considerations concerning his own well-being or eudaimonia have deliberative priority. Every act that an agent performs, say eudaimonists, either is or should be taken ultimately for the sake of his own happiness. Accordingly, if eudaimonism is true, an agent operates, or ought to operate, with the following principle of action selection: perform only those actions that, to the best of one’s knowledge, positively contribute to one’s own well-being or eudaimonia. When asked: “Why did you do that?” an agent’s ultimate justification will, or ought to, appeal to the way in which acting in that fashion contributes to his own well-being.

Reid rejects eudaimonism thus understood. It is safe to assume that Reid took Butler’s attack on what we might call descriptive eudaimonism to be decisive: there is no plausibility to the idea that agents necessarily give deliberative priority to their own happiness, for they can knowingly act in self-destructive ways (cf. EAP III.ii.i: 95). But Reid realized that Butler’s attack left prescriptive eudaimonism, or the view that practically rational agents grant their own well-being deliberative priority, relatively untouched. According to this view, whatever may be the case about how agents actually act, they ought to view their own well-being as having such priority.

Like Butler, Reid did not wish to recommend a picture of agency according to which agents should disregard or ignore their own well-being. “To serve God and be useful to mankind, without any concern about one’s own good and happiness,” Reid writes, is “beyond the pitch of human nature” (EAP III.iii.iv: 166). Indeed, Reid holds that, when properly understood, a concern for one’s good on the whole naturally leads to the acquisition of the moral virtues, such as justice and benevolence (EAP III.iii.iii: 163–4; cf. EAP V.i). Still, Reid insists that our good on the whole ought not to be the “only regulating principle of human conduct” (EAP III.iii.iv: 164). This is due to four main reasons (Cuneo 2010).

First, Reid claims that “the greater part of mankind can never attain such extensive views of human life, and so correct a judgment of good and ill, as the right application of this principle requires” (EAP III.iii.iv: 164). Reid’s point here is that a principle of action should be action-guiding. It should be the sort of thing that, in a wide range of cases, an agent could consult when determining what to do and thereby come to understand what she ought to do. The principles of morality are action-guiding. “Every man of common understanding,” says Reid, is such that he is capable of knowing his duty (EAP V.i: 269). But gaining a conception of one’s good on the whole, let alone an accurate one, and an understanding of what genuinely contributes to it, is something that is very difficult to do. It requires that one “observe the connections of things, and the consequences of our actions,” thereby “taking an extended view of our existence, past, present, and future” (EAP III.iii.i: 155). Many ordinary persons will have neither the time nor the ability to do this, let alone actually gain an accurate notion of that in which their good on the whole consists. If this is right, then an agent’s good on the whole is not sufficiently action-guiding to be the most general and fundamental principle of action and, hence, deserve deliberative priority, as eudaimonists claim.

Second, since one’s good on the whole is concerned not only with present satisfaction, but also with the enjoyment of future goods, it proves not to be as motivationally charged as one might hope. We would like to have a clearer and more efficacious guide to conduct. Reid puts the point thus:

Men stand in need of a sharper monitor to their duty than a dubious view of distant good. There is reason to believe, that a present sense of duty has, in many cases a stronger influence than the apprehension of distant good would have of itself. And it cannot be doubted, that a sense of guilt and demerit is a more pungent reprover than the bare apprehension of having mistaken our true interest. (EAP III.iii.iv: 165)

Duty is, then, according to Reid, in many cases, a better guide to action than interest. Moreover, it is often motivationally more powerful than an appeal to self-interest, as it connects more intimately with powerful motivating considerations such as one’s own guilt.

The third point Reid makes is that “a steady pursuit of our own good may, in an enlightened mind, produce a kind of virtue which is entitled to some degree of approbation, yet it can never produce the noblest kind of virtue, which claims our highest love and esteem” (EAP III.iii.iv: 165). So, Reid’s view is not that a concern for one’s own well-being is crass egoism or self-centeredness. To the contrary, there is something admirable about it; to pursue one’s own well-being properly requires virtue. For example, if concern for oneself helps to discount temptations to a life of ease, leisure, or frivolity, then it is much to be admired (cf. EAP III.iii.iv: 166, but also EAP V.vi: 272). That said, to be genuinely dedicated to the moral life, one cannot grant deliberative priority to one’s good on the whole. For our esteem, Reid writes, “is due only to the man whose soul is not contracted within itself, but embraces a more extensive object: who loves virtue, not for her dowry only, but for her own sake: whose benevolence is not selfish, but generous and disinterested” (EAP III.iii.iv: 165). For Reid, then, virtue requires caring not only about one’s own well-being, but also about being virtuous. And being virtuous requires being committed to the idea that the moral life is, in and for itself, worth living. It is not to be made subordinate to considerations about one’s well-being.

Reid’s fourth point echoes one of Butler’s most famous observations regarding the pursuit of happiness: if one primarily aims to secure one’s own happiness, one often increases the risk of not obtaining it. This is not only because directly aiming for one’s own happiness can “fill the mind with fear, and care, and anxiety” (EAP III.iii.iv: 166–7). It is also because a “concern for our own good is not a principle that, of itself, gives any enjoyment” (EAP III.iii.iv: 167). What does give enjoyment, however, are those particular activities and objects to which our affections are directed, such as friendship and the common good, as well as the satisfaction of having acted virtuously. Indeed, Reid writes that the awareness of excellent moral character “would most justly claim the preference to all other enjoyments the human mind is capable of, on account of its dignity, the intenseness of the happiness it affords, its stability and duration, its being in our power, and its being proof against all accidents of time and fortune” (EAP III.iii.vii: 183). To achieve one’s good on the whole, then, one must (at least part of the time) be focused on and motivated by considerations that are not identical with it.

When combined, these points support the idea that moral considerations deserve deliberative priority. Yet a substantial challenge faces Reid’s position. Consider a case in which considerations of well-being conflict with duty, such as when moral duty requires that one stand up for the innocent at the cost of one’s life and those of one’s family. It seems Reid is committed to the claim that, in a case such as this, one is required to surrender one’s life. Reid indicates that this is correct, as any such conflict is “imaginary.” So long as “the world is under a wise and benevolent administration, it is impossible, that any man should … be a loser by doing his duty” (EAP III.iii.viii: 194). In short, Reid’s theism lies in the background of The Hierarchy Thesis. His thinking seems to be (at least) this: to be morally virtuous is to be wholeheartedly devoted to the pursuit of virtue. Being devoted to virtue makes sense only if one also holds that God (the benevolent administrator) will guarantee that pursuing virtue never conflicts with one’s good on the whole in the long run (cf. Kroeker 2018b).

3. Moral Principles

According to the picture sketched thus far, Reid’s account of autonomous action has it that human beings can act from a great variety of principles, including the so-called mechanical and animal principles. What makes humans distinctive is their ability to gain critical distance from these incentives and regulate their conduct by appeal to the two rational principles of action, asking whether a given course of action truly contributes to their good on the whole or is morally called for. Finally, the principle of duty deserves deliberative priority. While I’ve not yet emphasized the point, the similarities between Reid’s and Kant’s thought in these respects are unmistakable (though we have no evidence that Reid was aware of Kant’s work). According to both Reid and Kant, humans are practically rational beings not primarily because they can engage in means-end practical reasoning. Rather, they are practically rational because they can assess the various impulses to act by appeal to a “certain general principle” or law—this law consisting, in Reid’s view, in the rational principles of action. Indeed, if J. B. Schneewind is correct, Reid and Kant were unique among the moderns inasmuch as they conceived of morality primarily in terms of rational self-governance (Schneewind 1998).

Still, there is at least this important difference between the two figures: Kant is an ethical monist, holding there is one master principle of morality—the categorical imperative—which grounds all particular moral duties and can guide decision making. Reid rejects ethical monism, maintaining that there is no such master principle, but only a variety of moral principles that are irreducible to one another, self-evident, and fitted to guide ethical thinking. The locution “the principle of duty,” in Reid’s mouth, is probably best understood to be a shorthand way of referring to one or another of these principles.

In his chapter “Of the first principles of morals,” Reid presents the first principles of morals “without pretending to a complete enumeration” (EAP V.i: 270). The eleven principles Reid presents look like a hodgepodge. Some are metaethical principles that specify certain properties of moral principles, such as that they apply only to free actions, while others are normative principles that one might consult when deliberating. Among the normative principles Reid presents are these:

We ought to prefer a greater good, though more distant, to a less; and a less evil to the greater.

Every man ought to consider himself as member of the common society of mankind, and of the subordinate societies to which he belongs, such as family, friends, neighborhood, and country, and do as much good as he can, as little hurt to the societies of which he is a part.

In every case, we ought to act that part toward another, which we would judge to be right in him to act toward us, if we were in his circumstance and he in ours. (EAP V.i)

Principles such as these, Reid says, form a system of morality in only a weak sense. They are a system only insofar as they can be organized in such a way that facilitates “apprehension and memory.” In this respect, a system of morals, Reid continues, is not like a system of geometry “where the subsequent parts derive their evidence from the preceding” but “resembles more a system of botany … where the subsequent parts depend not for their evidence upon the preceding” (EAP V.ii: 281). So, while Reid admits that the last principle stated above is the “most comprehensive,” he does not claim that it is fundamental in the sense that it grounds other moral principles.

Perhaps the most striking feature of the first principles of morals is that most are first principles of morals; they are about first-order moral principles. Elsewhere in the Active Powers, Reid indicates what these other first-order moral principles, such as the rules of justice, might be. They include norms such as

We each have an obligation not to wound, maim, or kill others.

We each have an obligation not to confine others (over whom we lack authority) against their will.

We each have an obligation not to destroy the reputation of others.

We each have an obligation to keep our promises and other commitments to others. (cf. EAP V.v: 312–13)

Suppose we distinguish first-order moral principles, such as those just listed, from the first principles of morals, some of which are enumerated above. When we do, we can better see the structure of Reid’s thinking about moral obligation. Generally speaking, the latter are higher-order moral principles that concern the former, enjoining agents to bear various sorts of relations to them, such as keeping them before the mind’s eye.

But now puzzles loom. For when Reid offers his reasons for believing there are first principles of morals, he voices foundationalist doctrines similar to those he presents when stating the principles of common sense in the Intellectual Powers. Regarding morality, Reid writes:

Morals, like all other sciences, must have first principles, on which all moral reasoning is grounded.

In every branch of knowledge where disputes have been raised, it is useful to distinguish the first principles from the superstructure. They are the foundation on which the whole fabric of the science leans; and whatever is not supported by this foundation can have no stability. (EAP V.i: 270; cf. EAP III.iii: 177)

Needless to say, what Reid says here doesn’t fit comfortably with his claim that morality is not a system. That aside, passages such as this pose Reid’s interpreters with a choice.

On the one hand, these passages may endeavor to describe the actual noetic structures of ordinary (rational) agents, committing Reid to the following pair of claims:

The first principles of morals are the epistemic bases of all our particular moral judgments;

and

The first principles of morals serve as epistemic bases by being that from which particular moral judgments are inferred or on which they’re evidentially based.

However, these claims sit very uneasily with what Reid says elsewhere, which is that particular moral judgments are ordinarily immediate or non-inferential (EIP VII.ii: 553; EAP V. ii: 280; EIP VI.vi: 503–4; but cf. Folescu 2018).

On the other hand, the foundationalist passages may aim to describe the noetic structures of not ordinary (rational) agents, but rather those of idealized ones (Cuneo 2025). The agents are idealized to the extent that their moral reasoning mirrors the justificatory structure of a satisfactory moral theory within which the first principles of morals are foundational. This interpretation would help to insulate Reid’s view from the worry voiced just above. But it raises a distinct concern, which is that Reid has identified the wrong sorts of principles to belong to the structure of well-formed moral belief or a moral theory. After all, if the foregoing is correct, most of the first principles of morals concern or are about first-order moral principles, such as the rules of justice stated above. But if they bear this relation to the first-order moral principles, then the first principles of morals cannot be the epistemic bases of first-order moral principles, as Reid’s foundationalist claims appear to mandate.

There may be no way to reconcile the different things Reid says about the first principles of morals. But there is an intriguing interpretation that picks up on Reid’s suggestion that assenting to a range of substantive moral principles is constitutive of competent moral thinking; failure to do so is not simply to make a moral mistake in which one accepts false substantive moral views but rather marks a failure to be a moral agent altogether (EAP III.iii. vi: 177–8; EIP VII.ii: 551–2). If this reading were correct, Reid’s view would represent an interesting type of position often overlooked in contemporary discussions in metaethics, as his view would be a version of realist constitutivism. Under this reading, if we want a guiding metaphor for thinking about the role played by the first principles of morals, they are not so much the basis for particular moral judgments so much as what help set the boundaries of moral thought (Cuneo 2014).

3.1 The objectivity of moral first principles

Reid believes moral principles are objective in a fairly strong sense. Or to put things more guardedly, if we interpret Reid’s claims that motives do not exist to mean only that they do not exist in the spatio-temporal manifold, then Reid thinks they are objective in a fairly robust sense (cf. David 1986; Nichols 2002; Yaffe 2004; van Cleve 2015; Folescu 2016).

In the first place, Reid believes that first-order moral principles cannot be the product of convention. His argument in this case is directed against Hume. In Reid’s view, Hume defends a conventionalist account of justice, which is predicated on a genealogical account of the emergence of the norms of justice. The account has two-parts. The first is that implementing rules for such things as the distribution of property is justified by the fact that conformance to them has considerable utility. It allows us to avoid serious evils, such as societal chaos, and enjoy goods, such as harmonious societal conditions. These goods and evils, in turn, are to be understood along hedonist lines, as either being hedonic states themselves or being such as to elicit them in suitable observers. The second thesis is that conformance to these rules counts as a virtue because it elicits approbation from the “common point of view.”

Reid’s contends that this two-part thesis is false. It will not function, as Reid puts it, as a “foundation for morals” (EAP V.v: 302). Admittedly, Reid’s attempts to articulate what he finds unsatisfactory about this dimension of Hume’s views can appear less than compelling. For Reid sometimes writes as if the problem with Hume’s view is that it implausibly identifies the concept being just with being such as to produce the most utility (EAP V.v: 304). But Hume would probably be unmoved by such a charge, as his primary concern is to offer not an account of the concept being just but rather to indicate how it is that the rules of justice emerged and how agents might be motivated to conform to them. Charitably understood, however, Reid’s charge is not that Hume has offered us an inadequate account of the meaning expressed by the phrase “being just.” It is rather that Hume fails to offer us a satisfactory account of the grounds of justice. Any account of the grounds of justice, says Reid, must be such that it makes sense of why we resent those who have violated the rights of others. Hume’s position, according to Reid, does not.

Reid offers several lines of argument developing this charge. According to one, we begin by considering the various ways in which a person can be injured:

A man may be injured, 1st, in his person, by wounding, maiming, or killing him; 2ndly, in his family, by robbing him of his children, or any way injuring those he is bound to protect; 3rdly, in his liberty, by confinement; 4thly, in his reputation; 5thly, in his goods or property; and, lastly, in the violation of contracts or engagements made with him. (EAP V.v: 312)

An innocent person, Reid continues:

has a right to the safety of his person and family, a right to his liberty and reputation, a right to his goods, and to fidelity to engagements made with him. To say that he has a right to these things, has precisely the same meaning as to say, that justice requires that he should be permitted to enjoy them, or that it is unjust to violate them. For injustice is the violation of right, and justice is, to yield to every man what is his right. (EAP V.v: 313)

But if so, Reid says, it is difficult to see what role considerations of pleasure and utility could play in grounding such a right. If Reid is correct, it is not as if the slanderer wrongs his victim on account of the fact that were people to act in this way, then they would probably bring about an unfavorable distribution of pains and pleasures. For even if my slandering were to contribute to an unfavorable distribution of pleasures and pains, this would not account for why I have wronged you. Your resentment would rightly be directed at me not because I have failed to do my part to contribute to some global generic good. Rather, it would be properly directed at me because I have mistreated you by demeaning you. Nor, it should be added, have I wronged you because there is some conventional arrangement in place whose justification consists in the fact that slandering tends to bring about an unfavorable distribution of pains and pleasures. For it is not as if were there no such convention in place, there would have been no wronging. The facts that actions of certain types tend to contribute to unfavorable distributions of pleasures and pains or that society has implemented rules of certain kinds, says Reid, are not the right sort of thing to explain why agents have rights to goods of certain types (EAP V.v: 324).

In his book The Second-Person Standpoint (2006), Stephen Darwall provides a helpful conceptual framework to understand the pattern of Reid’s thought. Bring to mind the distinction between the requirements of justice and their grounds. One way to think about the relation between grounds and requirements is by invoking the first-person standpoint. According to this way of proceeding, what accounts for an agent’s being required to act in a certain way (or his having a reason to act in that way) is the fact that acting in that way contributes to her own well-being. Requirements of justice, according to this view, are justified by the fact that they bear the right sort of relationship to an agent’s own flourishing. Another way of thinking about the relationship between grounds and requirements is by invoking the third-person standpoint. According to this way of thinking, what accounts for an agent’s being required to act in a certain way is the fact that acting in that way bears the proper relation to some abstract good, such as contributing to a favorable balance of pleasures and pains. A third way to think about the relation between grounds and requirements is to invoke the second-person standpoint. This way of thinking tells us that what accounts for an agent’s being required to act in a certain way is the fact that acting in that way bears the proper relation to other agents who are bearers of worth. Specifically, according to the second-person standpoint, as bearers of worth, these agents have the authority to demand that we conform to these requirements.

In the Active Powers, Reid expends considerable energy arguing that first-personal accounts of moral requirements are mistaken; the fact that acting in a certain way would contribute to one’s own flourishing is the wrong sort of thing to ground the requirements of respect. In his discussion of justice, Reid interprets Hume’s view as one that appeals to the third-person perspective. For reasons we’ve seen, Reid thinks that abstract goods that concern the distribution of pleasures and pains are also insufficient to account for the requirements of justice. Reid’s fundamental insight—to advert to Darwall’s way of framing things—is that we must think of justice in terms of the second-person standpoint. The requirements of justice are conceptually tied to the rights that agents have against each other, which themselves legitimate attitudes such as resentment and indignation toward those who violate them. These rights, if Reid is correct, cannot be justified by appeal to the fact that conforming to them would contribute to an agent’s own flourishing or to a favorable balance of pleasures and pains (Darwall 2006, Ch. 8; Cuneo 2015).

In addition to rejecting constructivist accounts of justice, Reid rejects what we today would call response-dependent accounts of moral facts. Roughly put, response-dependent views, which Reid attributes to sentimentalists such as Hutcheson and Hume, maintain that moral reality is grounded in the sorts of affective reactions agents have to the world. It is because certain actions and events elicit certain types of affective states in us that they have properties such as being wrong or being obligatory. Drawing upon what rationalists such as Balguy and Price had argued, Reid asks us to consider fundamental moral principles, such as the claim that, in ordinary conditions, an agent ought to honor his promises. Claims such as this, Reid says, are necessarily true. But if the response-dependent view were correct, this would not be so. After all, we can imagine being constituted in such a way that we failed to disapprove of those who do not honor their promises. If the response-dependent view were correct, then in those counterfactual circumstances, honoring one’s promises would not be obligatory; failing to honor them, accordingly, would not be wrong. But that is false, for basic moral principles do not exhibit this sort of contingency. Even in those counterfactual conditions it would be wrong not to honor one’s word. If so, sentimentalists views, Reid concludes, cannot be correct (EIP VI.vi: 494–95).

4. The Moral Sense

Contemporary philosophers, we noted earlier, tend to think of modern philosophers as being either rationalists or sentimentalists about morality. Reid does not fit comfortably in either category, since his views blend together both rationalist and sentimentalist commitments. This becomes especially evident in Reid’s discussion of the moral sense. (See Davis 2006 for a discussion of how Reid’s account of the moral sense is influenced by the legal practices of his day.)

It was Francis Hutcheson who first developed the claim that we are endowed with a moral sense. While Hutcheson’s position has been variously interpreted, his considered position appears to run as follows. Rationalists tell us that our moral judgments are the output of reason. But many of our ordinary, non-moral judgments are not the output of reason. Our perceptual judgments concerning the external world, our judgments about our own pain and pleasure, and our aesthetic judgments, for example, are not the products of reason. Rather, they are the products of various “senses” which are “determinations of our minds to receive Ideas independently of our Will” (ONC, 17). Moral judgments, Hutcheson claims, are no different in this respect. They are also not the product of reason; instead, they are the outputs of a sense, in this case, the moral sense. Although Hutcheson himself describes this sense in different ways, it is probably best to think of it as a faculty that has two basic functions.

In the first place, it is that faculty by which we form moral ideas or concepts and in such a way that does not involve any sort of reasoning or calculation. Rather, the “author of our Nature” has designed us in such a way that, in a certain range of circumstances, when an agent is aware of the behavior of himself or others, this awareness evokes in him states of approbation. These states of approbation, in turn, elicit states of love and esteem for the person whose behavior of which he’s aware. States of approbation, Hutcheson indicates, thus function as signs of an agent’s benevolence, indicating its presence. Love and esteem, by contrast, do not indicate benevolence but are rather appropriate affective responses to it. Second, these affective states move us to benevolent action. The moral sense at once puts us in contact with moral reality and motivates us to act (Cuneo 2013; Kail 2007).

4.1 Reid’s view compared with Hutcheson’s

Those familiar with Reid’s writing on perception will immediately notice striking similarities between Hutcheson’s account of the moral sense and Reid’s account of external sense (Stecker 1987).

To see this, consider a case of ordinary tactile perception, such as when one perceives by touch that the table before one is hard. In such a case, how does touch enable agents to perceive the table’s hardness? According to Reid, it is via pressure sensations produced by physical contact with the table—sensations which, Reid stresses, largely go unnoticed and unnamed—which immediately produce a “conception and belief” of the table that it is hard. As such, Reid says, the best explanation of how agents perceive things such as a table’s hardness is that the “Author of our Nature” has designed humans in such a way that, when all goes well, feelings of a certain range function as signs or indicators of it. (God, Reid emphasizes, could have easily fashioned us in such a way that the perceptual process worked differently. For all we reasonably believe, God could have constructed us in such a way that signs of an entirely different sort, such as noises or smells of a certain range, indicate a table’s hardness.) Reid stresses that, according to this account of perception, pressure sensations are not ideas in the way that Locke or Hume thought of them. For pressure sensations do not function as intermediaries of which we are aware that imagistically resemble and represent the table’s hardness, and from which we infer its existence (Copenhaver 2014).

In order to explain judgments of these sorts, both Hutcheson and Reid appeal not to reason but to an indigenous sense with which we come hardwired. Both thinkers maintain that (in the ordinary case) inference plays no role in the production of such judgments—feelings being such as to immediately evoke them. Both, moreover, offer teleological explanations of perception, which appeal to the plan of the “author of our Nature.” And, finally, both champion semiotic accounts of perceptual judgment formation. According to the relevant design plans, sensations or feelings of various kinds play the role of being signs for or indicators of qualities of things in the world.

At various points, Reid himself highlights the similarities between the two senses (cf. EAP III.iii.vi: 176–7 and PE, 144). Having noted these similarities, however, Reid goes on to claim that there is also an important disanalogy between the judgments produced by external sense, on the one hand, and the moral sense, on the other: In the former case, when all goes well, feelings elicit judgments about the external world. In the latter case, the order of explanation is reversed: “In the approbation of a good action … there is feeling indeed, but there is also esteem of the agent; and both the feeling and the esteem depend upon the judgment we form of his conduct,” not vice-versa (EAP V.vii: 349; cf. Broadie 1998; Cuneo 2006; Copenhaver 2014). By stressing that states of approbation are not mere feelings but include full-blooded moral judgments, Reid takes himself to have corrected a deficiency in Hutcheson’s view. For while Hutcheson nowhere denies that the outputs of the moral sense include the acceptance of moral propositions neither does he affirm this. Rather, what Hutcheson tells us is that states of approbation are feelings of pleasure and that they yield “love” for the benevolent. But Hutcheson, Reid points out, says next to nothing about this latter state, never specifying whether it includes moral propositional content. By explicitly specifying that the outputs of the moral sense have moral propositional content—indeed, a wide range of such contents—Reid takes himself to have identified more accurately the character of its outputs.

Both Hutcheson and Reid, then, maintain that human beings come equipped with a moral sense that bears certain resemblances to external sense. But the Reidian moral sense differs in two important respects from the Hutchesonian one. First, the outputs of the Reidian moral sense include not only moral conceptions, but also full-blooded moral beliefs with moral propositional content. (Reid, incidentally, understood Hume to deny that moral judgments have moral propositional content; EAP V.vii; cf. van Cleve 2015, Ch. 16; Golub 2019.) These moral beliefs themselves concern not only general moral truths, such as moral principles, but also particular ones, such as that this particular person’s behavior merits approbation.

Second, Reid reverses the order of explanation between sentiment and moral judgment. In the paradigmatic case, moral judgments elicit moral sentiments, not vice-versa. Although Reid reverses Hutcheson’s order of explanation claim, he still thinks of a range of particular moral judgments as being cases of moral perception. His basic approach is to claim that, in moral perception, it is not sentiments that function as signs of moral properties. Rather, it is the behavior and countenance of agents that play this role. Roughly, the guiding idea is that moral properties of a certain range attach to the mental states of agents such as their beliefs, desires, and intentions. For example, the property being kind can attach to an agent’s intention to perform a certain act. These mental states and their properties manifest themselves in the behavior and countenance of agents. Ordinary mature agents are so constituted that, when all goes well, upon becoming aware of the behavior and countenance of these agents, this awareness non-inferentially evokes in them the conception and belief of those agents that they have properties such as being kind, deceitful, faithful, and so forth. In this regard, moral perception exhibits the same fundamental structure as our perception of what Reid calls visible figure, such as an object’s length and height (Kroeker 2010; Copenhaver 2014; Foster 2024, Ch. 5). In both cases, features of our environment function as signs for a given quality, these signs being such as to non-inferentially produce conception and belief. Here is how Reid himself puts the point:

A man’s wisdom is known to us only by the signs of it in his conduct; his eloquence by the signs of it in his speech. In the same manner we judge of his virtue, of his fortitude, and of all his talents and qualities of mind.

Yet it is to be observed, that we judge of men’s talents with as little doubt or hesitation as we judge of the immediate objects of sense.

… We perceive one man to be open, another cunning; one to be ignorant, another very knowing; one to be slow of understanding, another quick. Every man forms such judgments of those he converses with; and the common affairs of life depend upon such judgments. We can as little avoid them as we can avoid seeing what is before our eyes.

From this it appears, that it is no less part of the human constitution, to judge of men’s characters, and of their intellectual powers, from the signs of them in their actions and discourse, than to judge of corporeal objects by our senses. (EIP VI.vi: 503–4)

It is Reid’s view that agents can apprehend both the external world and moral reality. He also holds that the beliefs formed on the basis of these apprehensions are generally in good epistemic order. So, in the case of the perception of external objects, Reid rejects skepticism. Admittedly, Reid says, we may lack a complete explanation of how we become aware of external reality. But this, says Reid, is no reason to doubt that we can in fact apprehend it. More importantly, Reid claims, there are powerful reasons to reject skepticism about external sense. For consider our indigenous epistemic faculties such as memory, introspection, reasoning, and perception. The outputs of these faculties include judgments of various sorts—judgments about what happened, what one is feeling, what to conclude given one’s evidence, and so forth. The practice of forming these judgments is socially well-established over time. Indeed, it is so deeply entrenched that it is, for all practical purposes, inescapable; we cannot avoid forming memory judgments, introspective judgments, perceptual judgments, and so forth. Moreover, we have sophisticated methods of evaluating judgments made in these domains, including appeals to its own array of experts and criteria for reliability. Finally, many of the judgments made in these domains are not subject to systemic disagreement among competent participants. By and large, our judgments about the external world, for example, converge.

Should we trust the deliverance of indigenous faculties of this sort? In one of his better known dialectal maneuvers, Reid claims that we should. For our situation is this. If we didn’t trust any of our indigenous faculties, we would face wholesale skepticism. Our most basic processes of reasoning would be rationally undercut, for we could not trust its deliverances. If we trust some but not all of our native faculties, then Reid claims we are being arbitrarily partial. Given that these faculties exhibit similar features, what reason could we have—at least at the outset of theorizing—for trusting one but not the other? In a well-known passage, Reid puts the point like this:

Reason, says the sceptic, is the only judge of truth, and you ought to throw off every opinion and every belief that is not grounded on reason. Why, Sir, should I believe the faculty of reason more than that of perception; they came both out of the same shop, and were made by the same artist; and if he puts one piece of false ware into my hands, what should hinder him from putting another? (IHM VI.xx: 169)

Reid continues in this vein, noting that trusting our indigenous faculties does not imply that we must suppose that they operate flawlessly:

There is no more reason to account our senses fallacious, than our reason, our memory, or any other faculty of judging which nature hath given us. They are all limited and imperfect…. We are liable to error and wrong judgment in the use of them all; but as little in the informations of sense as in the deductions of reasoning. (EIP II.xxii: 251–52; cf. Greco 2002 and 2004)

4.2 Reid’s defense of the reliability of the moral sense

In the Active Powers, Reid extends this line of argument to the moral sense. The fact that we have no well-worked out explanation of how we form moral judgments does not itself rationally undercut the epistemic status of these judgments (EAP V.ii: 282–3). And there are grounds for thinking that these judgments are often in good epistemic shape. For the moral sense, Reid claims, is also indigenous; all normal human beings raised in a normal environment have it. Moreover, its outputs include judgments of various sorts—judgments about what is wrong, right, approbation-worthy, and so forth. The practice of forming moral judgments is, furthermore, socially well-established over time. In fact, it is so deeply entrenched that it is, for all practical purposes, inescapable; try as we might, we cannot avoid forming moral judgments. We also have sophisticated methods of evaluating moral judgments, such as appeals to what we today would call reflective equilibrium. Finally, many moral judgments—in particular, those that concern fundamental moral principles—are not subject to systemic disagreement among competent participants. By and large, our judgments about these principles converge (EAP III.iii.vi; cf. Levy 1999; Davis 2006, 2010 and Foster 2024, Ch. 8 explore Reid’s treatment of moral disagreement).

Given all this, Reid contends that moral skepticism should be rejected. At the outset of inquiry, the deliverances of the moral faculty, like the deliverances of our other indigenous cognitive faculties, deserve to be trusted. Unlike Ross after him, Reid seems to think that our beliefs about not only moral principles but also particular cases can count as instances of knowledge.

To this point, we’ve seen important respects in which Reid’s account of the moral sense both articulates with and differs from Hutcheson’s. In borrowing from Hutcheson, Reid is concerned to distance his view from the rationalists, who come very close to characterizing moral knowledge as a species of ordinary theoretical knowledge such as that achieved in mathematics. However, Reid also wants to correct certain deficiencies in the sentimentalist program, such as the tendency to drive a sharp wedge between reason and “sense” and to think of the deliverances of the moral sense as mere feelings. Still, while Reid wishes to underscore that the moral sense yields bona fide moral judgments, he also emphasizes that it issues in more than mere moral judgments. Reid writes: “Our moral judgments are not, like those we form in speculative matters, dry and unaffecting, but from their nature, are necessarily accompanied with affections and feelings …” (EAP III.iii.vii: 180). Reid calls the complex state that combines moral judgment, affection, and feeling “moral approbation.”

Moral approbation comprises three elements: moral judgment, affection, and feeling. Reid is clear that the moral judgments in question are not general ones that concern moral principles, but particular judgments that concern whether someone has behaved well or badly or exemplifies a virtue or vice. The affections that accompany them are, in turn, dispositions “to do good or hurt to others,” which have a de re structure since they have “persons, and not things” [i.e., propositions] as their immediate object (EAP III.iii.iv: 107, 108). Finally, Reid accepts a minimalist account of the feelings that comprise moral approbation; feelings such as pleasure and pain, in Reid’s view, have no intentional object. They are not about anything. Rather, they are, as it were, adverbial modifiers of mental states and events: one esteems another pleasurably or disapproves of another painfully. By distinguishing approbation from feeling, Reid rejects the position according to which desires are individuated by feelings of one or another sort.

It is not difficult to discern the theoretical work that this account of moral approbation is supposed to do for Reid. In both the Treatise and the second Enquiry, Hume charged rational intuitionists with having no account of why moral judgments, which are the output of reason, should have such an intimate connection with action. Reid’s answer is to “go nativist”: we are so constituted to have a moral sense. The moral sense yields unified mental states, namely, states of moral approbation and disapprobation, that include moral judgments, affections, and feelings. These states are action producers.

By appealing to our constitution, Reid takes himself to employ a strategy he has used elsewhere in his elaboration of our perception of the external world. Recall in this regard Reid’s account of tactile perception: given certain experiential inputs, such as the pressure sensations evoked upon touching a table, agents form conceptions and belief about the hardness of the table. The pressure sensations function as signs of the table’s hardness, which immediately evoke the conception and belief in question. According to this account, there are no mental images or “ideas” from which we infer the hardness of the table. Likewise, in the moral case, we are presented with various kinds of experiential inputs such as the behavior and countenance of agents. These experiential inputs function as signs, immediately evoking in us moral judgments of various sorts. When all goes well, these judgments, in turn, yield affection and feelings of various sorts. Once again, there are no ideas that form the basis of moral judgments; the process of judgment formation is ordinarily non-inferential. By emphasizing the similarities between these two cases, Reid takes himself to defend an account of moral perception. It is an account, in Reid’s view, which blends together the most promising features of both the rationalist and sentimentalist traditions (Copenhaver 2014).

5. Conclusion

The Active Powers articulates an agency-centered ethical theory. Rather than start with questions about the function of moral language or the nature of right and wrong, this approach begins with the human agent: what is it that moves the human agent to act? And are there distinctive considerations that do so? Reid believes that there are such considerations, and they include moral ones. This commitment meshes with his regulation account of autonomy, according to which our rational nature consists in our ability to regulate our conduct by appeal to the rational principles of action.

This account of moral motives borrows a great deal from the rationalists. Fundamental moral first principles, says Reid, are self-evident necessary truths which are knowable to a person with a sound understanding, a decent moral education, and not in the grip of distorting influences. Reid, however, was no ideologue, and freely borrowed from sentimentalists such as Hutcheson. In particular, he borrows from the sentimentalists the conceptuality of the moral sense, which figures so importantly in his work. The idea that the moral sense is at once an information-processing system whose deliverances are affective states that move us to action, we’ve seen, resembles closely what figures such as Hutcheson claim. Finally, we’ve also noted that, at various points, Reid’s thought coincides with Kant’s. This is especially evident when one considers Reid’s regulation account of autonomy and his invocation of what Darwall calls the second-person standpoint.

Rather few contemporary philosophers could accept all of Reid’s central commitments—agent causes, teleological accounts of action, and occasionalism are hardly the dominant views of the day! Still, for those who resonate with a broadly realist version of ethical non-naturalism with emphases similar to those of both Ross and Kant, Reid’s view is intriguing. Its resources remain to be mined.1

Bibliography

Primary Literature

Reid’s Work

[C]

The Correspondence of Thomas Reid. Paul Wood (ed.), Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 2002.

[AC]

Thomas Reid on the Animate Creation: Papers Relating to the Life Sciences, Paul Wood (ed.), Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1995.

[PE]

Thomas Reid on Practical Ethics, Knud Haakonssen (ed.), Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 2007.

[EAP]

Essays on the Active Powers of Man (1788). Knud Haakonssen and James Harris (eds.), Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 2010.

[EIP]

Essays on the Intellectual Powers of Man (1785). Derek R. Brookes (ed.), Edinburgh University Press, 2002.

[IHM]

An Inquiry into the Human Mind on the Principles of Common Sense (1764). Derek R. Brookes (ed.), Edinburgh University Press, 1997.

Works by Others

• Balguy, John, 1778. The Foundation of Moral Goodness. New York: Garland, 1976.
• Clarke, Samuel, 1705. A Demonstration of the Being and Attributes of God and Other Writings, Ezio Vailati (ed.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1998.
• Hutcheson, Francis, 1728. On the Nature and Conduct of the Passions, with Illustrations on the Moral Sense, edited and with an Introduction by Aaron Garrett, Indianapolis, IN: Liberty Fund, 2002 (abbreviated as ONC and IMS respectively).
• –––, 1726. An Inquiry into the Original of our Ideas of Beauty and Virtue, revised edition, edited and with an introduction by Wolfgang Leidhold, Indianapolis, IN: Liberty Fund, 2008.
• Price, Richard, 1787. A Review of the Principal Questions in Morals, D. D. Raphael (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1948.
• Sidgwick, Henry, Essays on Ethics and Method, Marcus G. Singer (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 2000.

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Acknowledgments

Portions of this entry draw from Cuneo 2015, 2014, 2013, and 2011. I thank Tyler Doggett, Tom Dougherty, and Lori Wilson for comments on an earlier draft of this entry.