Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy

Mill's Moral and Political Philosophy

First published Tue 9 Oct, 2007

John Stuart Mill (1806-1873) was the most famous and influential British moral philosopher of the nineteenth century. He was one of the last systematic philosophers, making significant contributions in logic, metaphysics, epistemology, ethics, political philosophy, and social theory. He was also an important public figure, articulating the liberal platform, pressing for various liberal reforms, and serving in Parliament. Mill's greatest philosophical influence was in moral and political philosophy, especially his articulation and defense of utilitarian moral theory and liberal political philosophy.[1] This entry will examine Mill's moral and political philosophy selectively, reconstructing the central elements of his contributions to the utilitarian and liberal traditions. We will concentrate on his two most popular and best known works — Utilitarianism (1861) and On Liberty (1859) — though we will draw on other texts when this sheds light on our interpretation of his utilitarian and liberal principles. We will conclude by looking at how Mill applies these principles to issues of political and sexual equality in Considerations on Representative Government (1859), Principles of Political Economy (1848), and The Subjection of Women (1869).

1. Mill's Intellectual Background

One cannot properly appreciate the development of Mill's moral and political philosophy without some understanding of his intellectual background. Mill was raised in the tradition of Philosophical Radicalism, made famous by Jeremy Bentham (1748-1832), John Austin (1790-1859), and his father James Mill (1773-1836), which applied utilitarian principles in a self-conscious and systematic way to issues of institutional design and social reform. Utilitarianism assesses actions and institutions in terms of their effects on human happiness and enjoins us to perform actions and design institutions so that they promote — in one formulation, maximize — human happiness. Utilitarianism was a progressive doctrine historically, principally because of its universal scope — its insistence that everyone's happiness matters — and its egalitarian conception of impartiality — its insistence that everyone's happiness matters equally. Because of these general characteristics of utilitarianism, the Radicals' application of utilitarian principles to social institutions tended to challenge traditional institutions of class and privilege.

As documented in his Autobiography (1873), Mill was groomed from birth by his father to become the ultimate Victorian intellectual and utilitarian reformer. As part of this apprenticeship, Mill was exposed to an extremely demanding education, shaped by utilitarian principles. He began Greek at the age of three. He had read considerable Greek and Latin history, poetry, and philosophy by the age eight. At the age of eleven he helped edit his father's History of India. At the age of thirteen he began a systematic study of political economy. While Mill followed the strict intellectual regimen laid down by his father for many years, the intellectual and emotional stress that he was asked to shoulder eventually proved too much. He suffered a profound intellectual and emotional crisis in the period 1826-1830. Mill discusses this emotional crisis in his Autobiography. In contrast with contemporary memoirs, Mill does not rush to blame his father for all of his troubles. However, he does think that his training was too strictly intellectual and ignored his emotional needs and development. Mill's recovery was assisted by friendships he formed with Thomas Carlyle and Samuel Coleridge, who introduced him to ideas and texts from the Romantic and Conservative traditions. As Mill emerged from his depression, he became more concerned with the development of well-rounded individuals and with the role of feeling, culture, and creativity in the happiness of individuals.[2]

Though Mill never renounced the liberal and utilitarian tradition and mission that he inherited from his father, his mental crisis and recovery greatly influenced his interpretation of this tradition. He became critical of the moral psychology of Bentham and his father and of some of the social theory underlying their plans for reform. It is arguable that Mill tends to downplay the significance of his innovations and to underestimate the intellectual discontinuities between himself and his father. One measure of the extent of Mill's departure from the views of Bentham and James Mill is that Mill's contributions to the utilitarian tradition led his father to view him as a defector from the utilitarian cause (Auto ch. V, para. 24/CW I 189). We need to try to understand the extent of the transformation Mill brings to the utilitarian and liberal principles of the Radicals.

2. Mill's Utilitarianism

Utilitarianism, in its most general form, claims that one should assess persons, actions, and institutions by how well they promote human (or perhaps sentient) happiness. This claim Mill shares with his forbears. But he modified their assumptions about human motivation, the nature of happiness, the relationship between happiness and duty, and the justification of utilitarianism.

Some of Mill's most significant innovations to the utilitarian tradition concern his claims about the nature of happiness and the role of happiness in human motivation. Bentham and James Mill understand happiness hedonistically, as consisting in pleasure, and they believe that the ultimate aim of each person is predominantly, if not exclusively, the promotion of the agent's own happiness (pleasure). Mill rejects their psychological egoism (hedonism) and significantly modifies their assumptions about happiness when he introduces his doctrine of higher pleasures. To appreciate Mill's innovations here, we need to understand some aspects of the Radical legacy he inherits.

2.1 The Philosophical Radicals

Bentham begins his Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation (1789) with this hedonistic assumption about human motivation.

Nature has placed mankind under the governance of two sovereign masters, pain and pleasure [ch. I, section 1].

Bentham allows that we may be moved by the pleasures and pains of others. But he appears to think that these other-regarding pleasures can move us only insofar as we take pleasure in the pleasure of others (V 32). This suggests that Bentham endorses a version of the principle of psychological egoism, which claims that the agent's own happiness is and can be the only ultimate object of his desires. In his unfinished Constitutional Code (1822-32), Bentham makes this commitment to psychological egoism clear.

On the occasion of every act he exercises, every human being is led to pursue that line of conduct which, according to his view of the case, taken by him at the moment, will be in the highest degree contributory to his own greatest happiness [Introduction, §2].

Bentham is a hedonist about utility or happiness, treating happiness as consisting in pleasure (Principles I 3). So the version of psychological egoism to which he is attracted is psychological hedonism. Bentham does not say why he believes that one's own pleasure is the only ultimate object of desire. He may see it as a reasonable generalization from his observations about the motives underlying human behavior.

James Mill also treats psychological hedonism as axiomatic in his Essay on Government (1824). For instance, he claims

The desire, therefore, of that power which is necessary to render the persons and properties of human beings subservient to our pleasures, is the grand governing law of human nature [Essay IV; cf. Essay V].

In these pronouncements about human motivation, the Radicals are psychological egoists and hedonists. Sometimes, Bentham appears to allow for a more diverse set of ultimate motives or interests, including other-regarding motives (Principles X 25, 36-38; XI 31; Table of the Springs of Action II 2). But these concessions to psychological pluralism are exceptional. Even in contexts where Bentham recognizes motivation that is not ultimately self-interested, he appears to treat it as weaker and less dependable than self-interested motivation (Book of Fallacies 392-93).

Bentham claims that utility not only describes human motivation but sets the standard of right and wrong (I 1).

By the principle of utility is meant that principle which approves or disapproves of every action whatsoever, according to the tendency which it appears to have to augment or diminish the happiness of the party whose interest is in question … [I 2].

It remains to be determined whose happiness matters. One might imagine that it is the utility of the agent. This would be the ethical counterpart to psychological egoism. However, Bentham's answer, and the answer characteristic of utilitarianism, is the happiness of the community or the happiness of all (I 4-10). Bentham says that our account of right action, obligation, and duty ought to be governed by the principle of utility (I 9-10). This seems to imply that an action is right or obligatory just insofar as it promotes utility. But then the right or obligatory act would seem to be the one that promotes utility the most or maximizes utility. For these reasons, it is common to understand Bentham as combining psychological hedonism and hedonistic utilitarianism.

But, if this is Bentham's view, he faces a problem, for he combines the ethical claim that each of us ought to aim at the general happiness (pleasure) with the psychological claim that each of us can only aim (ultimately) at his own happiness (pleasure). Here we seem to have a special case of the conflict between psychological egoism and morality's other-regarding or altruistic demands. It is hard to see how to reconcile psychological egoism and a universalist moral theory.

Bentham is not unaware of this tension. He addresses part of the problem in the political context in other writings, notably his Plan for Parliamentary Reform (1817). In the political context, the problem is how we can get self-interested rulers to rule in the interest of the governed, as utilitarianism implies that they should. Bentham's answer invokes his commitment to representative democracy. We can reconcile self-interested motivation and promotion of the common good if we make rulers democratically accountable to (all) those whom they govern, for this tends to make the interest of the governed and the interest of the governors coincide. Bentham's argument, elaborated by James Mill in his Essay on Government, is something like this.

  1. Each person acts only to promote his own interests.
  2. The proper object of government is the interest of the governed.
  3. Hence, rulers will pursue the proper object of government if and only if their interests coincide with those of the governed.
  4. A ruler's interest will coincide with those of the governed if and only if he is politically accountable to the governed.
  5. Hence, rulers must be democratically accountable.

It was this reasoning that led Bentham and Mill to advocate democratic reforms that included extending the franchise to workers and peasant farmers.

This attempt to harness self-interest for the promotion of the common good is ingenious and has been an incredibly influential idea in theories of institutional design. Whether it is an adequate response to the tension between utilitarianism and psychological egoism is another matter. Even in the political context it only reduces the conflict between egoistic motivation and impartial utilitarian demands. Until such time as political leaders are made fully accountable, the political demands of utilitarianism must remain irrelevant. Also notice that the coincidence Bentham seeks between the interest of the governed and the interest of the governors is artificial. Political accountability will not effectively curb political egoism if rulers are sufficiently good at deceiving the public. Finally, notice that Bentham's solution to the tension has no obvious counterpart in the case of private, rather than public or political, conduct. Perhaps we can make political leaders accountable to citizens. But can we effectively make one citizen accountable to others?

In Principles Chapter IV Bentham sets out his conception of pleasure and utility in more detail, distinguishing between intrinsic and relational dimensions of pleasures. For our purposes, some dimensions matter more than others. Hedonism says that pleasure is the one and only intrinsic good and that pain is the one and only intrinsic evil. All other things have only extrinsic or instrumental value depending on whether and, if so, how much pleasure or pain they produce. Because the utilitarian asks us to maximize value, he has to be able to make sense of quantities or magnitudes of value associated with different options, where he assigns value to pleasure and disvalue to pain. Intensity, duration, and extent would appear to be the most relevant variables here. Each option is associated with various pleasures and pains both within a single life and across lives. For any given option we must find out how many pleasures and pains it produces, whether those occur in a single life or in different lives. For every distinct pleasure and pain, we must calculate its intensity and its duration. That would give us the total amount of (net) pleasure (or pain) associated with each option. Then we must do that option with greatest total. If there are two (or more) options with the greatest total, we are free to select any of these.

Bentham does not assume that our estimates of what will maximize utility will always be reliable. Nor does he assume that we should always try to maximize utility (I 13; IV 6). Doing so is costly, and we may sometimes promote utility best by not trying to promote it directly. Nonetheless, utility, he thinks, is the standard of right conduct.

2.2 Psychological Egoism and Hedonism

What was Mill's attitude toward this strand of psychological egoism and hedonism in the thinking of his Radical forbears? Henry Sidgwick (1838-1900), for one, read Mill as a psychological egoist (Methods 42-44). This is not just guilt by association. For it may appear that Mill endorses psychological egoism in his so-called “proof” of the principle of utility in Chapter IV of Utilitarianism. There, Mill aims to show that happiness is the one and only thing desirable in itself (IV 2). To do this, he argues that happiness is desirable in itself (IV 3), and a central premise in this argument is that everyone desires his own happiness (IV 3). Mill later argues that only happiness is desirable (IV 4).

But the proof does not reveal Mill to be a psychological egoist, much less a psychological hedonist. First, notice that in the proof he is primarily concerned with happiness, not pleasure, as an object of desire (IV 2-6). That doesn't require him to distinguish the two, but it does mean that support for psychological egoism wouldn't obviously be support for psychological hedonism. More importantly, Mill does not endorse psychological egoism. To see this, consider the structure of his proof.

Mill claims that the utilitarian must claim that happiness is the one and only thing desirable in itself (IV 2). He claims that the only proof of desirability is desire and proceeds to argue that happiness is the one and only thing desired. He argues that a person does desire his own happiness for its own sake and that, therefore, happiness as such is desired by and desirable for its own sake for humanity as a whole (IV 3). He then turns to defend the claim that happiness is the only thing desirable in itself, by arguing that apparent counterexamples (e.g. desires for virtue for its own sake) are not inconsistent with his claim (IV 4-6).

Later, we will look at the proof in more detail and discuss various worries about its cogency. The important point, for present purposes, is that Mill does not endorse psychological egoism here. He does say that each person has an ultimate desire for her own happiness, but he does not say that this is each person's only ultimate desire. Indeed, in the second half of the proof he allows that some agents have a disinterested concern for virtue and that they care about virtue for its own sake (IV 4-5). And what is true of virtue is no less true of less grand objects of desire, such as money or power (IV 6). These too it is possible to desire for their own sakes.

In fact, Mill offers an associationist story about the evolution of such intrinsic or ultimate desires. Like everyone else, the miser initially desires money only instrumentally, for the sake of the things that it allows him to buy. But, over time, the miser's desire transfers from the ends to the means such that he develops a concern for money for its own sake, independently of its instrumental value. Whether all of our desires originated in self-interested or specifically hedonistic desire Mill does not say. But he is clear that our own happiness and certainly our own pleasure are not the only intrinsic aims we have. If psychological egoism claims that one's own happiness is the only thing that is desired for its own sake, then this shows that Mill is not a psychological egoist.

Of course, he does say that these things are desired as parts of happiness, and this might seem to be compatible with a sophisticated version of psychological egoism. But there is room for doubt that Mill is endorsing even a sophisticated psychological egoism. First, he does say that people can develop a purely “disinterested” desire for virtue itself, “without looking to any end beyond it” (IV 5). So it is not clear that he thinks one need desire virtue as a part of happiness. Moreover, if the concern with virtue is disinterested, it is hard to see how this involves pursuing one's own interest. Indeed, it is not clear that Mill is here talking about desiring virtue for its constitutive contribution to (a) the agent's own happiness or (b) the general happiness. Only (a) could possibly provide some comfort to psychological egoism. But presumably Mill's proof requires (b); it requires that it be the general happiness that is the one and only thing desirable for its own sake. But if Mill has (b) in mind, then he's given up on psychological egoism.

Difficulties with the proof itself make it hard to know just what Mill is assuming about human motivation. Perhaps all we can say for sure is that the proof does not provide good reason to read Mill as a psychological egoist. If we look outside of Utilitarianism we can find even clearer evidence of Mill's doubts about psychological egoism and hedonism. In a note to his edition of James Mill's Analysis of the Phenomena of the Human Mind (1869) John Stuart Mill diagnoses a possible equivocation in his father's doctrine.

That the pleasures or pains of another person can only be pleasurable or painful to us through the association of our own pleasures and pains with them, is true in one sense, which is probably that intended by the author, but not true in another, against which he has not sufficiently guarded his mode of expression. It is evident, that the only pleasures or pains of which we have direct experience … [are] those felt by ourselves … [and] that the pleasure or pain with which we contemplate the pleasure or pain felt by someone else, is itself a pleasure or pain of our own. But if it be meant that in such cases the pleasure or pain is consciously referred to self, I take this to be a mistake [II 217-18].

In his “Remarks on Bentham's Philosophy” (1833) Mill urges a similar caution in understanding Bentham.

In laying down as a philosophical axiom that men's actions are always obedient to their interests, Mr. Bentham did no more than dress up the very trivial proposition that all people do what they feel themselves most disposed to do ….. He by no means intended by this assertion to impute universal selfishness to mankind, for he reckoned the motive of sympathy as an interest [para. 26/CW X 13-14].

In both passages Mill makes what is now a familiar diagnosis of the troubles with psychological egoism. He thinks that psychological egoism is ambiguous between a true but trivial thesis about the ownership of desire — an agent necessarily acts on his own desires — and a substantive but wildly implausible thesis about the content of desires — an agent's ultimate desire is always and necessarily to promote his own interests or pleasure. If so, there is no thesis that is both substantive and plausible. The substantive thesis may seem speciously attractive if we tacitly confuse it with the trivially true thesis. But it seems clear from Bentham's and James Mill's worries about the conflict between ruler's interests and the interest of the ruled that they intend something like the substantive psychological thesis. But if they do so because they conflate it with the trivial but true thesis, then they commit the fallacy of equivocation.

In A System of Logic (1843) Mill again provides a critique of psychological hedonism that relies on an associationist account of the development of plural ends that are psychologically autonomous (VI.ii.4/CW VIII 842). Something one desires originally only as an instrumental means to pleasure comes, by a process of association, to be desired for itself. In the process, Mill claims, the desire acquires psychological autonomy such that it can conflict with the prudential or hedonist concerns from which it originated. For instance, this is true of the miser. He starts off, like others, desiring money only as a means, for the pleasures that it can buy him. But he comes, over time, by a process of association or habituation, to care about money itself. In this way, the miser's concern for money can acquire psychological autonomy. Freed of its instrumental origin, the miser's desire for money can conflict with and override the prudential concern from which it originated. Here Mill denies the psychological hedonist view that pleasure is the sole ultimate object of our desires. Likewise, he denies the more general psychological egoist thesis that one's own happiness is the sole ultimate object of desire.

So it seems clear that Mill rejects the traditional substantive doctrines of psychological egoism and hedonism that Bentham and his father sometimes defended or suggested. This is really part of a larger criticism of the conception of psychology and human nature underlying Benthamite utilitarianism, which Mill elaborates in his essays “On Bentham” (1838) and “Remarks on Bentham's Philosophy”. Mill links Bentham's faults to the narrowness of his philosophy and personality.

Bentham's contempt, then, for all other schools of thinkers; his determination to create a philosophy wholly out of the materials furnished by his own mind, and by minds like his own; was his first disqualification as a philosopher. His second, was the incompleteness of his own mind as a representative of universal human nature. In many of the most natural and strongest feelings of human nature he had no sympathy; from many of its graver experiences he was altogether cut off; and the faculty by which one mind understands a mind different from itself, and throws itself into the feelings of that other mind, was denied him by his deficiency of Imagination [“Bentham” para. 23/CW X 91; cf. para. 26/CW X93].

Mill's desire to distance himself from Benthamite assumptions about human nature and psychology are also reflected in Mill's conception of happiness and his doctrine of higher pleasures.

2.3 Happiness and Higher Pleasures

Whatever his differences with Benthamite utilitarianism, Mill never abandons the utilitarian tradition of the Radicals. Mill explains his commitment to utilitarianism early in Chapter II of Utilitarianism.

The creed which accepts as the foundations of morals “utility” or the “greatest happiness principle” holds that actions are right in proportion as they tend to promote happiness; wrong as they tend to produce the reverse of happiness. By happiness is intended pleasure and the absence of pain; by unhappiness, pain and the privation of pleasure [II 2; cf.II 1].

This famous passage is sometimes called the Proportionality Doctrine. It sounds like Bentham. The first sentence appears to endorse utilitarianism, while the second sentence appears to endorse a hedonistic conception of utilitarianism.

Mill immediately goes on to introduce his doctrine of higher pleasures, which he contrasts with Benthamite utilitarianism. Hedonism implies that the mental state of pleasure is the only thing having intrinsic value (and the mental state of pain is the only intrinsic evil). All other things have only extrinsic value; they have value just insofar as they bring about, mediately or directly, intrinsic value (or disvalue). It follows that actions, activities, etc.can have only extrinsic value, and it would seem that their value should depend entirely upon the quantity of pleasure that they produce, where quantity is a function of the number of pleasures, their intensity, and their duration. This would mean that one kind of activity or pursuit is intrinsically no better than another. If we correctly value one more than another, it must be because the first produces more numerous, intense, or durable pleasures than the other.

Mill worries that some will reject hedonism as a theory of value or happiness fit only for swine (II 3). In particular, he worries that opponents will assume that utilitarianism favors sensual or voluptuary pursuits (e.g. push-pin) over higher or nobler pursuits (e.g. poetry). Mill attempts to reassure readers that the utilitarian can and will defend the superiority of higher pleasures.

He begins by noting, with fairly obvious reference to Bentham, that the hedonist can defend higher pursuits as extrinsically superior on the ground that they produce more intense, durable, and fecund pleasures (II 4). Presumably, the Benthamite should claim that neither poetry nor push-pin is intrinsically good. A fortiori neither is intrinsically superior to the other. We can only compare their extrinsic value based on the quantity of pleasure they produce, and this must be an empirical issue. As Mill remarks in the essay “On Bentham”

He [Bentham] says somewhere in his works, that, “quantity of pleasure being equal, push-pin is as good as poetry” [para. 64/CW X 113].

In fact, Bentham appears to have thought not simply that push-pin could be as valuable as poetry but that in fact it was more valuable. In The Rationale of Reward Bentham writes

The utility of all these arts and sciences … is exactly in proportion to the pleasure they yield. Every other species of preeminence which may be attempted to be established among them is altogether fanciful. Prejudice apart, the game of push-pin is of equal value with the arts and sciences of music and poetry. If the game of push-pin furnish more pleasure, it is more valuable than either. Everybody can play at push-pin; poetry and music are relished only by a few. The game of push-pin is always innocent: it were well could the same always be asserted of poetry. Indeed, between poetry and truth there is a natural opposition: false morals and fictitious nature. … If poetry and music deserve to be preferred before a game of push-pin, it must be because they are calculated to gratify those individuals who are most difficult to be pleased. [III.i]

As Bentham suggests, the difficulty of pleasing high-brows must be a count against music and poetry, for it raises their opportunity costs. Moreover, the education that it takes to appreciate music and poetry is also more costly than that required to appreciate push-pin. So Bentham seems to be making out a case for the purity and extent of the pleasures of push-pin.

Presumably, Mill's claim is that Bentham's actual view of the comparative value of push-pin and poetry might be rejected. Indeed, this is one place where Mill thinks that Bentham wrongly projects from his own narrow experience and interests, specifically from his failure to understand and appreciate the value of the arts. Mill apparently thinks that the arts broaden one's sensibilities and imagination, so that even if the pleasures associated with the arts are sometimes impure or costly they nonetheless produce intense and durable pleasures directly and produce much more pleasure indirectly by cultivating our emotional sensibilities and imagination.

So Mill thinks that the Benthamite hedonist can defend the extrinsic superiority of higher pleasure. Nonetheless, he is not content with this defense of the superiority of higher pleasures. While agreeing with the strict hedonist that the higher pleasures produce a larger quantity of pleasure and so are extrinsically more valuable, he also insists that the greater value of intellectual pleasures can and should be put on a more secure footing (II 4). He explains these higher pleasures and links them with the preferences of a competent judge, in the following manner.

If I am asked what I mean by difference of quality in pleasures, or what makes one pleasure more valuable than another, merely as a pleasure, except its being greater in amount, there is but one possible answer. If one of the two is, by those who are competently acquainted with both, placed so far above the other that they prefer it, even though knowing it to be attended with a greater amount of discontent, and would not resign it for any quantity of the other pleasure which their nature is capable of, we are justified in ascribing to the preferred enjoyment a superiority in quality so far outweighing quantity as to render it, in comparison, of small account[II 5].

Indeed, Mill seems to claim here not just that higher pleasures are intrinsically more valuable than lower ones but that they are incomparably better (II 6).

This certainly goes beyond Bentham's quantitative hedonism. In fact, it is not even clear that Mill's higher pleasures doctrine is consistent with hedonism. Mill's position here is hard to pin down, in part because he uses the term ‘pleasure’ sometimes to refer to (a) a certain kind of mental state or sensation and at other times to refer to (b) non-mental items, such as actions, activities, and pursuits that do or can cause pleasurable mental states (cf. the way in which someone might refer to sexual activity as a bodily pleasure). We might call (a)-type pleasures subjective pleasures and (b)-type pleasures objective pleasures. What's unclear is whether Mill's higher pleasures are subjective pleasures or objective pleasures. His discussion concerns activities that employ our higher faculties. What's unclear is whether higher pleasures refer to mental states or sensations caused by higher activities or the activities themselves.

It might seem clear that we should interpret higher pleasures as subjective pleasures. After all, Mill has just told us that he is a hedonist about happiness. The Radicals may not have always been clear about the kind of mental state or sensation they take pleasure to be, but it seems clear that they conceive of it as some kind of mental state or sensation. This is certainly the way the hedonist tradition is usually understood. Some, like Bentham, appear to conceive of pleasure as a sensation with a distinctive kind of qualitative feel. Others, perhaps despairing of finding qualia common to all disparate kinds of pleasures, tend to understand pleasures functionally, as mental states or sensations the subject, whose states these are, wants to continue and is disposed to prolong. Pleasures, understood functionally, could have very different qualitative feels and yet still be pleasures. Insofar as Mill does discuss subjective pleasures, he is not clear which, if either, of these conceptions of pleasure he favors. Nonetheless, it may seem natural to assume that as a hedonist he conceives of pleasures as subjective pleasures. According to this interpretation, Mill is focusing on pleasurable sensations and then distinguishing higher and lower pleasures by references to their causes. Higher pleasures are pleasures caused by the exercise of our higher faculties, whereas lower pleasures are pleasures caused by the exercise of our lower capacities. But this interpretation of the higher pleasures doctrine has some costs.

One concern is that conceding this difference between higher and lower pleasures does not imply the qualitative superiority of the former. It is not obvious why a hedonist should think that higher pleasures, as such, should be more valuable than lower ones. The pleasures or sensations, as such, should be of equal value, though some activities that produce pleasure may produce more intense, more durable, or more numerous pleasures. But then there appears to be a problem reconciling this reading of the higher pleasures doctrine with hedonism.

Another problem for this reading of the higher pleasures doctrine is that various features of Mill's discussion suggest that he understands higher pleasures as objective pleasures. First, we have independent evidence that Mill sometimes uses the word “pleasure” to refer to objective pleasures. For instance, in the second part of the “proof” of the principle of utility in Chapter IV Mill counts music, virtue, and health as pleasures (IV 5). These seem to be objective pleasures. Elsewhere in his discussion of higher pleasures in Chapter II, Mill equates a person's pleasures with his “indulgences” (II 7) and with his “mode of existence” (II 8). Here too he seems to be discussing objective pleasures. When Mill introduces higher pleasures (II 4) he is clearly discussing, among other things, intellectual pursuits and activities. He claims to be arguing that what the quantitative hedonist finds extrinsically more valuable is also intrinsically more valuable (II 4, 7). But what the quantitative hedonist defends as extrinsically more valuable are complex activities and pursuits, such as writing or reading poetry, not mental states. Because Mill claims that these very same things are intrinsically, and not just extrinsically, more valuable, his higher pleasures would appear to be intellectual activities and pursuits, rather than mental states. Finally, in paragraphs4-8 Mill links the preferences of competent judges and the greater value of the objects of their preferences. But among the things Mill thinks competent judges would prefer are activities and pursuits. And, in particular, in commenting on the passage quoted above (II5), Mill writes

Now it is an unquestionable fact that those who are equally acquainted with and equally capable of appreciating and enjoying both do give a most marked preference to the manner of existence which employs their higher faculties [II 6; emphasis added].

Here Mill is identifying the higher pleasures with activities and pursuits that exercise our higher capacities. He also claims that happiness includes “many and various pleasures, with a decided predominance of the active over the passive …” (II 12). Whereas activities can be passive or active, it is hard to see how pleasures themselves would be.

Perhaps this is not absolutely conclusive evidence that Mill's higher pleasures are objective pleasures, but it has significant probative value. Insofar as Mill's higher pleasures doctrine concerns objective pleasures, it appears anti-hedonistic for two reasons. First, he claims that the intellectual pursuits have value out of proportion to the amount of contentment or pleasure (the mental state) that they produce. This would contradict the traditional hedonist claim that the extrinsic value of an activity is proportional to the quantity of pleasure associated with it. Second, Mill claims that these activities are intrinsically more valuable than the lower pursuits (II 7). But the traditional hedonist claims that the mental state of pleasure is the one and only intrinsic good; activities can have only extrinsic value, and no activity can be intrinsically more valuable than another.

Whichever way we read Mill's higher pleasures doctrine, it is hard to square that doctrine with hedonism, as traditionally formulated. This apparent inconsistency was been noted by many of Mill's subsequent critics, including Sidgwick (Methods 93n, 94, 121), F.H. Bradley (Ethical Studies 116-20), T.H. Green (Prolegomena to Ethics §§162-63), and G.E. Moore (Principia Ethica 71-72, 77-81). Green's discussion is especially instructive. After raising some of these questions about the compatibility of the higher pleasures doctrine with hedonism, Green focuses on Mill's explanation of the preferences of competent judges for modes of existence that employ their higher faculties. Higher pleasures are those things (e.g.activities) that a competent judge would prefer, even if they produced less pleasure in her than the lower “pleasures” would (II 5). But why should competent judges prefer activities that they often find less pleasurable unless they believe that these activities are more valuable? Mill explains the fact that competent judges prefer activities that exercise their rational capacities by appeal to their sense of dignity.

We may give what explanation we please of this unwillingness [on the part of a competent judge ever to sink into what he feels to be a lower grade of existence] …but its most appropriate appellation is a sense of dignity, which all human beings possess in one form or other, and in some, though by no means in exact, proportion to their higher faculties …[II 6].

Green thinks that the dignity passage undermines hedonism (Prolegomena §§164-66, 171). In claiming that it is the dignity of a life in which the higher capacities are exercised and the competent judge's sense of her own dignity that explains her preference for those activities, Mill implies that her preferences reflect judgments about the value that these activities have independently of their being the object of desire or the source of pleasure. We take pleasure in these activities because they are valuable; they are not valuable, because they are pleasurable. This means that the preferences of competent judges should be understood as evidence of the greater value of the object of their preferences, rather than as constituting the object of their preferences as more valuable.[3]

To see Green's point, think of competent judges as demi-gods. In the dignity passage, Mill is making the same sort of point that Socrates does in discussing Euthyphro's definition of piety as what all the gods love (Euthyphro 9c-11b). Socrates thought the gods' attitudes would be principled, not arbitrary. But this meant that their love presupposed, rather than explained, piety and justice. Similarly, Mill thinks that the preferences of competent judges are not arbitrary, but principled, reflecting a sense of the value of the higher capacities. But this would make his doctrine of higher pleasures fundamentally anti-hedonistic, insofar it explains the superiority of higher activities, not in terms of the pleasure they produce, but rather in terms of the dignity or value of the kind of life characterized by the exercise of higher capacities. And it is sensitivity to the dignity of such a life that explains the categorical preference that competent judges supposedly have for higher activities.

2.4 Perfectionist Elements

If we read Mill's higher pleasures doctrine as Green suggests, then we can begin to see the possibility and the appeal of reading Mill as a kind of perfectionist about happiness, who claims that human happiness consists in the proper exercise of those capacities essential to our nature. For instance, Mill suggests this sort of perfectionist perspective on happiness when early in On Liberty he describes the utilitarian foundation of his defense of individual liberties.

It is proper to state that I forego any advantage which could be derived to my argument from the idea of abstract right as a thing independent of utility. I regard utility as the ultimate appeal on all ethical questions; but it must be utility in the largest sense, grounded on the permanent interests of man as a progressive being [I 11].

Mill apparently believes that the sense of dignity of a (properly self-conscious) progressive being would give rise to a categorical preference for activities that exercise his or her higher capacities. In claiming that “it is better to be a human being dissatisfied than a pig satisfied; better to be Socrates dissatisfied than a fool satisfied” (U: II 6), Mill recognizes capacities for self-examination and practical deliberation as among our higher capacities.

This concern with self-examination and practical deliberation is, of course, a central theme in On Liberty. There he articulates the interest that progressive beings have in reflective decision-making.

He who lets the world, or his own portion of it, choose his plan of life for him has no need of any other faculty than the ape-like one of imitation. He who chooses his plan for himself employs all his faculties. He must use observation to see, reasoning and judgment to foresee, activity to gather materials for decision, discrimination to decide, and when he has decided, firmness and self-control to hold his deliberate decision. And these qualities he requires and exercises exactly in proportion as the part of his conduct which he determines according to his own judgment and feelings is a large one. It is possible that he might be guided in some good path, and kept out of harm's way, without any of these things. But what will be his comparative worth as a human being [III 4]?

Even if we agree that these deliberative capacities are unique to humans or that humans possess them to a higher degree than other creatures, we might wonder in what way their possession marks us as progressive beings or their exercise is important to human happiness. Mill thinks an account of human happiness ought to reflect the kinds of beings we are or what is valuable about human nature. His discussion of responsibility in A System of Logic (“Of Liberty and Necessity”) suggests that he thinks that humans are responsible agents and that this is what marks us as progressive beings. There he claims that capacities for practical deliberation are necessary for responsibility. In particular, he claims that moral responsibility involves a kind of self-mastery or self-governance in which one can distinguish between the strength of one's desires and impulses and their suitability or authority and in which one's actions reflect one's deliberations about what is suitable or right to do (VI.ii.3/CW VIII 841). Non-responsible agents, such as brutes or small children, appear to act on their strongest desires or, if they deliberate, to deliberate only about the instrumental means to the satisfaction of their strongest desires. By contrast, responsible agents must be able to deliberate about the appropriateness of their desires and regulate their actions according to these deliberations. If this is right, then Mill can claim that possession and use of our deliberative capacities mark us as progressive beings, because they are what mark as moral agents who are responsible. If our happiness should reflect the sort of being we are, then Mill can argue that higher activities that exercise these deliberative capacities form the principal or most important ingredient in human happiness.

We have been focusing on Mill's conception of happiness. Though Mill appears to endorse Bentham's commitment to the utilitarian claim that it is our duty to promote happiness, he seems to have a very different conception of happiness. His higher pleasures doctrine seems to involve a significant departure from Bentham's hedonistic conception of happiness. Indeed, we have seen that there is a case to be made for reading Mill as a kind of perfectionist about happiness who stresses the intrinsic value of activities that exercise our higher capacities. Because Mill introduces these apparently anti-hedonistic claims about happiness with an apparent endorsement of hedonism (I 2), it is unclear if he has a consistent conception of happiness. The apparently hedonistic formulation at the beginning of ChapterII, Mill insists, is only a first approximation that needs further articulation.

To give a clear view of the moral standard set up by the theory, much more requires to be said; in particular, what things it includes in the ideas of pain and pleasure, and to what extent this is left an open question [II 2].

This should be a puzzling claim if we assume, as Bentham seems to have, that ‘pleasure‘ refers to a simple, qualitative mental state or sensation, for then, it is not clear what further analysis of pleasure should be necessary or even possible.

There is no puzzle if Mill is speaking here, as he does elsewhere, of objective pleasures. If he uses the word ‘pleasure‘ here to refer, not to any mental state, but to the activities that typically produce pleasurable mental states, then he can consistently say that happiness consists in pleasure — objective pleasure — and offer an objective or even perfectionist conception of happiness whose dominant component is the exercise of deliberative capacities. And this is just what he seems to do. His defense of higher pleasures in the paragraphs immediately following this initial statement of utilitarianism should be read as an important articulation of this initial statement that yields an anti-hedonistic conception of happiness.

There is no doubt that his initial formulation of his conception of happiness in terms of pleasure misleadingly leads us to expect greater continuity between his own brand of utilitarianism and Benthamite utilitarianism than we actually find. Mill's break with the hedonistic utilitarianism of Bentham and his father would have been clearer if he had avoided defining utilitarianism in terms of pleasure and pain and eschewed talk of “higher pleasures” and simply argued for a conception of happiness that recognizes the intrinsic superiority of the higher activities. However, this seems to be how we should understand the doctrine of higher pleasures. The fact that he uses the word ‘pleasure‘ to refer to objective pleasures allows us to recover a consistent and coherent doctrine from his somewhat misleading claims.

2.5 Conceptions of Duty

As Mill's Proportionality Doctrine makes clear, he endorses the utilitarian idea that duty or right action is to be defined in terms of the promotion of happiness. But exactly how Mill thinks duty is related to happiness is not entirely clear. To understand some of the different strands in his conception of utilitarianism, we need to make some distinctions. In particular, we need to distinguish between direct and indirect utilitarianism.

So formulated, direct and indirect utilitarianism are general theories that apply, at least in principle, to any object of moral assessment. But our focus here is on right action or duty. Act utilitarianism is the most familiar form of direct utilitarianism applied to action, whereas the most common indirect utilitarian theory of duty is rule utilitarianism.

This conception of act utilitarianism is both maximizing, because it identifies the right action with the best available action, and scalar, because it recognizes that rightness can come in degrees, depending on the action's proximity to the best.[4] The right act is the optimal act, but some suboptimal acts can be more right and less wrong than others. Similarly, this conception of rule utilitarianism assesses rules in both maximizing and scalar fashion.

Act utilitarianism appears to say that we should adhere to familiar moral precepts about honesty, fidelity, and nonmaleficence only when doing so has the best consequences. It is a counter-intuitive doctrine to the extent that we regard some of these precepts as categorical moral rules or principles. Rule utilitarianism may seem less counter-intuitive, because it can explain why one ought to adhere to certain rules or precepts, even when doing so does not have the best consequences, provided doing so is generally optimal. Act utilitarianism must condemn following rules when doing so is suboptimal; rule utilitarianism need not. But not everyone agrees that this makes rule utilitarianism superior to act utilitarianism. Some think that we are wrong to embrace categorical moral rules and principles. Though these rules and principles might be good rules of thumb, they are not exceptionless generalizations. Moreover, rule utilitarianism may seem ad hoc. If utility is the appropriate test for rules, then why shouldn't we assess actions by the same criterion? Isn't rule utilitarianism a form of irrational rule worship? I raise these issues here, not to take a stand on them, but to indicate what might be at stake in the debate between direct and indirect forms of utilitarianism.

2.6 Utilitarianism as a Standard of Conduct

We might expect a utilitarian (act or rule) to apply the utilitarian principle in her deliberations. Consider act utilitarianism for a moment. We might expect such a utilitarian to be motivated by pure disinterested benevolence and to deliberate by calculating expected utility. But it is a practical question how to reason or be motivated, and act utilitarianism implies that this practical question, like all practical questions, is correctly answered by what would maximize utility. Utilitarian calculation is time-consuming and often unreliable or subject to bias and distortion. For such reasons, we may better approximate the utilitarian standard if we don't always try to approximate it. Mill says that to suppose that one must always consciously employ the utilitarian principle in making decisions

… is to mistake the very meaning of a standard of morals and confound the rule of action with the motive of it. It is the business of ethics to tell us what are our duties, or by what test we may know them; but no system of ethics requires that the sole motive of all we do shall be a feeling of duty; on the contrary, ninety-nine hundredths of all our actions are done from other motives, and rightly so done if the rule of duty does not condemn them [II 18].

Later utilitarians, such as Sidgwick, have made essentially the same point, insisting that utilitarianism provides a standard of right action, not necessarily as a decision procedure (Methods 413).

If utilitarianism is itself the standard of right conduct, not a decision procedure, then what sort of decision procedure should the utilitarian endorse, and what role should the principle of utility play in moral reasoning? As we will see, Mill thinks that much moral reasoning should be governed by secondary precepts or principles about such things as fidelity, fair play, and honesty that make no direct reference to utility but whose general observance does promote utility. These secondary principles should be set aside in favor of direct appeals to the utilitarian first principle in cases in which adherence to the secondary precept would have obviously inferior consequences or in which such secondary principles conflict (II 19, 24-25).

The question that concerns us here is what kind of utilitarian standard Mill endorses. Is he an act utilitarian, a rule utilitarian, or some other kind of indirect utilitarian?

2.7 Act Utilitarianism

Several of Mill's characterizations of utilitarianism imply or at least suggest a form of direct utilitarianism, specifically act utilitarianism. Chapter II, we saw, is where Mill purports to say what the doctrine of utilitarianism does and does not say. In the opening paragraph, he tells us that utilitarians are “those who stand up for utility as the test of right and wrong” (II 1). According to the Proportionality Doctrine, introduced in the next paragraph, utilitarianism holds “that actions are right in proportion as they tend to promote happiness; wrong as they tend to produce the reverse of happiness” (II 2). Later in that chapter, he says that it requires that “utility or happiness [be] considered as the directive rule of human conduct” (II 8). Still later in Chapter II, he describes utilitarianism as a “standard of what is right in conduct” (II 17). Even Chapter V, which will eventually introduce some indirect elements, begins with Mill asserting that utilitarianism is “the doctrine that utility or happiness is the criterion of right and wrong” (V 1). These passages all seem to endorse a form of direct utilitarianism, specifically act utilitarianism.

2.8 Rule Utilitarianism?

But not everyone agrees. J.O. Urmson famously defended a rule utilitarian reading of Mill (1953). One of Urmson's reasons for this rule utilitarian reading appeals to Mill's reliance on various rules and secondary principles in moral reasoning. We will examine that rationale shortly. But, perhaps surprisingly, Urmson also appeals to the Proportionality Doctrine as requiring a rule utilitarian interpretation of Mill.

A. Felicific Tendencies. Recall that the Proportionality Doctrine says, in part, that utilitarianism holds that actions are right in proportion as they tend to promote happiness; wrong as they tend to produce the reverse of happiness (II 2). Urmson claims that we can make sense of an action's tendency to produce good or bad consequences only as a claim about what is true of a class or type of actions. Token actions produce specifiable consequences; only types of actions have tendencies. On Urmson's interpretation, Mill is really saying that an action is right if it is a token of a type of act that tends to have good or optimal consequences. But then the Proportionality Doctrine would espouse a form of rule utilitarianism.

But Urmson's interpretation of the Proportionality Doctrine is problematic. First, it was common among the Philosophical Radicals to formulate utilitarianism, as the Proportionality Doctrine does, in terms of the felicific tendencies of actions. For instance, Bentham does this early in his Introduction to the Principles of Morals and Legislation.

By the principle of utility is meant that principle which approves or disapproves of every action whatsoever, according to the tendency which it appears to have to augment or diminish the happiness of the party whose interest is in question: or, what is the same thing in other words, to promote or oppose that happiness. I say of every action whatsoever; and therefore not only every action of a private individual, but of every measure of government [I 2; cf. I 3, 6].

Here Bentham clearly ascribes the felicific tendency to action tokens, and he equates an action's felicific tendency with the extent to which it promotes utility. Later, Bentham repeats this extensional understanding of tendencies.

The general tendency of an act is more or less pernicious, according to the sum total of its consequences: that is, according to the differences between the sum of such as are good, and the sum of such as are evil [VII 2; cf. IV 5].

If we interpret Mill's Proportionality Doctrine against the background of similar claims made by Bentham, then we have strong evidence against Urmson's reading and in favor of an act utilitarian reading of the Proportionality Doctrine (cf. Berger 1984: 73-78).

Second, we might note another act utilitarian understanding of the Proportionality Doctrine. Particular actions have many consequences that are distributed both across persons and across times. The felicific or hedonic valence of these various consequences can be mixed. A given act may have consequences that are good for A and B but bad for C or bad for A and B in the short-run but better for them in the long-run. We could speak of an action's tendency to promote happiness either as a way of picking out its beneficial consequences or perhaps as a way of signaling that its beneficial consequences outweigh or predominate over its harmful consequences. Sometimes, Bentham does just this (Principles IV 5). But then the Proportionality Doctrine would be asserting that an action is right insofar as it has beneficial consequences or insofar as its beneficial consequences predominate. But these are act utilitarian claims.

B. Secondary Principles. But Urmson does not appeal only to the Proportionality Doctrine to support his rule utilitarian interpretation. He also defends this interpretation as a reading of Mill's claims about the importance of secondary principles and rules in our moral reasoning. He recognizes that an act utilitarian might appeal to rules or principles as rules of thumb in doing utilitarian calculations but insists that Mill's secondary principles are not mere rules of thumb.

We can see the need for rules and principles that do not refer to utility by remembering Mill's distinction between a moral standard and a decision procedure (II 19). In his Autobiography Mill notes the case for pursuing our own happiness indirectly (V 7/CW I 145). The need for indirection in the pursuit of one's own happiness is sometimes called the paradox of egoism. It requires that one pursue things other than one's own happiness for their own sakes in order to be happy. Mill treats these plural ends as secondary principles. He holds similar views about the need for secondary principles in the promotion of universal happiness. For instance, in Utilitarianism he defends the utilitarian's appeal to various moral precepts as secondary principles (II 24-25). But it is not entirely clear how these secondary principles are related to the utilitarian first principle. Mill's discussion of the indirect pursuit of one's own happiness suggests one possibility.

However, the immediate context of discussion in Chapter II of Utilitarianism suggests a different relationship.

Secondary principles, so understood, might sound like mere rules of thumb. But Mill seems to regard them as more than heuristics in a utility calculation. He seems to believe that secondary principles often satisfy two conditions.

  1. Following the principle generally but imperfectly leads to optimal results.
  2. The suboptimal results that adherence to the principle produces cannot be identified reliably and efficiently in advance.

When these two conditions are met, Mill believes, agents should follow these principles automatically and uncritically most of the time. They should periodically step back and review, as best they can, whether the principle continues to satisfy conditions (1) and (2). Also, they should set aside these secondary principles and make direct appeal to the principle of utility in unusual cases in which it is especially clear that the effects of adhering to the principle would be substantially suboptimal and in cases in which secondary principles, each of which has a utilitarian justification, conflict (II 19, 24-25). But, otherwise, they should regulate their conduct according to these secondary principles without recourse to the utilitarian first principle. Regulating one's behavior in this way by secondary principles is what will best promote happiness. Mill summarizes this picture in A System of Logic.

I do not mean to assert that the promotion of happiness should be itself the end of all actions, or even all rules of action. It is the justification, and ought to be the controller, of all ends, but it is not itself the sole end. There are many virtuous actions, and even virtuous modes of action (though the cases are, I think, less frequent than is often supposed) by which happiness in the particular instance is sacrificed, more pain being produced than pleasure. But conduct of which this can be truly asserted, admits of justification only because it can be shown that on the whole more happiness will exist in the world, if feelings are cultivated which will make people, in certain cases, regardless of happiness [VI.xii.7/CW VIII 952].

He makes similar claims in his essay “On Bentham” (para. 61/W X 110-11).

Mill's claims about the nature and importance of secondary principles and precepts that are and ought to be regulated by utilitarian first principles form an important part of his views about moral reasoning. His utilitarian justification of discrete secondary principles is intended as a contrast with the intuitionism of William Whewell and others. As he makes clear in his essay “Whewell on Moral Philosophy” (1852), Mill thinks that the intuitionist wrongly treats familiar moral precepts as ultimate moral factors whose justification is supposed to be self-evident to reason. By contrast, Mill's account of secondary principles recognizes their importance in moral reasoning but insists that they are neither innate nor infallible; they are precepts that have been adopted and internalized because of their acceptance value, and their continued use should be suitably regulated by their ongoing comparative acceptance value. Far from undermining utilitarian first principles, Mill thinks, appeal to the importance of such moral principles actually provides support for utilitarianism.

It seems clear that Mill is assigning to secondary principles or rules a role that goes beyond rules of thumb in a utilitarian calculation. In the passage from A System of Logic above he claims that utility justifies which principles or rules we follow. Does this commit Mill to rule utilitarianism? Urmson thinks it does.

But Mill's claims about secondary principles are not inconsistent with act utilitarianism. For one thing, though Mill does not treat secondary principles as mere rules of thumb in utilitarian calculation, he does not think that they should be followed uncritically or independently of their consequences. He thinks that they should be set aside in favor of direct appeal to the principle of utility when following them would be clearly suboptimal or when there is a conflict among secondary principles.

Moreover, act utilitarianism permits one to act on discrete moral precepts or principles that make no direct reference to utility if this results in one performing the optimal action. Indeed, the act utilitarian can allow the agent to follow principles or rules even when this sometimes results in suboptimal acts being performed. Recall that act utilitarianism is a species of direct utilitarianism, which assesses things by their (actual) consequences. But the direct utilitarian assesses things other than actions, including motives, principles, and rules. Now it might be true that for a particular agent the rules with the optimal acceptance value direct him to perform actions some of which are suboptimal. If he cannot reliably identify in advance those cases where adherence to the rule would be suboptimal or if he is not sufficiently fine-grained psychologically to deviate from the rule here where doing so is optimal without deviating from the rule in other cases where it is not, then he will do more good by following the rules uncritically even though he knows that by doing so he will perform some suboptimal actions. In such a situation, a direct utilitarian should want the agent to follow the optimal rules, rather than always perform the optimal action. This would be rule utilitarianism (not direct utilitarianism) only if we made the further claim that the right action is to follow the optimal rules. But the direct utilitarian will refuse this further move. She will say that the right action is the optimal action, but that for some agents it can in principle sometimes be best to act from optimal motives, rather than perform right actions. The suboptimal actions the agent thus performs will be wrong, but they can be cases of blameless wrongdoing, perhaps even praiseworthy wrongdoing.

Important as it is to understanding some aspects of Mill's utilitarianism, this account of secondary principles does not force a choice between direct, act utilitarianism and indirect, rule utilitarianism. A fortiori, it does not provide reason to reject the act utilitarian strand in Mill's formulation of the utilitarian doctrine.

2.9 Sanction Utilitarianism

So far, the picture we get is that Mill endorses act utilitarianism as a standard of right conduct or duty, even if he does not require it to be a decision procedure or to supply a set of motives. Though he believes in the importance of secondary rules that can and should regulate much moral reasoning, this does not require any departure from direct utilitarianism. However, Chapter V of Utilitarianism introduces claims about duty, justice, and rights that are hard to square with direct or act utilitarianism.

For the truth is, that the idea of penal sanction, which is the essence of law, enters not only into the conception of injustice, but into that of any kind of wrong. We do not call anything wrong unless we mean to imply that a person ought to be punished in some way or other for doing it — if not by law, by the opinion of his fellow creatures; if not by opinion, by the reproaches of his own conscience. This seems the real turning point of the distinction between morality and simple expediency [V 14].

Here Mill defines wrongness and, by implication, duty, not directly in terms of the nature of the action or its consequences but indirectly in terms of appropriate responses to it. He appears to believe that one is under an obligation or duty to do something just in case failure to do it is wrong and that an action is wrong just in case some kind of external or internal sanction — punishment, social censure, or self-reproach — ought to be applied to its performance. This test distinguishes duty from expediency (V 14, 15). Not all suboptimal or inexpedient acts are wrong, only those to which one ought to apply some sort of sanction (at least, self-reproach).

Justice is a proper part of duty. Justice involves duties that are perfect duties — that is, duties that are correlated with rights (V 15). An act is just if and only if it is not unjust, and it is unjust just in case it is wrong and violates someone's rights (V 23). Someone has a right just in case she has a claim that society ought to protect by force of law or public opinion (V 24).

Notice that these relationships among duty, justice, and rights do not yet introduce any utilitarian elements. But Mill does think that whether sanctions ought to be applied to an action — and hence whether it is wrong — and whether society ought to enforce an individual's claim — and hence whether she has a right — both depend upon the utility or expediency of doing so (V 25). However, he does not say precisely what standard of expediency he has in mind. In particular, he does not say whether the relevant test for whether something is wrong requires that sanctions be optimal or merely beneficial overall. The class of wrong acts is narrower if we require that sanctions be optimal than if we require that they be merely beneficial. Unless otherwise noted, I will ignore this interesting question about the proper utilitarian standard for applying sanctions.

Because this account of duty defines the rightness and wrongness of an act, not in terms of its utility, as act utilitarianism does, but in terms of the utility of applying sanctions to the conduct, it is an indirect form of utilitarianism. Because justice is a species of duty, it inherits the indirect character of sanction utilitarianism. In “Mill's Theory of Morality” (1976) and other essays (1994), David Lyons has drawn attention to this indirect aspect of Mill's utilitarianism. Lyons does not have a name for this form of indirect utilitarianism. Because it makes the rightness and wrongness of conduct depend upon the utility of sanctioning that conduct in some way, we might call it sanction utilitarianism. Because sanction utilitarianism is a species of indirect utilitarianism, it is inconsistent with act utilitarianism. The introduction of indirect utilitarian ideas in Chapter V of Utilitarianism into an account of utilitarianism that otherwise looks act utilitarian reveals a fundamental tension in Mill's thought about duty.

2.10 Act vs. Sanction Utilitarianism

Given Mill's ambivalence between direct and indirect utilitarianism, it is natural to inquire whether one view is more plausible than the other. Some of Mill's claims in Chapter V suggest a possible advantage that sanction utilitarianism might have. In articulating sanction utilitarianism, Mill claims that it allows him to distinguish duty and expediency and claim that not all inexpedient acts are wrong; inexpedient acts are only wrong when it is good or optimal to sanction them. This suggests that sanction utilitarianism may be preferable to act utilitarianism, because it has a more plausible account of the relation among different deontic categories.

Consider some of the implications of act utilitarianism. Act utilitarianism implies that I do wrong every time I fail to do the very best action, even when the suboptimal act that I perform is very good indeed. That may seem harsh and overly demanding. Commonsense moral thinking recognizes a familiar fourfold deontic distinction.

  1. wrong or forbidden
  2. permissible
  3. obligatory
  4. supererogatory

The act utilitarian seems unable to account for this fourfold distinction. Because it makes the optimal obligatory and the suboptimal wrong, it appears to expand the domain of the forbidden, collapse the distinction between the permissible and the obligatory, and make no room for the supererogatory. If the optimal is already one's duty, there appears to be no room for the supererogatory. By contrast, sanction utilitarianism does not appear to have these problems. It offers a distinct account of each category.

  1. Wrong or forbidden acts are those whose performance it is good/optimal to blame.
  2. Permissible acts are those whose performance it is not good/optimal to blame.
  3. Obligatory acts are those whose omission it is good/optimal to blame.
  4. Supererogatory acts are permissible acts that are especially expedient.

In this way, sanction utilitarianism appears to respect this common fourfold distinction and, in particular, to make room for the supererogatory.

However, the direct utilitarian can and should distinguish between the moral assessment of an act and the moral assessment of the act of praising or blaming that act. Each should be assessed, the direct utilitarian claims, by the utility of doing so. But then it is possible for there to be wrongdoing (a suboptimal act) that is blameless or even praiseworthy. But then the direct utilitarian can appeal to the same distinctions among praiseworthiness and blameworthiness that the sanction utilitarian appeals to, while denying that her own deontic distinctions track blame and praise. If so, it is unclear that sanction utilitarianism enjoys any real advantage here over act utilitarianism.

Moreover, sanction utilitarianism appears to have disadvantages that act utilitarianism does not. One such problem derives from its hybrid structure. Sanction utilitarianism is impurely indirect. For while it provides an indirect utilitarian theory of duty, the account it provides of when sanctions should be applied to conduct is direct — it depends upon the consequences of applying sanctions. Indeed, this isn't just the worry that sanction utilitarianism is a mixed theory — combining direct and indirect elements in an unmotivated or ad hoc way. There is a deeper worry afoot. Sanction utilitarianism provides an indirect utilitarian account of the conditions under which an action — any action — is right or wrong. This general criterion is that any action is wrong to which one ought to attach sanctions. But it goes on to explain when one ought to attach sanctions in direct utilitarian terms of whether doing so would be optimal (or, perhaps, beneficial). But imposing sanctions is a kind of action, and we can ask whether the imposition of a particular sanction would be right or wrong. The general criterion implies that we should answer this question about the rightness of applying sanctions in sanction-utilitarians terms, namely, by asking whether it would be right to sanction the failure to apply sanctions. This introduces a second-order sanction, whose rightness we can now ask about. We seem to be off on an infinite regress of sanctions. This is already cause for concern, inasmuch as this infinite regress looks vicious, because there appears to be no determinate fact to ground an answer to the original question about whether it is right to apply the first-order sanction. But matters are worse for sanction utilitarianism inasmuch as it implies a direct utilitarian answer to the question of whether it is right to apply sanctions that is inconsistent with the general criterion. This appears to render sanction utilitarianism internally inconsistent.

In the face of worries about sanction utilitarianism, it may be tempting to try to square sanction utilitarianism with act utilitarianism by noticing that in the crucial passage introducing sanction utilitarianism Mill says that “we do not call anything wrong unless we mean to imply that a person ought to be punished in some way or other for doing it — if not by law, by the opinion of his fellow creatures; if not by opinion, by the reproaches of his own conscience” (V 14, emphasis added). One might argue that Mill is giving an account of when we call something wrong, not when it is wrong. Whereas being wrong is, as the act utilitarian claims, a matter of being suboptimal, we only bother to call something wrong if it rises to the level that it would be good or optimal to sanction. Considered in itself, this act utilitarian reading of the significance of sanction utilitarianism is reasonably plausible. The problem is that the surrounding text makes it difficult to sustain this reading without strain. For in the previous sentence Mill says that “the idea of penal sanction … enters … into any kind of wrong,” and in the sentence immediately following the statement of sanction utilitarianism he says “that this seems to be the real turning point of the distinction between morality and simple expediency”. Here, he seems to be speaking in his own voice and insisting on distinguishing one's duty from what is or would be optimal.

The different strands in Mill's utilitarian conception of duty require disentangling. In his central exposition of the utilitarian standard in Chapter II, Mill commits himself to act utilitarianism in multiple passages. In that same chapter, he focuses on the felicific tendencies of actions and assigns a significant role to rules within moral reasoning, both of which have been taken to commit him to a rule utilitarian doctrine. However, these claims are reconcilable with direct utilitarianism and so provide no good reason to depart from a traditional act utilitarian reading of that chapter. But in Chapter V Mill does introduce indirect utilitarian ideas in the doctrine of sanction utilitarianism. It is hard to reconcile these direct and indirect elements in Mill's conception of duty.

2.11 The Proof of Utility

We have focused so far on understanding Mill's version of utilitarianism, especially his conceptions of happiness and duty. Now we should consider his justification of utilitarianism, which he offers in his discussion of the “proof” of the principle of utility in Chapter IV. Mill claims that the utilitarian must claim that happiness is the one and only thing desirable in itself (IV 2). He claims that the only proof of desirability is desire and proceeds to argue that happiness is the one and only thing desired. He argues that a person does desire his own happiness for its own sake and that, therefore, happiness as such is desired by and desirable for its own sake for humanity as a whole (“The aggregate of all persons”) (IV 3). He then turns to defend the claim that happiness is the only thing desirable in itself, by arguing that apparent counterexamples (e.g. desires for virtue for its own sake) are not inconsistent with his claim (IV 5-8).

Mill's proof is widely regarded as flawed in multiple ways. To appreciate the objections we need to reconstruct the steps in this argument more carefully. One traditional reconstruction might look something like this.

  1. Utilitarianism is true iff happiness is the one and only thing desirable for its own sake (and not for the sake of something else).
  2. The only proof of desirability is desire.
  3. Each person desires his own happiness for its own sake (and not for the sake of something else).
  4. Hence, happiness, as such, is desired for its own sake (and not for the sake of something else) from the point of view of humanity (= the aggregate of persons).
  5. Hence, happiness, as such, is desirable for its own sake (and not for the sake of something else).
  6. Happiness is the only thing desired for its own sake (and not for the sake of something else). Other things — such as virtue, health, music, money, and power — can come to be desired for their own sakes, but then they are desired as parts of happiness.
  7. Hence, happiness is the only thing desirable for its own sake (and not for the sake of something else).
  8. Hence, utilitarianism is true.

The “proof” has, at least in some quarters, threatened Mill's reputation as a careful philosopher. It is commonly thought to be riddled with major mistakes — mistakes of inference and implausible assumptions. Here is a partial list of concerns about Mill's argument, as traditionally conceived.

(i) (1) is plausible only if “desirable” means worthy of being desired, not if it means capable of being desired. But (2) is most plausible if “desirable” means capable of being desired (see (iii) below). But then there is a real worry that the argument trades on a tacit equivocation between these two different senses of “desirable” and that the argument is, as a result, invalid.

(ii) Even so, (1) is false. Even if happiness were the one and only think desirable for its own sake, this would establish only a claim about the good or “ends”. It is not a claim about duty or right action. Utilitarianism not only claims that the good is human happiness but goes on to define the right in terms of promoting the good. The second claim does not follow from the first. Mill appears to recognize this insofar as he at least tacitly distinguishes the two claims (IV 9; cf. IV 2). However, he goes on to infer the second claim from the first without any independent argument.

[I]f human nature is so constituted as to desire nothing that is not either a part of happiness or a means of happiness, we can have no other proof, and we require no other, that these are the only things desirable. If so, happiness is the sole end of human action, and the promotion of it the test by which to judge all human conduct; from whence it necessarily follows that it must be the criterion of morality, since a part is included in the whole. [IV 9]

(iii) For the argument to be valid, “desirability” in premise (2) must mean worthy of being desired (as it does in premise (1)). But then (2) is false. Desire is not proof of desirability. People can and do have mistaken desires about what is good. Indeed, if Mill is either a hedonist or a perfectionist he must think that people can and do have desires that fail to track the good.

(iv) It is not clear that (3) is true. It seems as if masochists or selfless altruists might fail to desire their own happiness for its own sake.

(v) (4) may be incoherent and certainly does not follow from (3). It is not clear that aggregates of persons have desires. Perhaps under special circumstances groups of people might form a corporate agent or person. But aggregates of persons, as such, are not persons and do not have desires. Even if they did, it is doubtful that one could infer what the aggregate desires from facts about what its members desire. That would involve a compositional fallacy.

(vi) (5) is presumably equivalent to the claim that happiness is good. But is it good simpliciter or good for the aggregate? The analogy between individuals and groups would suggest that happiness should be a good for the aggregate. But presumably the intended conclusion requires that happiness be good simpliciter.

(vii) It is not clear how to understand (6). One would think that the aim is to make claims that parallel (4) and (5). But then (6) needs to be understood as making another claim about aggregate psychology. And this raises some of the old questions about aggregate psychology. However, much of the discussion in IV 5-8 seems to be about individual psychology. Mill seems to be saying that insofar as individuals do have intrinsic desires for things other than their own happiness the objects of intrinsic desire are desired as parts of their own happiness. Perhaps this is Mill's initial claim from which he then hopes to infer, as he did from (3)-(4), that the general happiness is the only thing desired by the aggregate for its own sake (and not for the sake of something else). This inference would, of course, give rise to the same sort of worries we raised about the inference from (3)-(4). In particular, we might doubt that aggregates of persons have any aims, much less ultimate aims. And even if we conceded that they did, it is not clear that we could infer facts about the desires of aggregates from facts about the desires of its members. That, we said, would seem to involve a compositional fallacy.

(viii) Even if we accepted this defense of (5) and (7), this would only establish that happiness as such was the only thing desirable or good for the aggregate. It looks like we could have parallel claims about the agent's own happiness being the only thing desirable or good for the individual. But this might seem to imply that while the aggregate should pursue or promote the general happiness individuals should pursue or promote their own happiness. That would not be a defense of utilitarianism.

These are all serious worries about Mill's proof, as traditionally conceived. These objections seem so serious and so obvious that they should make us loathe to interpret Mill as advancing this conception of the proof. Can we do any better by Mill in our interpretation of his proof? At the beginning of Chapter IV Mill repeats his admonition that ultimate ends do not admit of proof in the ordinary sense of that term (IV 1). Here, he alludes to his introductory remarks in Chapter I that provide caution about the kind of proof available for first principles.

… I shall … attempt to contribute something toward the understanding and appreciation of the “utilitarian” or “happiness” theory, and toward such proof as it is susceptible of. It is evident that this cannot be proof in the ordinary and popular meaning of the term. Questions of ultimate ends are not amenable of direct proof. … We are not, however, to infer that its acceptance or rejection must depend upon blind impulse or arbitrary choice. There is a larger meaning of the word “proof,” in which this question is as amenable to it as any other of the disputed questions of philosophy. The subject is within the cognizance of the rational faculty; and neither does that faculty deal with it solely in the way of intuition [I 5].

So it seems that Mill is looking for arguments that may be rationally persuasive without providing incontrovertible proof. How might this help us better understand the proof?

For one thing, Mill need not confuse desire and desirability. He recognizes that they are distinct, but says that desire is our only proof of desirability (IV 3). In saying this, he need not presuppose that desiring something confers value on (obtaining) it. He can be a perfectionist, as we interpreted him, in the higher pleasures doctrine. As he recognizes there (especially the dignity passage), our desires often reflect value judgments we make, explicitly or implicitly. If so, our desires will be evidence of what we regard as valuable, and our reflectively acceptable desires may provide our best defeasible test of what things are objectively valuable.

Mill first applies this test to what each of us desires for her own sake. His answer is that what each of us desires for his or her own sake is happiness (IV 3). We needn't interpret Mill as endorsing psychological egoism at this point. Mill is not saying that each of us can focus only on her own happiness. Rather, he can be read as saying when each of us does focus on her own ends or sake, we find that each cares about her own happiness. Another way to put Mill's point is that prudential concern focuses on the agent's happiness.

Mill goes on to say that just as each person's own happiness is a good to that person, so too happiness, as such, is a good to the aggregate of persons. But we need not suppose that Mill is attributing a psychology, much less an egoist psychology, to humanity as a group. Instead, we can read Mill as claiming that just as the agent's own happiness is the object of prudential concern, so too happiness as such is the proper object of disinterested or impartial concern.

On this reading, Mill is not trying to derive utilitarianism from egoism. Rather, he is assuming that the moral point of view is impartial in a way that prudence is not. Just as prudence aims at the agent's own happiness, so too, Mill thinks, morality, which is impartial, aims at happiness as such. On this reading, the structure of Mill's proof looks something like this.

  1. Prudence is partial.
  2. Because prudence is partial, it aims at the agent's own happiness.
  3. Morality, by contrast, is impartial.
  4. Because morality is impartial, it aims at happiness as such.
  5. If the moral point of view aims at happiness as such, then it is the moral duty of each to promote happiness.
  6. Hence, utilitarianism is true.

If this is the right way to understand Mill's proof, then his justification or defense of utilitarianism consists in assuming that the moral point of view is impartial and claiming that utilitarianism is the right way to understand impartiality. Morality is impartial, and impartiality requires taking everyone's interests into account — and not just those of some select few — and weighing them equally — and not with a thumb in the scales for some select few. Indeed, later, in Chapter V, Mill identifies impartiality and its progressive demands with both justice and utility.

It [impartiality] is involved in the very meaning of Utility, or the Greatest-Happiness Principle. That principle is a mere form of words without rational signification, unless one person's happiness, supposed equal in degree (with the proper allowance made for kind), is counted for exactly as much as another's. Those conditions being supplied, Bentham's dictum ‘everybody to count for one, nobody for more than one,’ might be written under the principle of utility as an explanatory commentary. The equal claim of everybody to happiness in the estimation of the moralist and the legislator involves an equal claim to all the means of happiness …. And hence all social inequalities which have ceased to be considered expedient, assume the character not of simple inexpediency, but of injustice. The entire history of social improvement has been a series of transitions, by which one custom or institution after another, from being supposed a primary necessity of social existence, has passed into the rank of universally stigmatized injustice and tyranny. So it has been with the distinctions of slaves and freemen, nobles and serfs, patricians and plebeians; and so it will be, and in part already is, with the aristocracies of colour, race, and sex [V 36].

Here we see Mill identifying utilitarian impartiality with the demands of justice and morality itself (cf. Crisp 1997: 79-80). In doing so, he sees himself as echoing Bentham's conception of utilitarianism.[5]

One might wonder if utilitarianism is the only or the best way to understand impartiality. Indeed, this is one way of understanding now familiar worries about the implications of utilitarianism for issues of distributive justice and individual rights. But this reading of the proof has the virtue of identifying Mill's defense of utilitarianism with the feature of it that made it a progressive influence historically.

2.12 The Sanctions of Utility

In what is probably the most understudied chapter of Utilitarianism (ch. III), Mill addresses the question of the ultimate sanction of the principle of utility. He understands this alternately as a question about “the motives to obey it” and the “source of its obligation … [or] binding force” (III 1). Nor does Mill think that this issue about the sanction of the principle of utility is an idle one. There is a potential worry about the sanctions of utilitarianism that apparently has its source in prudence or self-interest.

He says to himself, I feel that I am bound not to rob or murder, betray or deceive; but why am I bound to promote the general happiness? If my own happiness lies in something else, why may I not give that the preference [III 1]?

But we can imagine this person unmoved by the moral demands in question and not just by a utilitarian reconstruction of these demands. And Mill is very clear that he thinks this issue about the sanction of utilitarianism arises for any moral theory and so poses no special problem for utilitarianism (III 1, 2, 3, 6).

Mill is not entirely clear how he understands the sanctions worry. Is it just a problem about motivation — the extent to which people are motivated to comply with utilitarianism or other moral conceptions and the extent to which and manner in which they might be brought to comply more fully or more easily? Or is it more a problem of authority — the extent to which people have reason to comply with utilitarianism or other moral conceptions? The sort of self-interested challenge that Mill identifies at the beginning (III 1) is usually part of an amoralist challenge to the authority of other-regarding morality. But much of Mill's actual discussion seems more addressed to the motivational issue.

Mill thinks that an account of the sanctions of utilitarianism or any other moral conception should distinguish between external and internal sanctions. The external sanctions are those penalties that can be visited on noncompliers by another, whether the others are mortals, individually or collectively, or God (III 3). Penalties might include official acts of the state (legal punishment) or community (official ostracism or public humiliation) or God (punishment meted out on Judgment Day). They might also include more informal and/or diffuse sanctions, such as those incurred when my bad acts have bad reputational effects that harm my social and/or economic prospects or opportunities. Of course, mortals are neither omniscient nor omnipotent. So there's no guarantee that noncompliers will be visited with external sanctions, at least in this world. If noncompliers can conceal their noncompliance, they will suffer no external sanctions. And existing external sanctions may be insufficient to deter noncompliance even if the noncompliance cannot be concealed. For instance, I may not be deterred from violating our agreement for mutually beneficial exchange of services by the bad reputational effects of noncompliance if you have already performed your part of the contract and the benefits of “taking the money and running” for me dwarf the costs of being excluded from future cooperation with you and other members of my community. Of course, we can collectively try to ratchet up the costs for detected noncompliance by criminalizing noncompliance, adopting draconian punishments for noncompliance, and pursuing extradition treaties with other communities. In this sense, the provision of adequate external sanctions is not entirely outside our control and could be treated as a political or social goal and achievement.

Mill spends somewhat more time discussing internal sanctions for noncompliance (iii 4-11). The internal sanction for noncompliance is Conscience (III 4). The issue that interests Mill most about Conscience seems to be whether it is innate (III 6-11). Mill represents the intuitionists (transcendentalists) as claiming that it is innate (II 6). He seems to equate Conscience being innate with its not being analyzable into other desires, passions, or emotions. Conscience might involve a desire to please God (III 4); it might involve the desire to be liked by others (III 4); it might involve the desire to form a union with others (III 10); or it might involve sympathy and empathy (III 7). Mill endorses the claim that Conscience is not innate (III 8-11). He thinks that Conscience involves these other emotions, passions, and desires and is built up out of them. Some of these capacities are themselves innate, but their proper development and exercise is a historical accomplishment that is not yet complete and that is fragile. So it is within our power individually — but more importantly collectively — to change social conditions so as to make Conscience and the internal sanctions of duty more robust.

In these claims Mill seems clearly to be focused on the motivational dimension of the internal sanctions of duty. But we might wonder what he has to say about the authority of these sanctions. The capacities underlying Conscience may not be distributed equally, and these capacities can wither or flower. Why should we care about Conscience? Is there anything wrong with me — in particular, any failure of practical reason — if I do not have a Conscience or it is weak? Is there any good reason I should cultivate a Conscience if I don't have one (assuming that's possible) or that I should invest resources in maintaining my Conscience if I do have one? Mill seems not to address these questions.

Is Mill right to claim that the worry about sanctions is really a general worry about the sanctions for noncompliance with other-regarding morality of any sort and so poses no special problem for utilitarianism? One might wonder whether utilitarianism makes greater demands on agents than other moral theories. For instance, contemporary writers have argued that utilitarianism seems to be potentially very demanding, much more so than commonsense morality. For instance, reformist utilitarians, such as Peter Singer (1972), have argued that utilitarianism entails extensive duties of mutual aid that would call for enormous changes in the lifestyles of all those who are even moderately well off. And critics of utilitarianism have treated the demandingness of utilitarianism as one of its principal flaws. Rawls (1971) has argued that the sort of interpersonal sacrifice that utilitarianism requires violates the strains of commitment in a well-ordered society. And Bernard Williams (1973) has argued that the demandingness of utilitarianism threatens the sort of personal projects and partial relationships that help give our lives meaning. The common complaint here is that utilitarianism's demands threaten to offend against a requirement of psychological realism, according to which the demands of an acceptable moral theory must be ones that can be incorporated into a reasonable and satisfying life plan.

This worry about the demands of utilitarianism is not easy to assess. One might wonder how to interpret and whether to accept the psychological realist constraint. If the constraint is relative to people's actual psychologies, then it represents a potentially conservative constraint on moral theorizing that one might well reject. If the constraint is relative to possible or ideal psychology, then it is not clear that even a highly revisionary moral theory need flout the constraint. Then there is a question about how demanding or revisionary utilitarianism actually is. Mill and Sidgwick thought that our knowledge of others and our causal powers to do good were limited to those near and dear and other associates with whom we have regular contact, with the result that — as individuals — we do better overall by focusing our energies and actions on associates of one kind or another, rather than the world at large (Utilitarianism II 19; Methods 361-69). On this view, utilitarianism can accommodate the sort of special obligations and personal concerns to which the critics of utilitarianism appeal. But it is arguable that even if this sort of utilitarian accommodation was tenable in nineteenth century Britain, technological development and globalization have rendered utilitarian demands more revisionary. Our information about others and our causal reach are not limited as they once were. Given the high benefit-to-cost ratio of many modern relief agencies, it is hard to resist something like Singer's conclusions about the reformist demands of utilitarianism. So even if Mill was right to think that the motivational demands of utilitarianism were not so different from those of other moral theories at the time he wrote, that claim might need to be reassessed today.

3. Mill's Liberalism

Mill's On Liberty is the most influential statement of his liberal principles. He begins by distinguishing old and new threats to liberty. The old threat to liberty is found in traditional societies in which there is rule by one (a monarchy) or a few (an aristocracy). Though one could be worried about restrictions on liberty by benevolent monarchs or aristocrats, the traditional worry is that when rulers are politically unaccountable to the governed they will rule in their own interests, rather than the interests of the governed. In particular, they will restrict the liberties of their subjects in ways that benefit the rulers, rather than the ruled. It was these traditional threats to liberty that the democratic reforms of the Philosophical Radicals were meant to address. But Mill thinks that these traditional threats to liberty are not the only ones to worry about. He makes clear that democracies contain their own threats to liberty — this is the tyranny, not of the one or the few, but of the majority (I 1-5). Mill sets out to articulate the principles that should regulate how governments and societies, whether democratic or not, can restrict individual liberties (I 6).

3.1 Liberal Principles and the Categorical Approach

In an early and famous passage Mill offers one formulation of his basic principles concerning liberties.

The object of this essay is to assert one very simple principle, as entitled to govern absolutely the dealings of society with the individual in the way of compulsion and control, whether the means used be physical force in the form of legal penalties or the moral coercion of public opinion. That principle is that the sole end for which mankind are warranted, individually or collectively, in interfering with the liberty of action of any of their number is self-protection. That the only purpose for which power can be rightfully exercised over any member of a civilized community, against his will, is to prevent harm to others. His own good, either physical or moral, is not a sufficient warrant. He cannot rightfully be compelled to do or forbear because it will be better for him to do so, because it will make him happier, because, in the opinions of others, to do so would be wise or even right. These are good reasons for remonstrating with him, or reasoning with him, or persuading him, or entreating him, but not for compelling him or visiting him with any evil in case he do otherwise. To justify that, the conduct from which it is desired to deter him must be calculated to produce evil to someone else. The only part of the conduct of anyone for which he is amenable to society is that which concerns others. In the part which merely concerns himself, his independence, is, of right, absolute. Over himself, over his own body and mind, the individual is sovereign [I 9].

Notice that Mill is concerned with articulating principles to apply to restrictions on liberty in various contexts. He is perhaps most interested in cases where the state uses civil or criminal law to forbid conduct and applies sanctions for noncompliance. But he is also interested in other sorts of case — including those in which social groups use the threat of condemnation and ostracism to limit liberty and ensure conformity and those in which one individual restricts the liberty of another. Having noted these complexities, let us focus, for the time being, on the central case of legal prohibition by the state.

In this passage, Mill distinguishes paternalistic and moralistic restrictions of liberty from restrictions of liberty based upon the harm principle.

Here, Mill seems to say that a restriction on someone's liberty is legitimate if and only if it satisfies the harm principle (cf. IV 1-4, 6; V 2). Later, he distinguishes between genuine harm and mere offense. In order to satisfy the harm principle, an action must actually violate or threaten imminent violation of those important interests of others in which they have a right (I 12; III 1; IV 3, 10, 12; V 5). So he seems to be saying that the harm principle is always a good reason for restricting liberty, but that mere appeals to morality, paternalism, or offense are never good reasons for restricting liberty.

As this account of Mill's principles suggests, his defense of individual liberties appears to be part of what might be called a categorical approach. To decide whether an individual's liberty ought to be protected, we must ascertain to which category the potential restriction of liberty belongs. The main categories for potential restrictions are as follows.

It is not just that Mill sorts restrictions on liberty by category. He also seems to permit or forbid restrictions on liberty by category, for he appears to say that a potential restriction is permissible if and only if it is an application of the harm principle.

Sometimes Mill suggests that the harm principle is equivalent to letting society restrict other-regarding conduct (I 11; IV 2). On this view, conduct can be divided into self-regarding and other-regarding conduct. Regulation of the former is paternalistic, and regulation of the latter is an application of the harm principle. So on this view it is never permissible to regulate purely self-regarding conduct and always permissible to regulate other-regarding conflict. But this is over-simple. Some other-regarding conduct causes mere offense, not genuine harm (IV 3, 12). So Mill cannot equate harmful behavior and other-regarding behavior and cannot think that all other-regarding behavior may be regulated.

It is generally thought that by applying this categorical approach to liberty and its permissible restrictions Mill is led to offer a fairly extensive defense of individual liberties against interference by the state and society. In particular, it is sometimes thought that Mill recognizes a large sphere of conduct which it is impermissible for the state to regulate. We might characterize this sphere of protected liberties as Mill's conception of liberal rights. On this reading, Mill is deriving his conception of liberal rights from a prior commitment to the categorical approach and, in particular, to the harm principle.[6]

3.2 Categories, Rights, and Utility

There is an apparent tension between Mill's commitment to a categorical approach to basic liberties and his defense of utilitarianism. Utilitarianism treats the good as prior to and independent of the right or duty — defining duty as the promotion of good consequences. Perhaps certain kinds of actions tend to be good or bad, but, according to direct utilitarianism, the moral quality of a particular action depends on its own consequences. By contrast, the deontological and natural rights traditions treat duty or the right as prior to and independent of the good. In particular, deontologists believe that it is not always one's duty to promote good consequences. Sometimes one has a duty to do an act that is suboptimal, and sometimes it is wrong to do the optimal act. Deontologists recognize moral constraints on pursuing the good. These constraints usually take the form of categorical rules to perform or refrain from certain sorts of actions (e.g. to keep promises or to refrain from lying), regardless of the consequences. A special case of this perceived conflict between categorical rules and utility is the perceived tension between utility and rights. For, on a common view, individual rights just are a special case of categorical rules. Individual rights, such as rights to liberties or to freedom from harm, are interpreted as side constraints on the pursuit of good consequences.

The apparent conflict between utility and rights, especially rights to liberties, poses an interesting test for Mill, because he not only endorses utilitarianism but wants to defend liberal rights. Moreover Mill insists that his arguments have utilitarian foundations.

It is proper to state that I forego any advantage which could be derived to my argument from the idea of abstract right as a thing independent of utility. I regard utility as the ultimate appeal on all ethical questions; but it must be utility in the largest sense, grounded on the permanent interests of man as a progressive being [OL: I 11].

Is Mill able to reconcile his defense of utility and liberty without compromising either his utilitarianism or his defense of a right to liberties? There seem to be four possible resolutions of this tension.

  1. The tension between utility and rights is inescapable, and Mill is simply inconsistent, endorsing both utilitarianism and rights to liberties.
  2. The tension between utility and rights is inescapable, and Mill's utilitarianism prevents him from defending genuine rights.
  3. The tension between utility and rights is inescapable, and Mill defends genuine rights, but only by abandoning his utilitarianism.
  4. The tension between utility and rights is not inescapable; Mill succeeds in reconciling a form of utilitarianism with a defense of individual rights to liberties.

It is worth bearing these possibilities in mind as we consider and evaluate Mill's defense of basic liberties. We will revisit this tension after we have examined Mill's main arguments and claims about basic liberties (see §3.13 below).

3.3 Freedom of Expression

Mill begins his defense of basic liberties with a discussion of freedom of expression. He thinks that there is general agreement on the importance of free speech and that, once the grounds for free speech are understood, this agreement can be exploited to support a more general defense of individual liberties (I 16; III 1). So his defense of expressive liberties is important not only in its own right but also insofar as it lays the foundation of his liberal principles.

Mill's discussion of censorship in Chapter II focuses on censorship whose aim is to suppress false or immoral opinion (II 1-2). Here too, Mill is apparently concerned with censorship whether practiced by individuals, groups, or states. However, here, as elsewhere, he focuses on restrictions on liberty imposed by the state. He mentions four reasons for maintaining free speech and opposing censorship.

  1. A censored opinion might be true (II 1-20, 41).
  2. Even if literally false, a censored opinion might contain part of the truth (II 34-39, 42).
  3. Even if wholly false, a censored opinion would prevent true opinions from becoming dogma (II 1-2, 6, 7, 22-23, 43).
  4. As a dogma, an unchallenged opinion will lose its meaning (II 26, 43).

It is natural to group these four considerations into two main kinds: the first two invoke a truth-tracking defense of expressive liberties, while the second two appeal to a distinctive kind of value that free discussion is supposed to have.

A. The Truth-Tracking Rationale. The first two claims represent freedom of expression as instrumentally valuable; it is valuable, not in itself, but as the most reliable means of producing something else that Mill assumes is valuable (either extrinsically or intrinsically), namely, true belief. Though Mill seems to assume that true belief is valuable, it is not hard to see how true beliefs would possess at least instrumental value, if only because our actions, plans, and reasoning are likely to be more successful when based on true beliefs. Of course, the most reliable means of promoting true belief would be to believe everything. But that would bring a great deal of false belief along too. A more plausible goal to promote would be something like the ratio of true belief to false belief. Freedom of expression might then be defended as a more reliable policy for promoting the ratio of true belief to false belief than a policy of censorship. This rationale for freedom of expression is echoed by Justice Oliver Wendell Holmes, in his famous dissent in Abrams v. United States when he claims that the best test of truth is free trade in the marketplace of ideas.[7]

Notice that this instrumental defense of freedom of expression does not require the mistaken assumption, which Mill sometimes makes, that the censor must assume his own infallibility (II 3). The censor need not assume that he is infallible. He can recognize that he might be mistaken, but insist that he must act on the best available evidence about what is true. Mill's better reply is that proper recognition of one's own fallibility should generally lead one to keep discussion open and not foreclose discussion of possibilities that seem improbable.

This instrumental rationale may justify freedom of expression in preference to a policy of censorship whenever the censor finds the beliefs in question implausible or offensive. But it does not justify freedom of expression in preference to more conservative forms of censorship. If the question is what policies are likely to increase the ratio of true to false belief, we would seem to be well justified in censoring opinions for whose falsity there is especially clear, compelling, and consistent or stable evidence. We would be on good ground in censoring flat-earthers (both literal and figurative).

Another way to see the weakness of the truth-tracking justification of freedom of expression is to notice that this instrumental defense of freedom of expression cannot explain what is wrong with censorship that is successful in truth-tracking terms. Suppose we lived in a society of the sort Plato imagines in the Republic in which cognitive capacities are distributed unequally between rulers and citizens and in which maximally knowledgeable and reliable censors — call them “philosopher kings” — censor all and only false beliefs. The truth-tracking argument would provide no argument against censorship in such circumstances. This shows that the truth-tracking argument condemns only unsuccessful or incompetent censorship. For some, this may be the biggest worry about censorship. But many would have residual worries about successful or competent censorship. They would object to censorship, even by philosopher-kings. Answering this worry requires a more robust defense of expressive liberties.

B. The Deliberative Rationale. The resources for a more robust defense of freedom of expression can be found in Mill's claim that it is needed to keep true beliefs from becoming dogmatic, because this reason for valuing freedom is intended to rebut the case for censorship even on the assumption that all and only false beliefs would be censored (II 2, 21). Mill's argument here is that freedoms of thought and discussion are necessary for fulfilling our natures as progressive beings (II 20). We can and should read Mill as appealing to his perfectionist assumptions about happiness to defend expressive liberties.

Recall that Mill claims that his defense of liberty relies on claims about the happiness of people as progressive beings (I 11). We have seen that Mill thinks that it is our deliberative capacities, especially our capacities for practical deliberation, that mark us as progressive creatures and that, as a result, the principal ingredient of our happiness or well-being must exercise these deliberative capacities. At its most general, practical deliberation involves reflective decision-making. In On Liberty Mill thinks of practical deliberation in terms of capacities to form, assess, choose, and implement projects and goals (III 4). We saw that Mill makes similar claims about the role of deliberative capacities in the happiness of progressive beings in his discussion of higher pleasures in Chapter II of Utilitarianism, where he contrasts the examined life Socrates led and the life of a contented swine and accords the former incomparably greater value (II 6). These deliberative capacities form the principal or most important ingredient in human happiness, because they are the capacities that mark us as responsible and, hence, progressive beings.

Mill's claim that the value of freedom of expression lies in keeping true beliefs from becoming dogmatic reflects his view that freedoms of thought and discussion are necessary for fulfilling our natures as progressive beings (II 20). For instance, we can see Mill appealing to a familiar distinction between true belief, on the one hand, and knowledge, understood as something like justified true belief, on the other hand (cf. Scanlon 1972; Ten 1980: 126-28). Progressive beings seek knowledge or justified true belief, and not simply true belief. Whereas the mere possession of true beliefs need not exercise one's deliberative capacities, because they might be the product of indoctrination, their justification would. One exercises deliberative capacities in the justification of one's beliefs and actions that is required for theoretical and practical knowledge. This is because justification involves comparison of, and deliberation among, alternatives (II 6, 7, 8, 22-23, 43). Freedoms of thought and discussion are essential to the justification of one's beliefs and actions, because individuals are not cognitively self-sufficient (II 38, 39; III 1). Sharing thought and discussion with others, especially about important matters, improves one's deliberations. It enlarges the menu of options, by identifying new options worth consideration, and helps one better assess the merits of these options, by forcing on one's attention new considerations and arguments about the comparative merits of the options. In these ways, open and vigorous discussion with diverse interlocutors improves the quality of one's deliberations. If so, censorship, even of false belief, can rob both those whose speech is suppressed and their audience of resources that they need to justify their beliefs and actions (II 1).

We should be careful not to overstate the significance of this argument against censorship. Deliberative values may not always speak in favor of expanding one's option set. Cognitively limited agents cannot consider all logically possible options, and careful consideration of many options — especially irrelevant options and options known to have failed — is likely to retard, rather than advance, their deliberations. More options are not always better than fewer. Nonetheless, it is important to note that this perfectionist appeal to deliberative values can explain why it is often wrong to censor even false beliefs. In this way, Mill's defense of expressive liberties that relies on his perfectionist appeal to deliberative values is a more robust defense than the one provided by his truth-tracking arguments alone.

3.4 A Perfectionist Defense of Basic Liberties

Though important in its own right, Mill's defense of freedom of thought and discussion provides the resources for an argument for various basic liberties. The deliberative rationale for freedoms of thought and discussion is a special case of a more general defense of basic liberties of thought and action that Mill offers in the balance of On Liberty. A good human life is one that exerci