The Liar Paradox in Arabic and Islamic Philosophy

Although the Liar Paradox was known in antiquity, the surviving textual record from that period is sparse. By contrast, medieval treatments of the Liar develop along two relatively well-preserved and parallel lines: one in the Islamic world, primarily in Arabic, and the other in the Christian world, primarily in Latin. The Latin tradition has been the subject of sustained historical scholarship for several decades (Spade & Read 2009 [2021]). Scholarly work on the Arabic tradition is a more recent development.

This article covers the development of the Arabic tradition from the 10th century to the 15th century. In the earliest texts, the Liar occurs either as a theological counterexample or as a logical sophism. During the 13th century, it became a standard example discussed by logicians, and several distinct solutions were articulated and defended. And at the end of the 15th century, the Liar had its philosophical moment, as it became the subject of an extended debate between two rivals, Ṣadr al-Dīn al-Dashtakī (d. 1498) and Jalāl al-Dīn al-Dawānī (d. 1502), who each wrote free-standing treatises on the topic.

• 1. General Remarks and Historical Context
• 2. The Early Period
  • 2.1 Yaḥyā ibn ʿAdī: When Declaratives Stop Being Declaratives
  • 2.2 Al-Naẓẓām, al-Bāqillānī, al-Baghdādī: Good, Evil, and the Liar
  • 2.3 Al-Fārābī and al-Rāzī: From self-falsification to paradox?
• 3. The 13th and 14th Centuries: A Conjunction of Two Contradictories
  • 3.1 Al-Abharī and al-Kātibī: Self-contradiction
  • 3.2 Al-Ṭūsī: Truth, Correspondence, and Distinctness
  • 3.3 Al-Samarqandī: Dual Evaluations
  • 3.4 Al-Taftāzānī: Voluntarism, Liar Cycles, and Irrational Roots
  • 3.5 Al-Jurjānī: Self-reference and Speaker Intention
• 4. The 15th Century
  • 4.1 Ḫaṭībzāde (?): States, Judgments, and Self-Contradiction
  • 4.2 Al-Dashtakī: Something Missing
  • 4.3 Al-Dawānī: Fruitless Self-Imitation
• 5. Conclusion
• Bibliography
  • Translations
  • Primary Texts
  • Other References
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

---

1. General Remarks and Historical Context

In its simplest form, the Liar is a puzzle generated when someone says, “This is false”. If true, this is false, and if false, true. Either way leads to contradiction.

Early texts in the tradition instead present the paradox as a puzzle about someone who says, “I am a liar (kādhib)”. Or rather—since the Arabic word ‘kādhib’ need not imply any intention to deceive—“I am a false-teller”, that is, someone who says false things. Unfortunately, this is ambiguous: it could mean that they always say false things; or it could mean that they sometimes say false things. Careful authors clarify what it means, or avoid this problem entirely, instead presenting the paradox as a puzzle about someone who says, “All my sayings are false”.^[1]

In ordinary circumstances, “All my sayings are false” is self-refuting, but it is not a paradox. In ordinary circumstances, the person who says “All my sayings are false” also says other things that are true, so the claim that all their sayings are false is simply false. To generate a paradox, we need to stipulate that they never say anything else that is true, either because everything else they say is false, or because this is the only thing they ever say. Since it is only a paradox in some situations but not others, “All my sayings are false” is what the contemporary literature calls a “contingent liar” (Barwise & Etchemendy 1987: 22).

This stipulation might seem far-fetched: it is hard to imagine a speaker who has never said anything true. To avoid this, 13th century authors shift to the example of someone who says, “All my sayings at this moment are false”, and this quickly becomes the standard example used in all discussions of the Liar (Alwishah and Sanson 2026: 100-103). It remains the standard example in the 15th century, but starting in the 15th century, it is gradually displaced by the simpler example, “This saying is false” (Rezakhany 2018: 185–86, n. 12).

A “liar cycle” is introduced in the 14th century: today, someone says, “All that I say tomorrow is false”; tomorrow, he says, “All that I say yesterday is true”; these are the only two things he says today and tomorrow. This generates a paradox, since if what he says today is true, then what he says tomorrow is false, so what he says today is false; and likewise, if what he says today is false, what he says tomorrow is true, so what he says today is true. The unique today-tomorrow structure of this particular example is due to the fact that it is built upon an earlier example, of a man who puts himself into a moral quandary by saying, “I will lie tomorrow”, thereby managing (the argument goes) to do something both bad and good at the same time (Alwishah and Sanson 2026: 44-54).

In all of these forms, the Liar puts pressure on the view that truth and falsehood are contradictories. Perhaps the moral to be drawn is that they are not, because some sentences are both true and false, or some sentences are neither true nor false.

Few authors in the tradition are satisfied with that response. But they do have good systematic reasons to think that truth and falsehood are not contradictories. Most authors, following Avicenna and Aristotle, take falsehood to be the metathetic negation of truth (Hodges 2012). That is, to be false is to be non-true, rather than not true. This is understood to have two important consequences. First, truth and falsehood share a propriety condition: just as a pre-pubescent boy is neither bearded nor non-bearded, since beards are only proper to adult men, a question is neither true nor non-true, since truth is only proper to declaratives. Second, it implies that truth and falsehood share existential import. This is because “S is true” and “S is non-true” are both affirmative propositions, and the standard view is that affirmative propositions have existential import, while negative propositions do not (Parsons & Ciola 2025: sec. 5.3). So, both “S is true” and “S is non-true” are false when the subject term, “S”, is vacuous. For example, if Zayd says nothing, then the subject term, “What Zayd says” is vacuous. So both affirmative propositions, “What Zayd says is true” and “What Zayd says is false”, are false, and the corresponding negative propositions, “What Zayd says is not true” and “What Zayd says is not false”, are both true.

These two conditions imply that, strictly speaking, truth and falsehood are not contradictories, because non-declaratives are neither true nor false, and non-existent declaratives are neither true nor false. But when applied to existent declaratives, they remain exclusive and exhaustive, so this offers no immediate solution to the Liar, which appears to involve the application of truth and falsity to existent declaratives.

The Liar is not just a declarative, but a declarative that declares something about itself. This feeds into a well-entrenched logico-grammatical analysis of declaratives: each declarative is about one or more thing, and these things—the things picked out by the subject term—are called its “declared-abouts” (mukhbar ʿanhu). Several of the solutions make use of this conceptual distinction. One simple move is to restrict self-reference, asserting that no declarative can declare something about itself. Other proposals make more subtle use of the distinction.

2. The Early Period

There are three early historical threads that involve the Liar.

First, Yaḥyā ibn ʿAdī (d. 978) presents the Liar as a difficult sophism. He observes that the Liar is a declarative that declares something about itself, and so plays two distinct roles. He then argues that the Liar is false in the role of a declarative, because, in its role as the subject of a declarative it is neither true nor false.

Second, the Liar appears as one of a series of counterexamples to dualist views of good and evil. Each example involves someone telling the truth about lying. The first, from al-Naẓẓām (d. 845), is not the Liar Paradox. A later counterexample, due to al-Bāqillānī (d. 1013), is liar-like, but still not the actual paradox. It is only al-Baghdādī (d. 1037) who offers the Liar Paradox itself as a counterexample to dualism.

The third thread traces back to Aristotle. In his treatment of relativism, Aristotle points out that “Everything is false” is self-falsifying (Metaphysics IV 1012b19). Al-Fārābī (d. 950) and Fakhr al-Dīn al-Rāzī (d. 1209) both treat the same topic using similar examples. Al-Fārābī does not connect these examples to the Liar Paradox, but al-Rāzī does. Al-Kātibī writes a commentary on al-Rāzī, and it appears that his attempt to reconstruct al-Rāzī may have led him to develop his own proposed solution to the Liar.

2.1 Yaḥyā ibn ʿAdī: When Declaratives Stop Being Declaratives

Yaḥyā ibn ʿAdī was a Syriac Christian in Baghdād. He was a student of Abū Bishr Mattā (d. 940) and either a student or a peer of al-Fārābī. He is important as a translator and commentator upon Greek philosophical works. In his own time he was held in especially high regard as a logician (Endress 1977: 6).

In two closely related works defending the power of logic over grammar, he illustrates his claim, that logic can solve problems grammar cannot, with four examples, which he describes as “common problems raised by the sophists”. One of these four is the Liar. This places his discussion firmly within a broadly Hellenistic context, but it is not clear what specific Hellenistic sources he was relying on, if any.

Endress, citing Prantl, says that Ibn ʿAdī’s source for the Liar was Aristotle’s Sophistical Refutations 25, along with Alexander of Aphrodisias’s commentary on Sophistical Refutations (Prantl 1855: 1.50, n. 83; Endress 1977: 44). But Alexander’s commentary is now thought to be spurious (Ebbesen 1981: sec. III.4), and the traditional story tracing medieval Latin treatments of the Liar to Sophistical Refutations 25 has been called into question (Spade 1973).

Alexander does discuss the Liar briefly in his commentary on Topics II.7, arguing that “I lie” is not a proposition, because if it were, it would be both true and false (Alexander, onT2: 113, 188:4–189:10). Ibn ʿAdī says that he consulted Alexander’s commentary when writing his own commentary on Topics, but he also says that his copy was missing Alexander’s commentary on Book II (Endress 1977: 25). He also says he consulted Ammonius’s commentary on Topics. Unfortunately, Ammonius’s commentary is lost, so we do not know whether or not it contained discussion of the Liar.

As mentioned above, Ibn ʿAdī describes the Liar as a well-known “common problem”. This may suggest that in his time the Liar was the sort of thing that any educated logician would know about, but not by way of any specific textual sources.

Here is how he presents the paradox:

Tell us about he who says, “All my sayings are false”, if he has not spoken before, other than by declaring them all false. Do you judge his saying to be false or true? If you insist that it is true, then it must be false, and this necessarily entails that his saying is true and false together, and it is one saying. (Ibn ʿAdī, MT: 3B, 5)

The key to his solution is a curious claim about what happens when a declarative says something about a declarative:

If a declarative is posited as a declared-about, it ceases to be a declarative. (Ibn ʿAdī, MY: 202)

According to Ibn ʿAdī, this implies that the Liar is false. His reasoning relies on making a sharp distinction between the evaluation of the Liar in its role as a declarative and the Liar in its role as the subject of a declarative, that is, as a “declared-about”. Since a declarative ceases to be a declarative when posited as a “declared-about”, in its role as a “declared-about”, the Liar is not a declarative. And since it is not a declarative in that role, it is neither true nor false in that role. On the other hand, in its role as a declarative, the Liar claims that its “declared-about” is false. And, as we just saw, that “declared-about” is neither true nor false. So, in its role as a declarative, the Liar is false, because what it says about itself, in its role as a “declared-about”, is incorrect.

The idea that the same utterance can be evaluated in one way as a declarative and another as the subject of a declarative is puzzling. Does Ibn ʿAdī mean to suggest that the Liar is really two distinct utterances, not one? Or does he think that it is one utterance, playing two distinct semantic roles, and so must be evaluated separately in each of those roles? Unfortunately, he fails to say anything to clarify his position on this point.

He does offer a defense of his claim that declaratives cease to be declaratives when posited as declared-abouts:

This is something that can be explained by induction: if you say “Zayd is standing” is a declarative, and “ʿAmrū is running” is a declarative, and “Bread is beneficial” [is a declarative], you are not declaring, in all these sayings, that Zayd is standing, or that ʿAmrū is running, or that bread is beneficial, and this applies to all other declaratives. (Ibn ʿAdī, MY: 202)

As he says, the speaker who utters,

(1)

“Zayd is standing” is a declarative,

says “Zayd is standing” but does not declare it. So, assuming that a saying must be declared to be a declarative, “Zayd is standing” is not, as it occurs in this utterance, a declarative.

This assumption, that a saying must be declared or asserted to be a declarative, and the further assumption that a saying must be a declarative to have a truth value, are both standard Aristotelian doctrine. This is familiar to contemporary philosophy because of Frege’s argument against it. As Frege points out, the doctrine implies that the antecedent and consequent of a conditional, since they are not asserted, have no truth values, which gives rise to the so-called “Frege-Geach Problem” for Aristotelians (Geach 1965).

Even if the doctrine is granted, Ibn ʿAdī’s examples suggest a narrowly tailored principle that only covers cases in which a saying that has the grammar of a declarative is verbally displayed as the subject of another declarative without actually being declared. A Liar-adjacent example is,

(2)

“All my sayings are false” is false.

When a speaker utters (2), they say the words, “All my sayings are false”, but they do not, in saying those words also declare them. So Ibn ʿAdī’s analysis applies brilliantly to this case: “All my sayings are false” is not declared and so not a declarative, so neither true nor false, so (2) is false.

The analysis applies less brilliantly to the actual case under discussion:

(3)

All my sayings are false.

When a speaker utters (3) they also declare (3). And the “declared-about” of (3) is not the words uttered as grammatical subject, “All my sayings”, but the saying those words refer to, which is (3) itself. So in this case, the “declared-about” is declared, not just verbally displayed. It is hard to see why, in its role as a “declared-about”, the fact that it is declared should be canceled or ignored.

Ibn ʿAdī’s text is the earliest known treatment of the Liar in the Islamic world. Although Ibn ʿAdī’s Hellenistic sources are obscure, and nothing like his solution appears in surviving Hellenistic texts, he presents the paradox as a well-known sophism, suggesting that it was part of the inherited Hellenistic logical tradition he was working within. Later authors in the tradition defend structurally similar solutions which also depend on the distinction between the Liar as a declarative and as a “declared-about”. A similar distinction can be found in the Latin tradition, where the “distinguentes” attempt to solve the Liar by making a distinction between the speaker’s “exercised act” and “signified act” (Spade & Read 2009 [2021: sec. 2.3]) This may suggest that the use of some such distinction to solve the Liar is itself part of the inherited Hellenistic tradition.

But the most striking fact about Ibn ʿAdī’s solution in relation to the later tradition is that it seems to be completely ignored: nobody mentions him or the distinctive feature of his solution, the idea that a declarative ceases to be a declarative when it becomes a “declared-about”.

2.2 Al-Naẓẓām, al-Bāqillānī, al-Baghdādī: Good, Evil, and the Liar

Ibrāhīm al-Naẓẓām (d. 845) is an important Muʿtazilī theologian who worked in Baghdād roughly a century prior to Ibn ʿAdī. His counterexample to Manichaen and Bardaisan Dualism is the first in a series of counterexamples, eventually leading to the Liar.

The Dualists hold that there are two opposing cosmic principles, the Light and the Dark. As al-Naẓẓām interprets them, they also hold that each created agent is either a creature of the Light, who does only good, or a creature of the Dark, who does only evil. So there are no “mixed” agents—agents who do both good and evil. Al-Naẓẓām asks the Dualist,

What would you say about the man who says his saying is false? Who is the liar? (al-Khayyāṭ, KI: 28)

“The man who says his saying is false” suggests the Liar Paradox. Van Ess comments that “the argument is structured following the model of the sophism of the lying Cretan, but it does not need to be expressed quite so pointedly (van Ess 1991–97 [2018: 426])”. Miller says that al-Naẓẓām uses the Liar Paradox to refute the Dualists (Miller 1989: 173).

But al-Naẓẓām’s ensuing discussion makes it clear that what he has in mind is a man who tells a lie and then confesses, saying that his earlier saying is false. This not a paradox. But it is an example of a “mixed” agent: someone who does something evil (lying) and also does something good (telling the truth about his earlier lie).

After al-Naẓẓām, this sort of counterexample to Dualism became a popular trope. Al-Bāqillānī (d. 1013) asks the Dualist,

Tell us of someone who says, “I am dark”. Does this person belong to the individuals of the Light or the individuals of the Dark? (al-Bāqillānī, al-Tamhīd: 67)

As al-Bāqillānī points out, someone who says “I am dark” cannot be a creature of the dark—because then they would have told the truth, and creatures of the dark cannot tell the truth—. But also, they cannot be a creature of the light—because then they would have lied, and creatures of the light cannot lie. Structurally, this is not the Liar, but a “Knights and Knaves” puzzle (Goodman 1972; Smullyan 1978: 20ff; Zarepour 2025; Alwishah and Sanson 2026: 38–40).

Like al-Naẓẓām and al-Bāqillānī, Abū Manṣūr al-Baghdādī (d. 1037)—who, despite his eponym, spent most of his career working not in Baghdad but in Nishapur—offers a counterexample to Dualism that involves telling the truth about lying. But his example is the Liar Paradox:

There is no declarative that is both true and false together, except one: namely, the declaration by he who has not lied at all, about himself, that he is a liar. And this declarative, from him, is false. And a liar who declares about himself that he is a liar is truthful, and this single declarative is true and false, and the speaker is one. And this is a demonstration of the invalidity of the saying of the dualists, that the truth-teller cannot tell a lie. (al-Baghdādī, Uṣūl: 28)

His reasoning is not as clear as it could be, and may involve some equivocation on what is meant by “I am a liar”. He stipulates that the speaker has “not lied at all”. If “I am a liar” means “All my sayings are false”, then, as he says, a speaker who has not lied at all and says “I am a liar” thereby says something false. But on this interpretation of “I am a liar”, this does not establish that the speaker is a liar, as it only establishes that they sometimes lie, not that they always lie. So the claim that “a liar who declares about himself that he is a liar is truthful”, while correct, does not apply to this case.

Logical details aside, the most striking feature of al-Baghdādī’s treatment is his attitude toward the paradox itself. He accepts the conclusion that it is both true and false, and offers no reason to think that this is not a contradiction. His objection to the Dualists appears to be not just that they are unable to accommodate mixed agents, but that they are unable to accommodate true contradictions.

Al-Baghdādī connects this point to a point about the definition of the declarative: no declarative is true or false together, except this one. Writing much later, Sayf al-Dīn al-Āmidī (d. 1233), reports on debates among the Muʿtazilī about the definition of the declarative, and he mentions the Liar alongside another problematic example,

Muḥammad and Musaylima are truthful in declaring the prophecy. (al-Āmidī, Iḥkām: 2:250)

The putative trouble here is that Muḥammad is a true prophet but Musaylima is a false prophet, and if you say this is true, then you say both are true prophets, but if you say it is false, you say both are false prophets.

Al-Āmidī provides a detailed report of a wide range of responses to this example, and these responses can be found in earlier texts from al-Qādī ʿAbd al-Jabbār (d. 1024) and Abī ʿAbd Allāh al-Basṛī (d. 980). He reports no responses to the Liar, and no discussion of the Liar has been found in those earlier texts (Alwishah and Sanson 2009; Alwishah and Sanson 2026: ch. 2).

2.3 Al-Fārābī and al-Rāzī: From self-falsification to paradox?

Some positions are self-refuting. Plato famously argues that the opinion that every opinion is true is self-refuting, since it is his opinion that it is false (Theaetetus 170d–171c). Aristotle extends this point, giving several additional examples of self-refuting claims. One of his examples is the claim, “Everything is false”. This cannot be true, he argues, since if it were, it would be false (Metaphysics IV 1012b14–19).

It is possible to generate the Liar Paradox from this example, by stipulating that there is only one thing, namely, the claim, “Everything is false”. In this situation, the claim is both self-refuting and self-verifying. But neither Aristotle nor his Hellenistic commentators do this. The example is and remains an example of self-refutation or self-falsification, not an example used to generate the Liar Paradox.

Al-Fārābī’s treatment of the example follows this pattern. But in one place, the example he uses is not “Everything is false” or “Every saying is false”, but “the saying of he who says that all he says is incorrect (bāṭil)” (al-Fārābī, Sharḥ: 348). This is essentially the same as the example used by his contemporary Ibn ʿAdī to generate the Liar Paradox. But al-Fārābī does not make the paradox-inducing stipulation that this is the only thing the speaker ever says, and so does not generate the paradox.

It appears that Fakhr al-Dīn al-Rāzī’ (d. 1209) is the first to connect this topic with the Liar Paradox. Giving an example of a declarative that can be known to be false because it is self-refuting, he says,

Within this type is the saying of he who never lied at all, [and] says, “I am a liar”. This declarative is false. This is because he is saying the declared-abouts are false. These are either earlier declaratives, or this declarative. The first is incorrect (bāṭil), because these declaratives were not false, so his declaring of himself that he is lying in them is false. The second is incorrect, because the declarative about something is later in order than the declared-about. So if the declarative were made the same as the declared-about, that would entail that the thing is later in order than itself, and that is impossible. (al-Rāzī, al-Maḥṣūl: 4:291)

Notice that the initial example, “I am a liar”, is the same as al-Baghdādī’s, as is the putative paradox-generating stipulation that the speaker “never lied at all” prior to saying this.

Al-Rāzī says that there are two possible interpretations of “I am a liar”. On the first, it means “All my earlier declaratives are false”, and this is false, given the stipulation. On the second, it means “This declarative is false”. But this is also incorrect, he says, because the declarative must be “later in order” than the declared-about, so they cannot be the same.

Al-Rāzī’s use of ‘incorrect (bāṭil)’ leaves open room for two different interpretations. The most obvious way for a declarative to be incorrect is for it to be false, and that is exactly what happens on the first reading of “I am a liar”: it is incorrect because it is false. But on the second reading, he could mean that self-referential declaratives are incorrect because they are false, or he could mean that they are incorrect because they are defective.

Al-Rāzī’s topic—declaratives that are known to be false, not declaratives that are known to be false or otherwise defective–favors the first interpretation. One suggestion is that, since a declarative cannot declare something about itself, “This declarative is false” has a vacuous subject, and so, being an affirmative with a vacuous subject, is false (Alwishah and Sanson 2026: 66–67).

In another text on the same topic, al-Rāzī alters the example and takes it in a different direction:

[A declarative is known to be false] if it contradicts itself, as when one says, “All my sayings are false”. For on the assumption that it can be said that all his sayings at prior times were false, he was truthful in declaring that he was false. And on the assumption that he was saying this saying is false, he was truthful in some priors (al-Rāzī, al-Maʿālim: 138; see also Ibn Kammūna & al-Kātibī, CR: 245).

In this passage, the unambiguous “All my sayings are false” replaces the ambiguous “I am a liar”. Also, the stipulation that all the prior sayings are false is the proper stipulation needed to generate a paradox. But otherwise, the logic of the passage is difficult to parse.

On one interpretation, al-Rāzī offers a solution to the Liar based on the idea that it is false because it contradicts itself. This is how al-Kātibī reads the passage (Ibn Kammūna & al-Kātibī, CR: 245). On another interpretation, despite appearances, al-Rāzī is just making the old Aristotelian point, that “All my sayings are false” is self-refuting, and the passage is not actually about the Liar paradox at all (Alwishah & Sanson 2026: 117[special-character]119).

3. The 13th and 14th Centuries: A Conjunction of Two Contradictories

Prior to the 13th century, treatment of the Liar is spotty and isolated. In the 13th century, it becomes a standard example of an especially difficult fallacy, often referred to generically as “the problem of the conjunction of two contradictories”. Several authors take the problem up, offering competing solutions and expressing disagreement or agreement with each other.

This continues into the 14th century, which also sees a second development, as al-Taftāzānī draws a connection between the Liar and theological arguments against the view that good and evil can be judged by reason. As part of this, he introduces a Liar Cycle, based upon the theological example of a man who gets himself into a moral pickle by saying, “I will lie tomorrow”. As he points out, with just a few tweaks, the man lands himself in a logical pickle as well. Also, he gives the paradox a somewhat puzzling new name, widely adopted by the later tradition, calling it “the paradox of the irrational root”.

3.1 Al-Abharī and al-Kātibī: Self-contradiction

Thirteenth century engagement with the Liar begins with Najm al-Dīn al-Kātibī (d. 1276) and Athīr al-Dīn al-Abharī (d. 1258/1265). Al-Kātibī was al-Abharī’s student, though there is some evidence that they had a falling out. Across several texts, each presents and defends the same solution, neither ever mentioning the other (al-Abharī, KH: 217ff; KA: 382ff; TA: 183; al-Kātibī, JD: 683; SK: 130; Ibn Kammūna & al-Kātibī, CR: 245). Al-Ṭūsī, their contemporary and associate, criticizes al-Abharī’s solution without mentioning al-Kātibī. Al-Dawānī and al-Dashtakī criticize al-Kātibī’s solution without mentioning al-Abharī.

The basic idea, perhaps echoing al-Rāzī, is that the Liar is false because its truth implies a contradiction. By itself, this is not a solution. The Liar presents two competing arguments, one showing that its truth implies a contradiction, and the other showing that its falsehood does too. Solving the paradox is not a matter of picking sides, and deciding to accept the first and so reject to the second, or vice versa. (For this objection, see al-Dashtakī, rSJA: 31.)

But that is not what al-Abharī and al-Kātibī do. Instead, they try to leverage the first argument, using it to identify a fallacy in the second. They argue that, since the truth of the Liar is the conjunction of its truth and falsehood, its falsehood is the non-conjunction of its truth and falsehood. Here is al-Kātibī, from his commentary on al-Rāzī:

[The Liar’s] falsehood is determined after the affirmation of what its utterance signifies. And what its utterance signifies is that this saying is true and false. So its falsehood is the non-affirmation of this conjunction. (Ibn Kammūna & al-Kātibī, CR: 245)

They then use this to identify a fallacy in the second argument—the argument that the falsehood of the Liar implies that it is both true and false. This argument, they say, requires a fallacious inference from the negation of a conjunction to the negation of one of its conjuncts. So, something like this:

1. The Liar is false. (Assumption)
2. If so, it is not both true and false. (From (1), by the principle defended above)
3. If so, it is not false (A fallacious inference from (2))
4. If so, it is true.
5. If so, it is both true and false.

There are at least two problems with this suggestion.

First, while inferring the negation of a conjunct from the negation of a conjunction is a formal fallacy, it is not clear that the inference of (3) from (2) is invalid. When “p” and “q” are logically equivalent, “not p” and “not q” both follow from “not (p and q)”. Arguably, that is the case here, as the truth of the Liar implies its falsehood, and its falsehood implies its truth, so the two conjuncts are logically equivalent.

Second, the analysis does nothing to prove that every argument from false to true must proceed in this formally fallacious way. Here, for example, is another argument from false to true:

1. The Liar is false. (Assumption)
2. If so, things are as it says. (From (1), because the Liar says it is false)
3. If so, it is true. (From (2) and the general principle that a declarative is true when things are as it says)

Unfortunately, neither al-Abharī nor al-Kātibī directly address these objections.

Contemporary interpreters suggest reading al-Abharī and al-Kātibī through the lens of a cluster of 14th century Latin proposals defended by Thomas Bradwardine (d. 1349), John Buridan (d. 1358), and Albert of Saxony (d. 1390) (Alwishah & Sanson 2009, 2026; Zarepour 2021; Spade & Read 2009 [2021]: sec. 3.1). On this reading, it is not just that the truth of the Liar implies that it is both true and false; it is that this is what the Liar says or signifies.

On its face, declarative, “All my sayings at this moment are false”, says that it is false. The claim that it also says or signifies that it is true, and so says or signifies that it is both true and false, requires some further non-obvious principle about what sayings say or signify. One such principle is the principle that every declarative signifies that it is true, in addition to whatever it says on its face. Another is the principle that, in addition to what it says on its face, every declarative signifies everything that logically follows from what it says on its face.

Neither al-Abharī nor al-Kātibī explicitly endorse either principle. But they do say that the truth of the Liar is its truth and falsity, not just that it implies its truth and falsity. And, in one place, as quoted above, al-Kātibī says that the utterance of the Liar signifies that it is both true and false. These claims make sense if we interpret them as endorsing the more general principle that every declarative says, or signifies, its own truth. And that would also give them grounds for resisting the not just their preferred fallacious argument from false to true, but other arguments from false to true as well: from the fact that the Liar is false, all that follows is that things are partly how it says, which is not enough to establish that it is true.

3.2 Al-Ṭūsī: Truth, Correspondence, and Distinctness

Nasīr al-Dīn al-Ṭūsī (d. 1274) was a contemporary of al-Abharī and al-Kātibī, and the founding director of the Maragha observatory, where al-Kātibī also worked later in his career.

Al-Ṭūsī argues that the Liar has no truth value. He grants that it is a declarative, and so is the kind of saying that is apt to be true or false, but he argues that it cannot be true or false because it is self-referential. Truth, he says, requires a correspondence relation between a declarative and the things it is about, its “declared-abouts”. And falsehood requires a non-correspondence relation. But both relations, correspondence and non-correspondence, require distinct relata. So self-referential declaratives, like the Liar, cannot be true or false.

Others in the tradition argue that self-reference is impossible (see Section 2.3, Section 3.3, and Section 3.5). But al-Ṭūsī’s point is not that self-reference is impossible. Instead, he argues that when self-reference occurs, truth and falsity are impossible.

The claim that self-referential declaratives are neither true nor false conflicts with the standard definition of declaratives as sayings that are either true or false. Saʿad Ibn Mansūr Ibn Kammūna (d. 1284), a Jewish philosopher working in Baghdād, offers two responses to this objection on al-Ṭūsī’s behalf, though he never mentions al-Ṭūsī by name. In a fragment of his correspondence with al-Kātibī, he suggests that the mark of a declarative is not that it is true or false, but that it can be judged to be true or false (al-Dawānī, nkSJA: 119). Elsewhere, he suggests that falsehood is the simple negation of truth rather than its metathetic negation, so, while truth requires correspondence (and so distinct relata), falsehood does not require non-correspondence, and so does not require distinct relata. Instead, the absence of correspondence is enough to make the Liar false (Ibn Kammūna, al-Kāshif: 74–75).

Ibn al-Muṭahhar al-Ḥillī (d. 1325) endorses al-Ṭūsī’s solution (and, unlike Ibn Kammūna, attributes it to al-Ṭūsī). His only disagreement concerns the identification of the fallacy. Al-Ṭūsī says that the Liar involves a fallacy of “the misuse of the predicate”. Although later authors in the tradition get confused about this, this is Avicenna’s way of describing a fallacy secundum quid (see Avicenna, al-Shifāʾ: 21). Al-Ḥillī says that this is wrong, and it is instead the fallacy of accident, “taking what is an accident in place of what is an essence” (al-Ḥillī, Asrār: 233). Both fallacies involve a failure to recognize exceptions to a general rule—in this case, presumably, the general rule that a declarative must be either true or false. It is not clear why al-Ḥillī thinks this case is better described as a fallacy of accident than a fallacy secundum quid.

Al-Dawānī and al-Dashtakī raise the obvious objection, that not all self-referential declaratives are paradoxical, and many are clearly either true or false. For example, “This saying is composed” (that is, composed of words) is true, and “This saying is not composed” is false.

Al-Ṭūsī does not simply assert that correspondence and non-correspondence require distinct relata. He suggests that distinct relata are required to sustain the structure of opposition found between a declarative and its negation:

Upon investigation, truth and falsity apply to every declarative that is distinct from its declared-about, so that it is conceived that this declarative and a declarative opposite to it are standing on contrary sides, such that, if one of them corresponds to the declared-about, the other does not correspond to it, so that one of them is true and the other of them is false. […] However, if the declarative is the same as the declared-about, then truth and falsity are not conceived from it, for correspondence is not conceived except between two things, and the contrary [to correspondence] is not conceived [except between two things]. For if one thing is affirmed, then nothing is denied, and if one thing is denied, then nothing left to be affirmed is conceived. (al-Ṭūsī, Taʿdīl: 237)

One might be tempted to claim, contrary to al-Ṭūsī, that correspondence does not require distinct relata, and that, in fact, everything corresponds to itself. But notice that this entails that all self-referential declaratives are true: “This saying is composed” corresponds to itself, and so is true; but also, “This saying is not composed” corresponds to itself, and so also is true. This example is not quite the same as what al-Ṭūsī has in mind above. In his example, the second declarative is not the negation of the first, since “this saying” refers to different sayings in each case. Still, it is an example of the way that the structure of opposition between affirmation and negation, and truth and falsehood, threatens to break down in cases of self-correspondence, if we assume that everything corresponds to itself.

Al-Ṭūsī raises a related concern about self-correspondence, truth, and falsehood in the case of mathematical judgment. According to Avicenna, mathematical objects exist in the mind. Al-Ṭūsī argues that, if this were correct, then the truth of a mathematical judgment, like the judgment that 1 is half of 2, would consist in a correspondence between a mental relation and itself. That is because there would be no distinction between the mental relation that is the judgment, and the mental relation between 1 and 2 as they are in themselves. But this would imply, al-Ṭūsī argues, that all mathematical judgments are true, including the judgment that 2 is half of 1 (See Zarepour 2022; Erdt 2025; Spiker 2021; Ahmed 2022).

Al-Ṭūsī does not connect this argument with his solution to the Liar, but the connection is clear (see Qarāmaleki 2016; Motavalli & Qarāmaleki 2021; Alwishah & Sanson 2026: 125–128). In both cases, the worry is that allowing self-correspondence as truth would obliterate the opposition between truth and falsehood, by making everything true. In the mathematical case, al-Ṭūsī avoids the problem by insisting on distinct relata, rejecting Avicenna’s claim that mathematical objects exist as they are in themselves in the mind. Instead, they exist as they are in themselves outside the mind, in the universal active intellect. So the truth of mathematical judgment involves a correspondence relation between two distinct things: the judgment in the mind, and the thing itself outside the mind, in the universal active intellect. In the case of the Liar, self-reference cannot be avoided, so he concludes that it cannot be true or false.

The obvious objection remains: many self-referential declaratives are non-paradoxically true or false. But al-Ṭūsī’s restriction on self-referential truth is not an ad hoc restriction introduced to avoid paradox. It is grounded in systematic worries about the role correspondence and non-correspondence play in the theory of truth.

3.3 Al-Samarqandī: Dual Evaluations

Little is known about the life of the logician, theologian, and mathematician, Shams al-Dīn al-Samarqandī (d. 1322).

Like al-Rāzī, he points out that the Liar can be given a non-paradoxical reading. Specifically, when someone says, “All my sayings in this moment are false”, their intention determines exactly which sayings they are talking about. So if they only intend to include all the other things they say at the moment, there is no paradox. Moreover, since this is the only thing they say at that moment, there are no other things they say, so if they only intend to include those other things, “All my sayings” is vacuous, and “All my sayings at this moment are false”, as an affirmative proposition with a vacuous subject, is therefore false.

The paradox occurs when the speaker intends to include the Liar as one of the sayings they are talking about. In this case, al-Samarqandī says, “it is as if he spoke this saying, and then said again, ‘This saying is false’”. And so, “in this saying, he has conjoined two declaratives, each attached to the other”, one declaring the other to be false (al-Samarqandī, QAM: 646).

Granting this analysis, the paradox once again dissolves. When one declarative declares another to be false, if the first, the “declared-about”, is true, then the second, the “declarative”, is false, and if the first is false, the second is true. Either way, there is no contradiction, since truth and falsity are being applied to two different declaratives.

But, of course, even if, in the case of the Liar, it is in some sense “as if” the speaker uttered two declaratives, one declaring the other false, in fact he only uttered one. His shorter treatment, in his book, al-Qisṭās, offers no response to this objection. But in his longer autocommentary, Sharḥ al-Qisṭās, he argues that, since only one declarative is uttered, in effect the first declarative fails to exist, leaving just the second, which says of a non-existent declarative that it is false. Since the first declarative is fails to exist, the second, being an affirmative proposition with a vacuous subject, is false. (See Alwishah and Sanson 2026: 72–73) for translation and manuscript sources for Sharḥ al-Qisṭās).

One might object that the Liar says that it itself is false, not say that some other (existent or non-existent) declarative is false. This brings things back to al-Samarqandī’s “as if” claim. While he says that it is “as if” the speaker who utters the Liar utters two declaratives, his actual view appears to be that the speaker really does utter two declaratives—or, at least, really does need to utter two declaratives if they wish to avoid a vacuous subject. In support of this, he says that the predicate “false” plays two roles. In one role, it is part of a declarative that declares something. In the other role, it is part of a declarative that something is declared about. And he asserts, without further argument or explanation, that this entails that the speaker “has conjoined two declaratives, each attached to the other”. Unfortunately, he does not explain why these two roles must have distinct occupants.

3.4 Al-Taftāzānī: Voluntarism, Liar Cycles, and Irrational Roots

Saʿd al-Dīn al-Taftāzānī (d. 1392), is a prominent 14th century scholar, known for his work in linguistics, grammar, logic, and jurisprudence. His treatment of the Liar is something of an anomaly, occurring not in a work on logic but theology.

He is also responsible for giving the Liar an odd name, calling it, without further explanation, “the paradox of the irrational root (jadhr al-aṣamm)”. The label proved popular, and shows up in the titles of many later works, including al-Dawānī’s treatise on the Liar. Writing a century and a half after al-Taftāzānī, Kamāl al-Dīn al-Bukhārī (d. 1540) offers three speculative explanations for the label: first, that it is a reference to the idea that irrational roots, like the square root of 2, are unknowable; second, that ‘root (jadhr)’ can also mean “pull up from the root” and ‘irrational (aṣamm)’ can also mean ‘backbone’, so the Liar is so-called because it pulls the backbone of logic, the principle of non-contradiction, up from its root; third, that ‘root (jadhr)’ can also mean “source” and ‘irrational (aṣamm)’ can also mean ‘mute’ so the Liar is so-called because the person who came up with the puzzle was deaf. Al-Bukhārī confidently adds that this last explanation cannot be correct, because Ibn Kammūna is the source of the paradox, but he was not deaf (al-Bukhārī, al-Muntakhab: 315–316).

A more plausible speculation is that the name is a reference to one of the standard examples of an argument by reductio, the ancient proof that the diagonal of a square is incommensurable with its sides (Alwishah and Sanson 2026: 11; Aristotle Prior Analytics, bk 1, 41a22–37; Alexander, onPA: 41a26–37). That proof assumes that the diagonal is commensurable to a unit side, and shows that, if so, it would be both odd and even, just as, in the case of the Liar, we assume it is true or false, and show that, if so, it would be both true and false. And if we think of truth and falsehood as relations or ratios between a declarative and what it is about, we might describe the Liar as a declarative for which no such ratio exists, and so a declarative that is neither true nor false, just as the diagonal is neither odd nor even.

His solution appeals to the distinction between truth and falsity occurring as the content of a judgment, and truth and falsity occurring as properties or states of a judgment:

Truth and falsity, in the same way they are states for judgment, as affirmative and negative relations, required of all propositions, can [also] be a judgment. That is, what is judged is predicated of something indirectly, as when we say, this is true and that is false. And they are not contradictory to each other unless we consider them as two states for one judgment, or two judgments for one subject, as opposed to if we consider one of them as a state for judgment and the other as a judgment. (al-Taftāzānī, SM: 4:287)

This distinction applies to any predicate that applies to judgments: a judgment can be rash or measured, and it can also be judged to be rash or measured. In the first instance, rashness and being measured are “states of a judgment”; in the second, they are “judgments” made upon another judgement.

Suppose Zayd’s judgment is measured, and you judge it to be rash. As al-Taftāzānī says, there is no contradiction here. There is only a contradiction when the two contradictory properties occur both as states of the same judgment, or both as judgments on the same state. In the first case, there is a contradiction in the world—Zayd’s judgment is both rash and measured; in the second, there is a contradiction in your judgment—you judge Zayd’s judgment both to be rash and to be measured.

Described in these terms, the Liar is a judgment that has two possible states—truth and falsehood—and it is also a judgment that judges itself to have one of these two states, falsehood. This is not yet a contradiction: truth occurs as one of two possible states; falsehood occurs as a judgment. But a contradiction follows: if the Liar is true, the judgment that it is false is false, and so the Liar is false. And this is now a contradiction: the same judgment has both the state of truth and the state of falsehood. Likewise, if it is false, then the judgment that it is false is true, and so the Liar is true. Again, we have one judgment in two contradictory states.

But al-Taftāzānī does not think this is what happens. As he sees it, when we attempt to generate our contradiction, we start from an assumption about a state of the “original judgment”, then introduce a new judgment about that original judgment, and conclude that the new judgment has a contradictory state. For example, if we assume that the state of the Liar—the “original judgment”—is that it is false, we can then introduce a new judgment judging it to be false, and infer that this new judgment is true. In this case, both truth and falsity occur as states of different judgments, so there is no contradiction.

This is al-Samarqandī’s first solution re-described. The Liar is not one but two judgments (declaratives), one judging (declaring) the other to be false. So, if the first is true the second is false, and if the first is false the second is true, neither of which is a contradiction.

To his credit, al-Taftāzānī did not think highly of his own proposal. He says,

However, the correct judgment regarding this proposition is to give up on a solution and admit that we are unable to solve the paradox.

As mentioned above, al-Taftāzānī discusses the Liar in theological rather than logical context. His immediate concern is to show, against the Muʿtazilī, that good and evil are not “intrinsic” and cannot be judged by reason, but are instead grounded in divine command.

He rehearses several traditional arguments for this position, and many involve the ethics of lying. For example, reason judges that lying is always wrong, but it also judges that one must lie to the murderer at the door, which shows that reason cannot be used to judge good and evil without falling into confusion and contradiction (al-Taftāzānī, SM: 4:285).

Another argument involves the example of a man who says, “I will lie tomorrow”:

If goodness and badness are intrinsic, then this entails the conjunction of two contradictories, as in the case of the one who says, “I will lie tomorrow”. For either he is truthful, so his truth entails his goodness, and entailing the lie tomorrow, his badness; or he is a liar, so his lie entails his badness and entailing the truth tomorrow [entails] his goodness. And thus, it is possible to establish that there is a conjunction of two contradictories in the declarative, “I will lie tomorrow”. (al-Taftāzānī, SM: 4:286)

Once again, attempting to use reason to judge good and bad leads to contradiction. In this case, the contradiction is that someone who says “I will lie tomorrow” has done something that is both good and bad.

There are obvious objections to this argument. For present purposes, its interest lies in the fact that al-Taftāzānī connects the example to the Liar:

And this fallacy can be set up in such a way that truth and falsehood are conjoined in one saying, and thus goodness and badness are conjoined. For if we consider a proposition whose purport is to declare itself not to be true, then truth and falsehood are entailed in it, as when you say that the saying I now speak is not true, for its truth entails the absence of its truth and vice versa. (al-Taftāzānī, SM: 4:286–87)

Having done this, he then goes a step further, using the temporal structure of the original example to generate Liar cycle:

And this can be expressed in the form of “tomorrow” and “yesterday” sayings. For if one says that the saying I speak tomorrow is not true, or that nothing I say tomorrow is extrinsically true, and then tomorrow his only saying is, “The saying I spoke yesterday is true”, then the truth of either the “tomorrow” saying or the “yesterday” saying entails the absence of the truth in both cases, and vice versa. (al-Taftāzānī, SM: 4:287)

This is the first Liar cycle introduced into the tradition. It causes trouble for most of the prior solutions, including al-Taftāzānī’s own. But al-Taftāzānī does not seem to notice this. (For further discussion and reconstruction of al-Taftāzānī, see Alwishah and Sanson 2016; Daşdemir 2023b: 241–245; Alwishah and Sanson 2026: 43–52, 82–85.)

3.5 Al-Jurjānī: Self-reference and Speaker Intention

Al-Sharīf al-Jurjānī (d. 1413) was a celebrated grammarian and logician, working in Shiraz. His views about the Liar survive in the form two conflicting reports, one from al-Dashtakī and the other from al-Dawānī, both students of students al-Jurjānī, who treat him as a respected authority (Pourjavady 2011: 4, 9). It is possible that their conflicting reports have little to do with anything al-Jurjānī actually said, and simply reflect their attempts to position themselves in relation to his authority.

According to the first report, from al-Dashtakī, al-Jurjānī held that self-reference is impossible. So, when someone says, “All my sayings in this moment are false”, that very saying cannot be among the sayings they refer to. The report does not include any further information about what is taken to follow from this. Perhaps the upshot is that the “All my sayings in this moment” is vacuous, and so “All my sayings in this moment are false” is false.

According to al-Dawānī, self-reference is impossible in the case of demonstrative pronouns. When someone says, “Those men are walking”, for example, they must specifically intend each man referred to by “those men”. This requires a prior perceptual connection to each of those men, and so implies that each of those men must exist prior to becoming a referent. Likewise, then, someone who says, “Those declaratives are false”, cannot include that very declarative as one of the referents of the demonstrative pronoun, “those declaratives”. And, by the same token, someone who says, “This declarative is false”, cannot include that very declarative as the referent of “this declarative”, assuming “this declarative” here functions as a demonstrative pronoun.

Although al-Dawānī accepts this view of how demonstrative pronouns work, he does not accept it a view about how all reference works. Specifically, he rejects the idea that each referent of a universal terms like “All men” or “All my sayings at this moment”, must be specifically intended by the speaker. So, while this restriction on demonstrative self-reference might apply to “This declarative is false”, it does not apply to “All my sayings at this moment are false”.

The second report, from al-Dawānī, is second-hand, but he thinks it is more plausible and therefore more likely to reflect what al-Jurjānī actually held:

A declarative is a reference (ishāra) to the state of the thing it is about, and the reference to a thing cannot be a reference to this reference itself. Thus, the declarative itself cannot enter into the judgment that contains the declarative, hence the judgment does not include it, as if it were excluded. And it is not the point of this that it is not one things the declarative is about, nor that it is not one of its subjects, but rather that the reference is unable to include itself. (al-Dawānī, nkSJA: 118–19)

This is strikingly similar to al-Dawānī’s own view, though expressed in different terms.

4. The 15th Century

In the late fifteenth century, two scholars, Ṣadr al-Dīn al-Dashtakī (d. 1498) and Jalāl al-Dīn al-Dawānī (d. 1502), both working in Shiraz, engaged in extended debate over several interrelated topics, one of which was the Liar. This debate began in correspondence, continued in their competing glosses on al-Qūshjī’s commentary on al-Ṭūsī’s Tajrīd, and culminated in two freestanding treatises on the topic. At around the same time, or perhaps a bit earlier, an Ottoman scholar of uncertain identity defended his own solution to the Liar, responding primarily to al-Taftāzānī.

4.1 Ḫaṭībzāde (?): States, Judgments, and Self-Contradiction

A late 15th century work, attributed to both Ḫocazāde Muṣliḥuddīn Efendī (d. 1488) and Ḫaṭībzāde Muḥyiddīn Efendī (d. 1496), takes al-Taftāzānī as its jumping off point for a discussion of the Liar (Daşdemir 2023a, 2023b; Aydin 2014). As with al-Taftāzānī, the context is once again theological rather than logical, focused on arguments against the view that good and evil and are not intrinsic.

Following al-Taftāzānī, the author emphasizes the distinction between truth and falsehood as judgments versus truth and falsehood as states of judgments. He rejects al-Taftāzānī’s solution, and offers three different solutions of his own, all based on the idea that the Liar is not a declarative because it fails to have proper truth conditions.

First, he argues that no judgment can judge itself to be true or false. His argument depends on two key claims. One is the claim that the state of being true or false is “essentially distinct” from the judgment that has it:

[…] This state (truth or falsehood) is distinct from the judgment, essentially distinct, since its meaning is (in the case of truth) the correspondence of the judgment to reality, or (in the case of falsehood) its absence. (Ḫaṭībzāde [attrib.] , HMM: 227)

The other is the claim that, when a state is essentially distinct from a judgment, the judgment that something has that state is essentially distinct from the thing that has that state:

The judgment of a state of the thing that is essentially distinct from it is also essentially distinct from that thing, and this is clear. (Ḫaṭībzāde [attrib.], HMM: 227)

Together, these entail that no judgment can judge itself to be true or false.

On the basis of this argument, Daşdemir attributes to the author a blanket restriction on self-reference—no judgment can judge anything about itself—similar to restriction attributed to al-Jurjānī by al-Dashtakī (2023b: 245ff). But the first claim only establishes that the states of truth and falsehood are essentially distinct from the judgments that have them, so the argument only rules out a judgment that judges itself true or false. There is nothing here to suggest that a judgment cannot judge itself to be composed, or rash, or measured. The argument narrowly targets self-referential judgments of truth and falsity.

As for the Liar, the author concludes that, because it attempts to judge (or declare) itself to be true or false, and that is impossible, it not a judgment (or declarative) at all.

This solution is remarkably similar to al-Ṭūsī’s proposal. Al-Ṭūsī holds that a declarative can declare itself false, but such a declarative cannot be true or false, because truth and falsehood require correspondence and non-correspondence, which require distinct relata. This author holds that a declarative cannot declare itself false, because if it did, it could not be true or false, because truth and falsehood require correspondence and non-correspondence, which require distinct relata.

The author’s second solution is presented as a solution to al-Taftāzānī’s Liar Cycle. Here, the author relies on the claim that a declarative must be able to be actualized “with each of truth and falsity, one in lieu of the other (Ḫaṭībzāde [attrib.], HMM: 228)”. That is, to be a declarative, a saying must be able to be true without also being false, and vice versa. When our speaker says today, “My saying tomorrow is false”, and then says tomorrow, “My saying yesterday is true”, his saying today is true if false and false if true. That is, it cannot be true without also being false, and it cannot be false without also being true. So it is not a declarative.

On an alternate reading, the author instead holds that, to be a declarative, a saying must be able to be true and then false (Daşdemir 2023b: 253). This has the radical implication that all declaratives are temporally contingent “tensed” declaratives, true at one time and false at another, like “It is raining”.

The author’s third solution is appeals to the claim that no declarative can signify both an affirmative and a negative judgment about the same relation at the same time:

[These] two significations, namely, the signification of the affirmative judgment and the signification of the negative judgment, cannot be conjoined in one saying. (Ḫaṭībzāde [attrib.], HMM: 229)

For example, “Zayd is standing” signifies an affirmative judgment about the relation between Zayd and standing, while “Zayd is not standing” signifies a negative judgment about that same relation. But a declarative that does both at the same time is impossible. It is not clear what the author would say about the conjunction, “Zayd is and is not standing”, which is a contradiction but is not impossible to declare.

But this is what the Liar does, because it signifies both the affirmative judgment that it false, and the negative judgment that it is not false, because

the declarative that any proposition is false […] includes a declarative that the affirmative relation between the predicate and the subject of that proposition does not obtain. (Ḫaṭībzāde [attrib.], HMM: 229)

This looks similar to the solution defended by al-Abharī and al-Kātibī, who also hold that the Liar signifies a contradiction. But where they conclude that the Liar is false, this author concludes that the Liar fails to be a declarative.

4.2 Al-Dashtakī: Something Missing

According to al-Dashtakī, the Liar is one declarative that predicates falsehood twice. But, he argues, a declarative that predicates a truth value twice requires the existence of two declaratives. Since the person who speaks the Liar only actualizes one declarative, not two, this requirement is not met.

His argument that a declarative that predicates two truth predicates requires the existence of two declaratives begins with the point, familiar from Ibn ʿAdī, that a declarative that predicates truth or falsity of another declarative requires the existence of that other declarative:

Truth and falsehood require the actualization of the declarative to which they are attributed. If this declarative is actualized, then the attribution of one of them is correct, otherwise it is not. But if the declarative they are attributed to is missing, then it is not correct to attribute truth or falsehood to it. (rSJA: 55)

For example, if Zayd has not declared anything, and someone says, “Zayd’s declarative is false”, their declarative is not correct, because Zayd’s declarative does not exist.

Al-Dashtakī says that a declarative that violates this condition is “incorrect (bāṭil)”. As with al-Rāzī, this leaves open room for two different interpretations. He could mean that such declaratives are false (Alwishah and Sanson 2026: 89–90), or he could mean that they are semantically defective in some way. Zarepour suggests a proto-Frege interpretation: since the subject has no referent, the sentence as a whole has no truth-evaluable semantic content (2024: 12–13). On the first interpretation, al-Dashtakī’s position fits with the orthodox Aristotelian view that affirmatives with vacuous subjects are false. On the second, al-Dashtakī’s position represents a radical break from that tradition.

Either way, al-Dashtakī infers from this that a declarative that “considers truth or falsity twice” requires two declaratives:

This is if one considered truth and falsity once. However, if one considered them twice, then this requires two declaratives, as when you say “‘Zayd’s declarative is true’ is true” or “‘Zayd’s declarative is false’ is false”. So it is not sufficient for it to be correct that we have one declarative, rather it requires two declaratives to be actualized, one of them a declaring about something, and the second a judgment on this declarative, namely that it is true or false. (MH: 14)

He works through several of the relevant possibilities. For example, suppose Zayd declares something, but nobody declares “Zayd’s declarative is true”. In this case, regardless of what Zayd declared, it would be incorrect to attribute truth or falsehood to “Zayd’s declarative is true”, because it does not exist. So, both “‘Zayd’s declarative is true’ is true” and “‘Zayd’s declarative is true’ is false” are incorrect.

He does not explicitly consider the opposite case, where Zayd does not declare anything, but somebody declares “Zayd’s declarative is true” and somebody else declares “Zayd’s declarative is false”. In this case, the orthodox Aristotelian should infer that “Zayd’s declarative is true” is false, on the grounds that it has a vacuous subject. So “‘Zayd’s declarative is true’ is false” is correct, contrary to what al-Dashtakī claims. Likewise, “Zayd’s declarative is false” is also false, for the same reason. So “‘Zayd’s declarative is false’ is false” is also correct.

Zarepour’s proto-Fregean reading saves al-Dashtakī from this embarrassment. On that reading, since Zayd did not declare anything, both “Zayd’s declarative is true” and “Zayd’s declarative is false” lack truth-evaluable content, so both “‘Zayd’s declarative is true’ is false” and “‘Zayd’s declarative is false’ is false” lack truth-evaluable content as well.

El-Rouayheb offers a third interpretation (2020: 11; 2019: 101). As he understands al-Dashtakī, a declarative that considers truth or falsehood twice is structurally defective. In the non-defective case, Zayd declares something, someone declares “Zayd’s declarative is true”, and someone declares “’Zayd’s declarative is true” is false”. In the defective case, that second step is skipped. Instead, Zayd declares something, and someone attempts to apply both predicates, “is true” and “is false”, at once: “Zayd’s declarative is true is false”. The result is a structurally defective declarative, composed of a single subject and two predicates.

Finally, there is al-Dashtakī’s claim that the Liar “considers falsity twice”. In support of this, al-Dashtakī argues that when someone’s only saying in a given day is, “My sayings today are false”, the subject, “My sayings today”, picks out the saying, “My sayings today are false”, so the predicate, “is false”, is applied to “My sayings today are false”. In other words, it is “as if” the speaker said, “‘My sayings are false’ is false”, a declarative that considers falsehood twice (al-Dashtakī, rSJA: 56; al-Dawānī, nkSJA: 125). This recalls al-Samarqandī’s position, that the person who speaks the Liar “has conjoined two declaratives, each attached to the other”, but, in doing so, has only produced a single declarative, so one of the two conjoined declaratives fails to exist, rendering the other false.

4.3 Al-Dawānī: Fruitless Self-Imitation

Al-Dawānī argues that the Liar is not a declarative, and is not a truth-apt saying, because it fails to be an imitation (ḥikāya) of a relation in reality (nisba wāqiʿiyya).

He connects this proposal to a long-standing debate about the distinction between declarative and non-declarative sayings. By al-Dawānī’s time, this distinction was understood as a distinction between a declarative (khabar) and an inshāʾ (Firanescu 2009; Larcher 1990: 198ff). The word “inshāʾ” is often translated using Austin’s now-familiar neologism, “performative” (Austin 1961 [1979: 235ff]). But the root of “inshāʾ” is not about performance; it is about creation or construction. This is an important part of the theory: a declarative reports a fact; an inshāʾ constructs or creates a fact. So, following Austin's lead, “constructative” is a more apt neologism translating “inshāʾ”.

The debate has to do with sayings that are grammatically declarative, but are used in non-declarative ways. For example, “I sold (biʿtu)” is grammatically a simple past tense declarative, and it can be used this way, to report on a past sale. But it is also used as a constructative, as when an auctioneer says “Sold (biʿtu)!” When so used, its function is to create or execute a sale in the present, rather than to report on a sale in the past.

Al-Astarābādī (d. 1287) offers an explanation of how this works:

With respect to the constructative, “Sold!” there is no external that is intended to correspond to it; rather, the sale occurs in the present by this utterance, and this utterance brings it into existence. For this reason it is said that a constructative saying is not possibly true or false. And this is because the meaning of truth is the correspondence of the saying to the external, and falsehood the non-correspondence to it. For, if there is no external, how could there be correspondence or non-correspondence? (al-Astarābādī, SR: 4:12; Also see Larcher 1990: 199).

Al-Astarābādī explains the distinction by appeal to speaker intention: “there is no external that is intended to correspond to it”. Al-Dawānī rejects this, and explains the distinction by appeal to imitation. When the seller says, “Sold!”, he does not imitate an existing relation in reality; instead he creates a relation in reality. By contrast, when a speaker declares, “I sold”, he imitates a relation in reality, and so his declarative is true when it corresponds to the relation it imitates, and false when it does not.

To support his claims about imitation, al-Dawānī offers examples involving visual representation. A declarative is like a portrait, a painting painted in imitation of someone. Just as a good portrait resembles the person it imitates and a bad portrait fails to resemble the person it imitates, a true declarative corresponds to the fact it imitates, while a false declarative fails to correspond to the fact it imitates.

A constructative, on the other hand, is not an imitation of any fact. It is like a painting that is not a portrait—an image that the artist makes up, not in imitation of anyone or anything. Any similarity to actual persons or facts is coincidental, and not grounds for judging the painting good or bad, or the constructative true or false.

Al-Dawānī extends this analogy to argue that self-imitation is impossible:

An aspect of this imitation is that the imitated is determined in reality without regard to the imitation. For if you say to a painter, “Paint an image that imitates this image itself”, your sentence is fruitless. For if the thing is not determined first, the imitation of it would not be established, and this is necessary. (al-Dawānī, nkSJA: 134)

This is his diagnosis of both the Liar and the Truthteller (“This saying is true”):

Perhaps you understand from this discussion that if one says, “My saying is true”, referring to this same saying, this is not a declarative at all, even if it is in a form of a declarative, because of the lack of imitation, which requires the distinctness of the imitation and the imitated. (al-Dawānī, STM: 173–74)

From this, it would appear to follow that he thinks that all self-imitation is impossible. But, when objecting to al-Ṭūsī, he clearly insists that some self-referential declaratives are non-paradoxically true or false, like “This saying is composed” and “This saying is not composed”. Al-Dashtakī accuses al-Dawānī of inconsistency here. Daşdemir agrees, arguing that, for the sake of consistency, al-Dawānī ought to have held that no self-referential declarative is truth-apt (2023b: 258).

The analogy to paintings is suggestive. But it leaves room for interpretation. Why exacty should we think that self-imitation of the sort is al-Dawānī describes is impossible?

One interpretation focuses the attention of the argument on what it is to be a “relation in reality (nisba wāqiʿiyya)”. On this interpretation, a “relation in reality” is a independent fact, and the problem with cases of self-imitation is that there is no properly independent fact to be imitated. (Rezakhany 2018; El-Rouayheb 2020; 2019: 104). Rezakhany (2018: 190–95) offers the most detailed development and defense of this interpretation. While he initially suggests that a relation in reality must be mind-independent, the criteria that he ultimately appeals to is utterance-independence. When someone says, “This saying is false”, there is no prior relation between that saying and falsehood, so no utterance-independent fact to be imitated. Since there is no utterance-independent fact to be imitated, the saying cannot be true or false. This dovetails nicely with al-Astarābādī, who, in the case of “Sold!”, connects the utterance-dependence of the sale with the claim that there is “no external” fact for it to correspond to.

This interpretation is also supported by what al-Dawānī himself says in response to al-Dashtakī, about the difference between “This saying is false” and “This saying is composed”:

The difference is clear, as we drew your attention to [earlier]. For the intellect finds it self-evident that there is a relation in reality between this saying and composition, in contrast with this saying and truth and falsehood. (al-Dawānī, nkSJA: 145)

Here he clearly states that in the one case, there is a relation in reality, while in the other, there is not. This strongly suggests that when self-imitation is impossible, this is because of the non-existence of a relation in reality.

He also says that this difference is self-evident, but it is not. A saying does not exist unless and until it is uttered, and it is composed of the words that are uttered as it is uttered. So it is hard to see how the relation between the saying and its composition exists in an utterance-independent way. Rezkahany suggests that al-Dawānī might instead have in mind the conceptual or definitional relation between being a saying and being composed, a relation that does plausibly hold independent of any specific utterance (Rezakhany 2018: 202). But it is not clear that such a relation is enough to make “This saying is composed” true. And it is not clear how to extend this suggestion to other examples, like “This saying is composed of seven words”, or “This saying is uttered by a philosopher”.

An alternative interpretation focuses attention on imitation itself, rather than the status of the would-be imitated relation. On this interpretation, the problematic cases of self-imitation are cases where what is being imitated is the imitation itself (Alwishah and Sanson 2026: ch. 7). There are many ways that a painting can imitate itself. For example, a painting can depict itself set on an easel, in a studio, being painted by an artist. So an artist can paint a painting that imitates itself by placing herself and her canvas in front a mirror, and painting what she sees in the mirror. The kind of trouble al-Dawānī describes—the fruitless attempt at self-imitation—only arises when the question of what to paint cannot be settled by what the artist sees in the mirror. In this situation, the artist can continue to paint, but she is no longer painting an imitation; she is now making something up.

Plausibly, non-semantic predicates like “composed” and “uttered by a philosopher” attribute features that a saying either has or does not have independent of its attempt to imitate anything, and so independent of its attempt to imitate itself. By contrast, predicates like “true” and “false” attribute features that cannot be settled independently of the imitation itself.

Al-Dawānī extends his solution to cover al-Taftāzānī’s Liar Cycles. There, he argues that, even if each declarative in the cycle imitates a relation that is independent of itself, the chain of imitation relations is fruitless and empty, because it never reaches an independent ground. On a reading that centers the utterance-independence of relations in reality, the thought is that, while each declarative in the cycle corresponds to a relation that is independent of its own utterance, collectively, their truth conditions fail to reach any relations in reality that are independent of their collective utterance. On a reading that emphasizes the limits of self-imitation, the idea is that the chain of imitation relations never reaches an imitation-independent ground.

5. Conclusion

Research into work on the Liar after al-Dawānī is on-going.

The generation of scholars who came immediately after al-Dashtakī and al-Dawānī continued to discuss the topic. Al-Dashtakī’s son, Ghiyāth al-Dīn Dashtakī (d. 1542) wrote his own treatise on the Liar (TG; see El-Rouayheb 2019: 106 for discussion), as did Shams al-Dīn Muḥammad al-Khafrī (d. 1535-6), a student of both al-Dawānī and the elder al-Dashtakī (Qarāmaleki 2013). El-Rouayheb (2019) reports treatments of the Liar from Mīr Fakhr al-Dīn al-Astarābādī (d. 1577), al-Shūshtarī (d. 1610), Mīr Dāmād (d. 1631), al-Khwānsārī (d. 1687) (see also Qarāmaleki 1997: 77–89), al-Bihārī (d. 1707), al-Ilāhābādī (circa 1700), Qāḍī Mubārak (d. 1749), al-Lakhnawī (d. 1784), and al-Shuwayhī (early 1800s), and reports more generally the Liar was widely discussed within the Indo-Muslim tradition, and to a lesser degree within the Ottoman tradition. Rezakhany (2018) contains useful discussion of the Liar in Mīr Zāhid al-Harawī (d. 1689), Qāḍī Mubārak (d. 1748), and Mullā Mubīn (d. 1810).

The conceptual similarity between Ibn ʿAdī and al-Samarqandī and the Latin distinguentes tradition has already been noted, as has the similarity between al-Abharī, al-Kātibī, and Bradwardine and his followers. Comparisons to contemporary solutions to the Liar have also been suggested. Qarāmaleki (2014) sees in al-Dashtakī’s use of iterated truth predicates an echo of Tarski’s theory of truth. Alwishah and Sanson (2026) suggest a comparison between al-Dawānī’s solution and contemporary “grounding” solutions, as defended and articulated by Herzberger (1970) and Kripke (1975).

Bibliography

Translations

Most of the works discussed in this article are only just becoming available in English translation. Alwishah and Sanson (2026) contains a complete translation of al-Dawānī’s Final Word, along with translations of all the passages discussed in this article.

Primary Texts

• al-Abharī, Athīr al-Dīn, [KH] Kashf al-Ḥaqāʾiq fi taḥrīr al-daqāʾiq, Hüseyin Sarıoğlu (ed.), Istanbul: Çantay Kitabevi, 2001
• –––, [KA] Khilāṣat al-afkār wa naqāwat al-asrār, Mahdī ʿAzimī and Hāshim Qurbānī (eds), Tehran: Iranian Institute of Philosophy, 2018.
• –––, [TA] Tanzīl al-afkār fī taʿdīl al-asrār, Muḥammad ʿAbd al-Ḥammīd (ed.), Masters Thesis, Egypt: University of Minia, 2020.
• Alexander of Aphrodisias, [onPA] On Aristotle’s “Prior Analytics 1.23–31”, Ian Mueller (trans.), Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 2006. Reprinted London: Bloomsbury Academic, 2014.
• –––, [onT2] On Aristotle, Topics 2, Laura Maria Castelli (trans.), London: Bloomsbury Academic, 2020.
• al-Āmidī, Sayf al-Dīn, [Iḥkām] Al-Iḥkām fī uṣūl al-aḥkām, ʿA. Ibrāhīm (ed). Vol. 2, Beirut: Dār al-Kutub al-ʿilmiyya, n.d.
• Aristotle, Aristotle’s Metaphysics: Books Γ, Δ, and Ε, Christopher Kirwan (trans.), Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1971.
• –––, On Sophistical Refutations, E. S. Forster (trans.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1955.
• –––, Prior Analytics. Book 1 (Clarendon Aristotle Series), Gisela Striker (trans.), Oxford/New York: Clarendon Press, 2009.
• al-Astarābādī, Raḍī al-Dīn, [SR] Sharḥ al-Raḍī ʿalā kāfiya, Yūsuf Ḥasan ʿUmar (ed.), Vol. 4, Benghazi: Manshurāt Jāmiʿat Qāryūnis, 1996.
• Avicenna, [al-Shifāʾ] al-Shifāʾ: al-Safsaṭa, A. al-Ahwānī (ed.), Cairo: al-Maṭbaʿa al-Amīriyya, 1958.
• al-Baghdādī, ʿAbd al-Qāhir, [Uṣūl] Uṣūl al-dīn, Ahmed Shams al-Dīn (ed.), Beirut: Dār al-Kutb al-ʿilmiyya, 2002.
• al-Bāqillānī, Abū Bakr, Al-Tamhīd. Richard al-Yasūʿī (ed.), Beirut: al-Maktaba al-Sharqiyya, 1957.
• al-Bukhārī, [al-Muntakhab] “Al-Muntakhab min Sharḥ risālat al-mughālaṭāt”, in 12 Treatises on the Liar Paradox in Shirāz School, Aḥad Qarāmaliki (ed.), Tehran: Iranian Institute of Philosophy, 315–323, 2007.
• al-Dashtakī, Ghiyāth al-Dīn, [TG] “Tajrīd al-Ghawāshī fī Shubhat Jidhr al-Aṣamm”, in 12 Treatises on the Liar Paradox in Shirāz School, Aḥad Qarāmaliki (ed.), Tehran: Iranian Institute of Philosophy, 159–261, 2007.
• al-Dashtakī, Ṣadr al-Dīn, [MH] “Al-Muntakhab min ḥāshiyatihi ʿalā al-Sharḥ al-jadīd li-al-tajrīd”, in 12 Treatises on the Liar Paradox in Shirāz School, Aḥad Qarāmaliki (ed.), Tehran: Iranian Institute of Philosophy, 3–15, 2007.
• –––, [rSJA] “Risāla fī ḥall shubhat jadhr aṣamm”, in 12 Treatises on the Liar Paradox in Shirāz School, Aḥad Qarāmaliki (ed.), Tehran: Iranian Institute of Philosophy, 27–62, 2007. An English translation is available as “Treatise on the Problem of the Liar’s Paradox”, in Anthology of Philosophy in Persia, Volume 5: From the School of Shiraz to the Twentieth Century, Majid Fakhry (trans.), Seyyed Hossein Nasr and Mehdi Aminrazavi (eds), London: I.B. Tauris Publishers, 2015.
• al-Dawānī, Jalāl al-Dīn, [nkSJA] “Nihāyat al-kalām fī ḥall shubhat jadhr al-aṣamm”, in 12 Treatises on the Liar Paradox in Shirāz School, Aḥad Qarāmaliki (ed.), Tehran: Iranian Institute of Philosophy, 101–155, 2007.
• –––, [STM] “Sharḥ Tahdhīb al-manṭiq”, in Sharḥā al-muḥaqiq al-Dawānī wa al-Mullā ʿAbd Allāh al-Yazdī ʿalā Tahdhīb al-manṭq, ʿAbd al-Naṣīr al- Milyabārī (ed.), Kuwait: Dār al-Ḍiyāʾ, 91–204, 2014.
• al-Fārābī, Abū Naṣr, [Sharḥ] “Sharḥ al-Qiyās”, in Al-Manṭiqiyyāt, Vol. 2, Muḥammad Taqī Dānishpazuh (ed.), Qum: Manshurāt al-Marʿashī, al-Najafī, 263–553, 1987–89.
• Ḫaṭībzāde [attrib.], [HMM] “Ḥall Al-Maghlaṭa Al-Musammāt Bi-l-Jadhr Al-Aṣamm”, Yusuf Dasdemir (trans./ed.), in Theories of Paradox in the Middle Ages (Studies in Logic 99), Stephen Read and Barbara Bartocci (eds), Cambridge: College Publications, 224–234 (part of ch. 9), 2023.
• al-Ḥillī, Ibn al-Muṭahhar, [Asrār] Asrār al-khafiyya fī al-ʿulūm al-ʿaqliyya, Markaz al-Abḥāth wa-al-Dirāsāt al-Islāmiyya (ed.), Qom: Muʾassasat Būstān al-Kitāb, 2000.
• Ibn ʿAdī, Yaḥyā, [MY] Maqālāt Yaḥyā Ibn ʿAdī al-falsafiyya, S. Khalīfāt (ed.), ʿAmān: Jordan University, 1988.
• –––, [MT] “Maqāla fī tabyīn faḍl sịnāʿat al-mantịq bi-waṣf̣ baʿḍ mā yufīduhū ahlahā min al-quwā al-muʿjiza li-sāʾir al-ṣināʿāt al-kalāmīyya siwāhā”, in A Safavid Anthology of Classical Arabic Philosophy. Facsimile Edition of MS Madrasah-i Marvī 19, Robert Wisnovsky (ed.), ms. 5–6, Tehran and Montreal: Markaz-i Dāʾirat al-maʿārif-I buzurg-i islāmī—Intishārāt-I kitab-i rayzān and McGill Institute of Islamic Studies, 2017.
• Ibn Kammūna, Saʿd ibn Manṣūr, [al-Kāshif] al-Kāshif (al-Jadīd fī al-ḥikma), Ḥāmid Aṣfahānī (ed.), Tehran: mu’ssa pashuhashti hikmat wa falsafat, 2008.
• Ibn Kammūna, Saʿd ibn Manṣūr and Najm al-Dīn al- Kātibī, [CR] Critical Remarks by Najm Al-Dīn Al-Kātibī on the Al-Maʿālim by Fakhr Al-Dīn Al-Rāzī, Together with the Commentaries by ʿIzz Al-Dawla Ibn Kammūna, Sabine Schmidtke and Reza Pourjavady (eds), Tehran: Iranian Institute of Philosophy & Institute of Islamic Studies, Free University of Berlin, 2007.
• al-Kātibī, Najm al-Dīn, [SK] Sharḥ Kashf al-asrār ʿan ghāwāmiḍ al-afkār, Anwar Shāhīn (ed.), n.p., 2019. (This edition is useful but lacks critical apparatus.)
• –––, [JD] Jāmiʿ al-daqāʾiq fī kashf al-ḥaqāʾiq, ʿA. Ismāʿīl and R. Rabīʿ (eds), Kuwait: Dār al- Ḍiyāʾ, 2023.
• al-Khayyāṭ, Abū al-Husayn, [KI] Kitāb al intiṣār: le livre du triomphe et de la réfutation d’ibn al Rawandi l’hérétique, Albert N. Nader (trans.), Beirut: Éditions Les Lettres Orientales, 1957.
• Plato, Platonis Opera I: Euthyphro, Apologia, Crito, Phaedo, Cratylus, Theaetetus, Sophista, Politicus, Oxford Classical Text, E.A. Duke, W.F. Hicken, W.S.M. Nicoll, D.B. Robinson, and J.C.G. Strachan (eds.), Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1995.
• Qarāmaleki, Aḥad, 2007, 12 Treatises on the Liar Paradox in Shirāz School, Tehran: Iranian Institute of Philosophy.
• al-Rāzī, Fakhr al-Dīn, [al-Maʿālim] Al-Maʿālim fī ʾuṣūl al-fiqh, ʿĀdil ʿAbd al-Mawjūd and ʿAlī Muʿawaḍ (eds), Cairo: Mukhtār lil-Nashr wa Tawzīʿ al-Kitāb, 1994.
• –––, [al-Maḥṣūl] Al-Maḥṣūl fī ʿlm uṣūl al-fiqh, Volume 4, Ṭā-hā al-ʿAlwānī (ed.), Cairo: Dār al-Salām, 2011.
• al-Samarqandī, Shams al-Dīn, [QAM] Qisṭās al-afkār fī al-manṭiq, A. Falāḥī (ed.), Muassasah-i Pizhūhishī-i Ḥikmat va Falsafah-i Īrān, 2020.
• al-Taftāzānī, Saʿd al-Dīn, [SM] Sharḥ al-Maqāṣid, Volume 4, Umayra ʿAbd al-Raḥmān (ed.), second edition, Beirut: ʿĀlam al-Kitāb, 1998.
• al-Ṭūsī, Naṣīr al-Dīn, [Taʿdīl] “Taʿdīl al-miʿyār fī naqd tanzīl al-afkār”, in Collected Texts and Papers on Logic and Language, Mehdi Mohaghegh and Toshihiko Izutsu (ed.), Tehran: Institute of Islamic Studies 139–248, 1974.

Other References

• Ahmed, Asad Q., 2022, Palimpsests of Themselves: Logic and Commentary in Postclassical Muslim South Asia (Berkeley Series in Postclassical Islamic Scholarship 5), Oakland, CA: University of California Press.
• Alwishah, Ahmed and David Sanson, 2009, “The Early Arabic Liar: The Liar Paradox in the Islamic World from the Mid-Ninth to the Mid-Thirteenth Centuries CE”, Vivarium, 47(1): 97–127. doi:10.1163/156853408X345909a
• –––, 2026, The Final Word: Al-Dawani and the Liar Paradox in the Islamic World, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780197609941.001.0001
• Austin, J. L., 1961 [1979], “Performative Utterances”, first appeared in Philosophical Papers, J. O. Urmson and G. J. Warnock (eds), first edition, Oxford University Press. Reprinted in the third edition, 1979, 233–252. doi:10.1093/019283021X.003.0010
• Aydin, Mehmet, 2014, “The liar paradox in the Islamic thought and the treatise called ‘Hallu Maglatat’l-Musammati Bi’l-Cazri’l-asamm’ of Hadjazada Bursawi”, İlahiyatt Fakultesi Dergisi, 40(2): 167–213.
• Barnes, Jonathan, 2007, Truth, Etc: Six Lectures on Ancient Logic, Oxford: Clarendon Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780199568178.001.0001
• Barwise, Jon and John Etchemendy, 1987, The Liar: An Essay on Truth and Circularity, New York: Oxford University Press.
• Daşdemir, Yusufa, 2023a, “A Fifteenth-Century Ottoman Treatise on the Liar Paradox: A Case for Ḫaṭībzāde’s Authorship”, in Theories of Paradox in the Middle Ages (Studies in Logic 99), Stephen Read and Barbara Bartocci (eds), Rickmansworth, UK: College Publications, 204–238 (ch. 9).
• –––, 2023b, “A Fifteenth-Century Ottoman Solution to the Liar Paradox by Ḫaṭībzāde Muḥyiddīn”, Arabic Sciences and Philosophy, 33(2): 237–263. doi:10.1017/S0957423923000048
• Ebbesen, Sten, 1981, Commentators and Commentaries on Aristotle’s Sophistici Elenchi: A Study of Post-Aristotelian Ancient and Medieval Writings on Fallacies, Leiden: E.J. Brill.
• El-Rouayheb, Khaled, 2019, The Development of Arabic Logic (1200–1800) (Medieval and Early Modern Philosophy 2), Basel: Schwabe Verlag.
• –––, 2020, “The Liar Paradox in Fifteenth-Century Shiraz: The Exchange between Ṣadr al-Dīn al-Dashtakī and Jalāl al-Dīn al-Dawānī”, British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 28(2): 251–275. doi:10.1080/09608788.2019.1616156
• Endress, Gerhard, 1977, The Works of Yaḥyā Ibn ‘Adī: An Analytical Inventory, Wiesbaden: Reichert.
• Erdt, Agnieszka, 2025, “A Third Realm Ontology? Naṣīr al-Dīn Ṭūsī and the Nafs al-Amr”, British Journal for the History of Philosophy, 33(3): 435–459. doi:10.1080/09608788.2024.2369136
• Ess, Josef van, 1991–1997 [2018], Theologie und Gesellschaft im 2. und 3. Jahrhundert Hidschra: eine Geschichte des religiösen Denkens im frühen Islam, 6 volumes, Berlin: Walter de Gruyter. Part translated as Theology And Society In The Second And Third Centuries Of The Hijra: A History of Religious Thought in Early Islam, Volume 3, Gwendolin Goldbloom (trans), Leiden: Brill, 2018.
• Firanescu, Daniela Rodica, 2009, “Speech Acts”, Encyclopedia of Arabic Language and Linguistics, Volume 4: Q–Z, Kees Versteegh (ed.), Leiden: Brill, 328–334.
• Geach, Peter T., 1965, “Assertion”, The Philosophical Review, 74(4): 449–465. doi:10.2307/2183123
• Goodman, Nelson, 1972, “The Truth-Tellers and the Liars”, in his Problems and Projects, Indianapolis, IN: Bobbs-Merrill, 449–451.
• Herzberger, Hans G., 1970, “Paradoxes of Grounding in Semantics”, The Journal of Philosophy, 67(6): 145–167. doi:10.2307/2023885
• Hodges, Wilfrid, 2012, “Affirmative and Negative in Ibn Sīnā”, in Insolubles and Consequences: Essays in Honour of Stephen Read (Tributes 18), Catarina Dutilh Novaes and Ole Thomassen Hjortland (eds), Rickmansworth, UK: College Publications, 119–134.
• Kripke, Saul, 1975, “Outline of a Theory of Truth”, The Journal of Philosophy, 72(19): 690–716. doi:10.2307/2024634
• Larcher, Pierre, 1990, “Eléments Pragmatiques Dans La Théorie Grammaticale Arabe Post-Classique”, in Studies in the History of Arabic Grammar II, Kees Versteegh and Michael G. Carter (eds), Amsterdam: John Benjamins Publishing Company, 195–214. doi:10.1075/sihols.56.16lar
• Miller, Larry B., 1989, “A Brief History of the Liar Paradox”, in Of Scholars, Savants, and Their Texts  Studies in Philosophy and Religious Thought; Essays in Honor of Arthur Hyman, Ruth Link-Salinger (ed.), New York: Peter Lang, 173–182 (ch. 16).
• Motavalli, Morteza and Ahad Qaramaleki, 2021, “Nasīr Ad-Dīn al-Tūsī’s Theory of Truth; the Analysis”, Journal of Religious Thought: A Quarterly Journal of Shiraz University, 21(1): 99–114.
• Parsons, Terence and Graziana Ciola, 2025, “The Traditional Square of Opposition”, in The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2025), Edward N. Zalta and Uri Nodelman (eds), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2025/entries/square/>.
• Pourjavady, Reza, 2011, Philosophy in Early Safavid Iran: Najm al-Dīn Maḥmūd al-Nayrīzī and His Writings (Islamic Philosophy, Theology, and Science: Texts and Studies 82), Leiden: Brill. doi:10.1163/ej.9789004191730.i-224
• Prantl, Carl, 1855, Geschichte der Logik im Abendlande, Leipzig: Verlag von S. Hirzel.
• Qarāmaleki, Aḥad Faramarz, 1997, “Āqā Ḥusayn Khwānsārī Va Muʿammā-Yi Jadhr-i Aṣamm”, Khirādnāme-Yi Ṣadrā (Sadra Islamic Philosophy Research Institute, Tehran), 10: 77–89.
• –––, 2013, “The Liar’s Paradox and Shamsuddin Mohammad Khofari’s Solution”, Journal of Religious Thought: A Quarterly Journal of Shiraz University, 11: 33–43.
• –––, 2014, “The Liar Paradox in Shīrāz Philosophical School”, Ishraq: Islamic Philosophy Yearbook (Moscow), 5: 41–52.
• –––, 2016, “Argument of the Facts of Nafs Al-Amri and the Mystery of the Root of Asm”, Articles and Reviews (University of Tehran, Faculty of Theology and Islamic Studies), 62: 59–69.
• Rezakhany, Hassan John, 2018, “Jalāl Ad-Dīn Ad-Dawānī’s Solution to the Liar Paradox and Its Reception in Qāḍī Mubārak and Mullā Mubīn”, Journal of South Asian Intellectual History, 1(2): 183–220. doi:10.1163/25425552-12340007
• Sanson, David and Ahmed Alwishah, 2016, “Al-Taftāzānī on the Liar Paradox”, in Oxford Studies in Medieval Philosophy, Volume 4, Robert Pasnau (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 100–124. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780198786368.003.0005
• Smullyan, Raymond M., 1978, What Is the Name of This Book? The Riddle of Dracula and Other Logical Puzzles, Englewood Cliffs, NJ: Prentice-Hall.
• Spade, Paul Vincent, 1973, “The Origins of the Mediaeval Insolubilia Literature”, Franciscan Studies, 33: 292–309.
• Spade, Paul Vincent and Stephen Read, 2009 [2021], “Insolubles”, in The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Winter 2021), Edward N. Zalta and Uri Nodelman (eds), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/win2021/entries/insolubles/>.
• Spiker, Hasan, 2021, Things as They Are: Nafs al-Amr and the Metaphysical Foundations of Objective Truth, Abu Dhabi, UAE: Tabah Research.
• Zarepour, Mohammad Saleh, 2021, “Abharī’s Solution to the Liar Paradox: A Logical Analysis”, History and Philosophy of Logic, 42(1): 1–16. doi:10.1080/01445340.2020.1793291
• –––, 2022, “Arabic and Islamic Philosophy of Mathematics”, in The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2022), Edward N. Zalta (ed.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2022/entries/arabic-islamic-phil-math/>.
• –––, 2024, “Dashtakī’s Solution to the Liar Paradox: A Synthesis of the Earlier Solutions Proposed by Ṭūsī and Samarqandī”, History and Philosophy of Logic, 45(3): 219–245. doi:10.1080/01445340.2023.2210918
• –––, 2025, “‘I Am Darkness’: On Liar-Style Anti-Dualist Arguments in Kalām”, History and Philosophy of Logic: 1–12. doi:10.1080/01445340.2025.2549617

Academic Tools

	How to cite this entry.
	Preview the PDF version of this entry at the Friends of the SEP Society.
	Look up topics and thinkers related to this entry at the Internet Philosophy Ontology Project (InPhO).
	Enhanced bibliography for this entry at PhilPapers, with links to its database.

Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

Related Entries

al-Farabi | al-Farabi: philosophy of logic and language | al-Razi, Fakhr al-Din | Arabic and Islamic Philosophy, disciplines in: philosophy of language and logic | Arabic and Islamic Philosophy, disciplines in: philosophy of mathematics | assertion | Ibn Kammūna | insolubles [= insolubilia] | liar paradox | logic: ancient | medieval philosophy | self-reference | speech acts | truth | voluntarism, theological