Wisdom in Contemporary Analytic Philosophy

First published Thu Jul 2, 2026

What is wisdom? Despite receiving less attention than other epistemic goods in contemporary analytic epistemology, wisdom is affirmed by philosophers across different traditions and cultures as the highest epistemic good. Such philosophers include the Christian thinkers Boethius and Anselm, the Muslim thinkers Avicenna and Averroes, and the Jewish philosopher Maimonides (O’Grady 2019: 416). This entry provides a general overview of the discussion of wisdom in contemporary analytic philosophy, although literature outside that field and outside the field of philosophy is also touched on. The overview we provide is not intended to capture the many interesting and important approaches to wisdom found in other fields of inquiry. Rather, this entry will examine (1) the relationship between wisdom and virtue; (2) the domain of wisdom, or, to put it differently, what it is that the wise person understands; and (3) whether the wise person lives well.

1. Wisdom and Virtue

Wisdom is widely considered to be an especially important form of human excellence. But what is the nature of this apparent virtue, and, assuming it is a virtue, how does it connect to, or guide, the other virtues? Is wisdom a purely practical virtue or is it, at least in part, a theoretical or intellectual virtue?

The Stoics, for example, maintained that wisdom is virtue, whereas Confucius (Analects 6.22) holds wisdom to be a virtue. While they disagree about the nature of wisdom and its relationship to other virtues, Aristotle and Plato agree that wisdom is the highest form of human virtue. In what follows, we present different and competing views on the relationship between virtue and wisdom. Although we find some of these views more plausible than others, we attempt to maintain a degree of neutrality in our discussion of these views. The question to begin our investigation of the nature of wisdom is which virtues particularly contribute to wisdom or characterize the nature of a wise person?

1.1 Socratic Wisdom

Socrates is perhaps the paradigmatic example of the wise person in Western culture, and understanding a Socratic conception of wisdom is useful for our discussion as it informs contemporary accounts of wisdom. Socrates’ view of wisdom, as expressed by Plato in the Apology (20e–23c), is sometimes interpreted as an example of a humility theory of wisdom (Sharon Ryan 1996 and Whitcomb 2011). In Plato’s Apology, Socrates and his friend Chaerephon visit the oracle at Delphi. As the story goes, Chaerephon asks the oracle whether anyone is wiser than Socrates. The oracle’s answer is that no one is wiser than Socrates. Socrates reports that he is puzzled by this answer since so many other people in the community are well known for their extensive knowledge and wisdom, and yet Socrates claims that he lacks knowledge and wisdom. Socrates does an investigation to get to the bottom of this puzzle. He interrogates a series of politicians, poets, and craftsmen. As one would expect, Socrates’ investigation reveals that those who claim to have abundant knowledge either do not really know any of the things they claim to know, or else they know far less than they claim to know. The most knowledgeable of the bunch, the craftsmen, know about their craft, but they also claim to know things far beyond the scope of their expertise. Socrates, so we are told, neither suffers the vice of claiming to know things he does not know, nor the vice of claiming to have wisdom when he does not have wisdom. In this revelation, we have a potential resolution to the wisdom puzzle in The Apology.

Although the story may initially appear to deliver a clear theory of wisdom, it is actually quite difficult to capture a textually accurate and plausible theory here. How should we understand this form of human excellence that makes Socrates stand out? One interpretation is that Socrates is wise because he, unlike the others, believes he is not wise, whereas the poets, politicians, and craftsmen arrogantly and falsely believe they are wise. A simple way to state this theory is as follows:

  • Socratic Humility Theory (SH): A person is wise to the extent that they believe they are not wise.

This is a tempting interpretation because Socrates certainly thinks he has shown that the epistemically arrogant poets, politicians, and craftsmen either lack wisdom or have far less of it than they think they have. Moreover, Socrates claims that he is not wise, and yet, if we trust the oracle, Socrates is actually the wisest person. Does this contrast in humility, however, provide a satisfactory account of the virtue of wisdom?

As we noted, it is quite challenging to extract a textually accurate and philosophically satisfying theory of wisdom from this section of The Apology. While there are many interesting alternative interpretations of a theory of wisdom in The Apology, we will not take them all up in this entry. However, we will point out that even if (SH) is an acceptable interpretation of the view of wisdom offered in The Apology, it does not provide us with an adequate understanding of the nature of wisdom for various reasons. Many people who firmly believe they are not wise are correct in their self-assessment. Thus, the belief that one is not wise is not, all by itself, an important signifier of wisdom. Furthermore, having the belief that one is wise plausibly does not, in itself, affect a person’s status as a wise person. Nor does it guarantee the vice of arrogance. In fact, we don’t have good reason to think that a belief that one is wise and intellectual humility are at odds. What’s more, plausibly the wise person has to have a solid belief in their wisdom, at least relative to their community, in order to take on the responsibility of the sort of role that the wise person often plays across different cultures, that of giving advice to others.

(SH) focused on believing one is not wise, but perhaps a form of humility about knowledge, or an especially valuable form of knowledge, would be a better interpretation of Socrates. After all, when Socrates demonstrates that a person is not wise, he does so by showing that the person lacks some knowledge that they claim to possess. Moreover, throughout Plato’s Socratic dialogues, Socrates is especially concerned with getting things right with respect to important philosophical questions, the examination of which he considers fundamental to a life worth living – what is justice?, what is virtue?, what is wisdom?, what is the nature of reality?, what is the ideal state, and so on. Thus, Socrates’ view might be better captured by focusing on the idea that wise people do not believe they know the answers to the most important and perplexing philosophical questions. This alternative statement of what the Socratic puzzle tells us about wisdom is:

(SH*)
A person is wise to the extent that they do not believe they know the answers to the most important and perplexing philosophical questions.

We will put aside any attempt to define what counts as “important”, “perplexing”, and “philosophical”, and simply understand those to include the questions of Plato’s dialogues. While perhaps an interesting interpretation of Socrates’ view of wisdom in The Apology, (SH*) is both too permissive and likely too restrictive. An honest person who is just beginning to delve into the big questions of philosophy, for example, might admit that they do not know any of the answers. That admission would not, all by itself, constitute the human excellence required for wisdom. It might be too restrictive, because an extremely wise person might come to know, and believe that they know, the answers to the most perplexing of life’s big questions. An additional problem is that, if we accept the commonly held view among philosophers that wisdom provides guidance to living well, then intellectual humility will not be enough to make a person wise.

Before moving away from Socrates, we note that other virtues do play an important role in the discussion of wisdom in Plato’s Apology. Courage, for example, is another important virtue that Socrates models in The Apology. Socrates has the courage to examine carefully both his own beliefs and commitments as well as the popular and entrenched positions and practices of others. He has the courage to express the truth even when the truth he shares directly challenges authority. He has the courage to follow the logic of an argument to its conclusion even when the destination is uncomfortably surprising, and he has the courage to do what he regards to be the right thing even when that ultimately leads to his death.

1.2 Wisdom Grounded In Virtue

While (SH) and (SH*), two of many interesting ways to flesh out a Socratic humility theory of wisdom, are not adequate as theories of wisdom, there is noticeable agreement in the history of philosophy and across traditions that some form of intellectual humility is one of the virtues that is central to the disposition of the wise person. In both the Confucian Analects (2.17) and the Daodejing (chapter 71), we learn that knowing one’s own ignorance involves wisdom (Ni 2017: 107). In the Confucian Analects, a wise person’s recognition of limitations informs their political participation (Morrow & Shane Ryan 2023). Similarly, Shane Ryan and Karyn Lai (2021) argue that on a Zhuangzian approach to wisdom, intellectual humility plays an important role in enabling openly engaging with the world.

Perhaps all of the virtues contribute toward the development of wisdom, but the contributions of several stand out in the literature. Beyond being intellectually humble and courageous, virtues exemplified by Socrates, wise people open their minds and hearts and take reasonable alternative points of view into consideration. Indeed, the virtue of open-mindedness is widely held to be essential for wisdom (Baehr 2011; Shane Ryan 2025; Sharon Ryan 2021; Taylor 2016; Zagzebski 1996). In addition to engaging with an open-minded disposition, wise people possess the virtue of imagination. They are characteristically capable of imagining alternative ideas, points of view, and solutions that the unwise often miss.

Wise people are characteristically empathetic and are able to compassionately and insightfully appreciate the perspectives from which others view the world (Hursthouse 2006; Tiberius 2008; Shane Ryan & Sharon Ryan 2025). Rosalind Hursthouse (2006: 299), who underscores the importance of rich life experience that informs an understanding of others and the risks and benefits associated with different courses of action in her Neo-Aristotelian view of wisdom, observes that among other virtues the practically wise

have a perceptual capacity, “perceptiveness” or “sensitivity”, to see or hear that, despite a smiling front, others are hurt, embarrassed, uncertain, angry, frightened, worried, or that their apparent shiftiness or brazenness is no more than embarrassment, that their expression of gratitude, though awkward, is genuine, or….

Valerie Tiberius (2008), who defends a theory of wisdom with several elements of virtue at its core, points out that wise people are notoriously reflective and introspective. They courageously and honestly reflect on how their lives are going and critically assess the extent to which they are living up to their own standards and values for what it takes to live a good life. When reflection exposes a tension between one’s values and one’s life, the person on the right path to wisdom sees the tension and makes appropriate adjustments. One who has achieved a healthy degree of wisdom is living a life that is in harmony with their considered values and principles about the good life. In a similar vein, Rosalind Hursthouse (2006: 307) notes that the wise person will reflect on their

life as a whole and how our competing and perhaps incommensurable concerns can be encompassed within the realization of the ideal life of virtuous activity at which we are aiming.

They know how to appropriately discern the important costs and benefits of actions, accurately predict the good for oneself and others, and are motivated to do the right thing. The necessity of this sophisticated virtue of reflective discernment is why Hursthouse (2006) and Aristotle (Nicomachean Ethics, Book 6.113) believe the development of wisdom rests upon significant life experience.

Psychologists studying wisdom have also identified reflection as playing a key role in the development of wisdom or perceptions of wisdom. Work by notable contributors to the study of wisdom in psychology, for example, Ardelt (2003, 2004) and Glück and Bluck (2011, 2013) emphasizes this. Swartwood (2013, 2020), Stichter (2024) and Tsai (2023, 2024) engage with the psychological literature on wisdom. Jason Swartwood (2013, 2020), who also identifies reflection as a key component of wisdom, has more recently expressed some skepticism about psychologists’ attempts to measure wisdom. He argues that what psychologists are measuring is different from (practical) wisdom as understood by philosophers. Swartwood (2013: 513) contends that as wisdom is a normative ideal, empirical research by itself cannot give us an adequate account of it.

Plato (Republic) and Aristotle (Nicomachean Ethics) viewed wisdom as the most important virtue that guides all of the other virtues. Plato identified four cardinal virtues: Wisdom, Courage, Temperance, and Justice. Wisdom is the rational guiding virtue that directs the other virtues to succeed in achieving the good life or a just society. For Aristotle, practical wisdom, or phronesis, is the virtue that helps us figure out what to do when we are in situations in which we might otherwise experience practical or moral quandaries where different virtues seem to support conflicting courses of action. For example, courage and temperance or humility might seem to conflict. Wisdom is the ruling virtue that guides us to know, or see (McDowell 1979 [1998]), what we ought to do in such circumstances.

When considering the development of virtues like wisdom, some philosophers such as Aristotle, defend the unity of the virtues thesis, essentially the view that one can’t have one virtue fully without having all the other virtues fully. Others defend more modest positions such as the view that the human excellence of wisdom is built on other human excellences, with some such excellences playing a more important role than others (Russell 2009).

The Stoics, again, thought wisdom is virtue. And virtue, for the Stoics, is “right reason” (Stobaeus, Anthology 5b10, Inwood and Gerson 1997). Through disciplined practice, the Stoic sage achieves a deep understanding of reality/nature and appreciates the extent to which things are, or are not, within our power (Epictetus, Discourses 4.1.128–131). The goal, according to Stoicism, of those who seek wisdom is to figure out how to live in accordance with nature (Zeno, On the Nature of Man, Book 1 and Chrysippus, On Goals, 1.88, Inwood and Gerson 1997). This depth of understanding distinguishes the sage from the rest of us. “He knows infallibly what should be done in each situation of life and takes every step to do it at the right time and in the right way” (Long 1974: 205). For the Stoics, a wise person exhibits appropriate emotional and intellectual responses to their experiences. They avoid destructive emotional reactions which are largely caused by failing to appreciate what we can control (Epictetus, The Encheiridion 8,14). The Stoics aren’t alone in drawing attention to the relationship between wisdom and emotion. In the contemporary discussion, both Sharon Ryan (2012) and Cheng-hung Tsai (2024) claim that the wise person’s emotions are rational in certain respects, while Stichter (2024) discusses emotional regulation as a function of wisdom. In a different vein, though still considering the relationship between wisdom and emotion, Jason Baehr (2019) makes the case that suffering in the humble person can contribute to such a person gaining wisdom.

Within the vast literature on wisdom, we find many intellectual, social, and moral virtues that are plausibly connected to what it takes to be a wise person. The list of virtues we note is not meant to be exhaustive, but it is meant to showcase some of the most important and most commonly cited virtues associated with wisdom. But our understanding of wisdom needs to go beyond the significant virtues embodied by the wise person. Focusing on the model of a wise person as someone to go to for advice in difficult circumstances, we see the wise person is someone who, in addition to possessing virtue, has a deep grasp on what really matters with respect to the vicissitudes of life. In the next section, we focus on the nature of the deep and comprehensive epistemic grasp possessed by the wise person and the subject matter on which the wise person exhibits a special form of expertise. In other words, what is the epistemic stance of wisdom and what subject matter is in the domain of wisdom?

2. The Domain of Wisdom

Previously we discussed the relationship between wisdom and virtue. This discussion concerned the character of the wise person and so told us about their dispositions. Now we’re going to shift our focus to wisdom as an epistemic good, which doesn’t rule out wisdom as a virtue, as well as the content of wisdom.

Wisdom could be a distinctive kind of epistemic good or it could be a familiar kind of epistemic good with a distinctive content. Knowing and understanding are typically thought to be distinctive epistemic goods, though some epistemologists argue that understanding is reducible to knowing (Ross 2020 and Sliwa 2015). In any case, there is a consensus among theorists that the wise person is doing well epistemically with regard to living well, for example, Grimm (2015), Nozick (1989), Plato (The Apology), Garrett (1996), Kekes (1983), Shane Ryan (2016), Sharon Ryan (1999), and Tiberius (2008). There is disagreement, however, regarding what doing well epistemically amounts to ultimately.

Epistemologists have tended to provide accounts of wisdom that explicitly present wisdom, at least primarily, as a kind of justified believing (Sharon Ryan 2012), knowing (Grimm 2015), or understanding (Shane Ryan 2016). Motivations for favoring understanding over propositional knowledge (and know how) are the dynamic grasp that understanding entails, and, relatedly, the thought that testimonial knowledge about how to live well would be epistemically inadequate both to be wise and to be able to play the social role of the wise person.

There are disagreements, as well, about what it is that the wise person understands or knows that distinguishes them from the rest of us. Although giving an account of what it means to do well epistemically with regard to living well may prove as difficult a topic as providing an account of wisdom, Nozick provides an illuminating start.

Wisdom is not just one type of knowledge, but diverse. What a wise person needs to know and understand constitutes a varied list: the most important goals and values of life—the ultimate goal, if there is one; what means will reach these goals without too great a cost; what kinds of dangers threaten the achieving of these goals; how to recognize and avoid or minimize these dangers; what different types of human beings are like in their actions and motives (as this presents dangers or opportunities); what is not possible or feasible to achieve (or avoid); how to tell what is appropriate when; knowing when certain goals are sufficiently achieved; what limitations are unavoidable and how to accept them; how to improve oneself and one’s relationships with others or society; knowing what the true and unapparent value of various things is; when to take a long-term view; knowing the variety and obduracy of facts, institutions, and human nature; understanding what one’s real motives are; how to cope and deal with the major tragedies and dilemmas of life, and with the major good things too. (Nozick 1989: 269)

Aristotle also gives us a description of doing well epistemically with regard to living well but also holds that this is not the only type of wisdom. Aristotle famously distinguishes practical wisdom from theoretical wisdom. From Book VI of the Nicomachean Ethics:

This is why we say Anaxagoras, Thales, and men like them have philosophic but not practical wisdom, when we see them ignorant of what is to their own advantage, and why we say that they know things that are remarkable, admirable, difficult, and divine, but useless; viz. because it is not human goods they seek. (EN vi.7 1141b)

Knowledge of contingent facts that are useful to living well is required in Aristotle’s practical wisdom. According to Aristotle,

Now it is thought to be the mark of a man of practical wisdom to be able to deliberate well about what is good and expedient for himself, not in some particular respect, e.g. about what sorts of thing conduce to health or to strength, but about what sorts of thing conduce to the good life in general. (EN vi.5 1140a–1140b)

Wisdom, in general, many philosophers would argue, requires practical knowledge about living. What Aristotle calls theoretical wisdom, many would contend, is not wisdom at all. Aristotle’s theoretical wisdom is merely extensive knowledge or deep understanding. Nicholas Maxwell (1984), in his argument to revolutionize education, argues that we should be teaching for wisdom, which he sharply distinguishes from standard academic knowledge. Similar points are raised by Robert Sternberg (2001) and Andrew Norman (1996). Robert Nozick holds a view very similar to Aristotle’s theory of practical wisdom, but Nozick is trying to capture the essence of wisdom, period. He is not trying to define one, alternative, kind of wisdom. And, John Kekes (1983: 280) maintains that, “What a wise man knows, therefore, is how to construct a pattern that, given the human situation, is likely to lead to a good life”. More recently, Valerie Tiberius (2008) has developed a practical view that connects wisdom with well-being, requiring, among other things, that a wise person live the sort of life that he or she could sincerely endorse upon reflection.

Some philosophers, perhaps inspired by Aristotle’s distinction, have offered reasons why the wise person must also do well epistemically with respect to valuable academic subjects. A further point of disagreement in the literature, then, is whether the wise person, aside from doing well epistemically with regard to living well, is also doing well epistemically with respect to anything else. Sharon Ryan (2012) and Dennis Whitcomb (2011), broadly agreeing, both answer in the affirmative.

In the preface of his Principles of Philosophy, Descartes insisted upon factual knowledge as an important component of wisdom. Descartes wrote,

It is really only God alone who has Perfect Wisdom, that is to say, who has a complete knowledge of the truth of all things; but it may be said that men have more wisdom or less according as they have more or less knowledge of the most important truths. (Descartes 1647 [1911: 204])

Of course, among those important truths, one might claim, are truths about living well, as well as knowledge in academic subject areas.

Sharon Ryan (2012) raises the concern that if the wise person just needs to do well epistemically with respect to living well, then we would have an overly permissive account of wisdom. In other words, the account would predict that more people are wise, say on the basis that they have justified beliefs about how to live well, who in fact are not wise. Sharon Ryan believes that the inclusion of the requirement that the wise person is also doing well with respect to valuable academic subjects suitably raises the bar. However, since so much of what was long ago considered knowledge has been abandoned, or has evolved, a theory that requires truth (through a knowledge condition) would exclude almost all people who are now long dead, including Hypatia, Socrates, Confucius, Aristotle, Homer, Zhuangzi, etc. from the list of the wise. Bad epistemic luck, and having lived in the past or living in a community today without access to a modern education, should not count against being wise. But, since truth is a necessary condition for knowledge, bad epistemic luck is sufficient to undermine a claim to knowledge. Therefore, Ryan (2012) argues that a theory of wisdom that focuses on having rational or epistemically justified beliefs about living well and academic subject matter, rather than the higher standard of actually having knowledge, would be more promising.

Whitcomb (2011), engaging with but ultimately not accepting Aristotle’s approach, similarly defends the inclusion of valuable academic subjects in the domain of wisdom. He offers the following thought experiment in support of his views. Suppose two agents were doing equally well epistemically with respect to living well, but one was doing better epistemically with respect to a valuable academic subject. Wouldn’t it be intuitive to suppose that the agent who is doing better epistemically with respect to the academic subject is wiser than the agent who is otherwise the same epistemically?

Shane Ryan (2016) challenges both justifications for including valuable academic subjects in the domain of wisdom. First, he argues against Sharon Ryan’s claim that inclusion of valuable academic subjects in the domain of wisdom avoids an overly permissive account of wisdom. A stronger epistemic requirement than justified belief will do that anyway, and so the rationale for including valuable academic subjects is removed. Shane Ryan also challenges Whitcomb’s grounds for including valuable academic subjects. He denies that it is really intuitive that someone who is doing a bit better epistemically with respect to, say, chemistry is wiser. Furthermore, he makes the case that thinking that the core feature of wisdom is doing well epistemically with respect to living well makes sense of our pre-theoretic intuition that the wise person is the sort of person who can give good advice. In fact, Shane Ryan claims that it is conceivable that there were wise people in the distant past and there are others alive today who didn’t have the benefit of a modern education, and hence had little knowledge of modern physics, chemistry, and so on.

Here it is also worth noting a few conciliatory moves that can be made between the theorists who hold that the domain of wisdom includes valuable academic subjects and those who deny the claim. Grimm (2015) also rejects the claim that the wise person must be doing well epistemically with respect to valuable academic subjects, at least in so far as this is conceived as independent from living well. However, Grimm distinguishes being wise as a person, a more holistic property that a person may have, from being wise as a mechanic, botanist, scientist, and so on – in fact, this move echoes a similar move in Sharon Ryan (1999). This move may go some way to account for the intuitions of scholars such as Whitcomb. With Grimm’s move, we can suggest that there is a sense in which a person can be wise that is not exhausted by doing well epistemically with regard to living well, albeit in a way that is derivative of being wise as a person.

A further conciliatory point that we get from Grimm is that doing well epistemically with regard to valuable academic subjects may contribute to wisdom in so far as such knowledge is instrumentally important for doing well epistemically with regard to living well. While, again, the position remains that it is doing well epistemically with regard to living well that determines wisdom, this move from Grimm may be seen as recognizing the importance of knowledge of valuable academic subjects in a way that may satisfy scholars sympathetic to the views of Sharon Ryan and Whitcomb.

One final move that can perhaps do something similar is proposed by Shane Ryan (2016, 2021), whose account is developed through close engagement with Sharon Ryan’s (2012) account of wisdom. Sharon Ryan proposes a condition for wisdom that Shane Ryan endorses with some modifications. The crucial part of Sharon Ryan’s condition for our purposes is that the wise person has very few unjustified beliefs. Shane Ryan’s version states that the wise person believes, in all but a few cases, as it is epistemically appropriate for them to do so, where this includes suspending belief. The upshot of this move is that it can’t be the case that many of an agent’s beliefs, including beliefs that have valuable academic subjects as their domain, are epistemically inappropriate. This move then goes some way towards supporting the view that doing well epistemically with regard to valuable academic subjects, albeit with respect to the evidence available to the agent, is important given that not doing so in a significant enough way would exclude the possibility of an agent being wise. The move is essentially motivated by the thought that the wise person should be an all-round good epistemic agent. As such, the proposed condition could perhaps be replaced with a sort of background condition for wisdom that requires that the wise person is an intellectually virtuous agent. This would give us a contemporary account that not only recognizes the contribution of virtue to wisdom, and so can directly draw on the discussions detailed in section one, but also the necessity of the virtues for wisdom.

Understanding “Living Well”

Having discussed whether the domain of wisdom includes both living well and valuable academic subjects or just living well, as well as how these views might be conciliated, let us return now to the point of relative consensus in the literature, living well is in the domain of wisdom. Nevertheless, this point of agreement may mask some possible differences on this issue. An issue is to unpack, however, what is meant by living well.

If we think that the wise person is doing well epistemically with regard to living well, we may think that this just means that the wise person is doing well epistemically with respect to the correct theory of well-being: they understand or know how to live well where this knowledge or understanding is of hedonism, desire-fulfillment theory, value-fulfillment theory, objective list theory, or whatever the correct theory of well-being is.

Such a position, however, is unsatisfactory for a number of reasons. First, discussions of theories of the good life tend to focus on which good or goods are ultimately valuable or non-instrumentally valuable for well-being. For example, for the hedonist it is, depending on the version, pleasure or enjoyment that is ultimately valuable for well-being with other goods such as friendship, wealth, and health only being of instrumental significance.

Nevertheless, if we retain the conception of the wise person as the sort of person who it is good to go to for advice about what to do in difficult life situations (Whitcomb 2011), it seems implausible that the focus of their knowledge or understanding will be on which good is of ultimate value for living well. After all, they won’t be in a good position to give advice if they can just say what is ultimately valuable for well-being and not have insight as to the concrete steps someone should take to improve their lives. The wise person needs to do more than to know or understand the correct theory of well-being.

If we regard the debate about what falls into the domain of wisdom as tracking Aristotle’s distinction between theoretical wisdom (sophia) and practical wisdom (phronesis), then we may follow Aristotle with respect to how to think about living well. In other words, Aristotle’s discussion of phronesis can help us understand what it is that the wise person has. Possession of phronesis implies good judgment as to what to do across a wide variety of situations. Even accounts of well-being that pay more attention to how instrumentally valuable goods relate to ultimately valuable goods don’t encompass everything that the wise person needs to understand or know about living well.

Although Aristotle distinguishes virtue from skill, see Stichter (2016) for a discussion, skills-based approaches seem an obvious successor to Aristotle’s account of phronesis. Swartwood (2013) defends the position that “practical wisdom is the intellectual virtue that enables a person to make reliably good decisions about how, all-things-considered, to live” (Swartwood 2013: 511). On his expert skill model, wisdom is analogous to expert decision-making in areas such as firefighting and includes intuitive and deliberative abilities. Similarly, Matt Stichter (2016), whose view is that virtues are actually a subset of skills, defends a skills-based approach to wisdom. In doing so he addresses the concern that virtues are dispositions to act, whereas skills are merely capacities to act in certain ways. He points out that the possession of virtue implies the possession of skill. What’s more, he makes the case that the possession of expert skills entails motivation to the ends of the relevant practice. Nevertheless, in Stichter’s (2016) view phronesis is needed to connect the virtues to morality. In later work, Stichter (2018) discusses the worry that thinking of wisdom as the skill of getting things right morally faces the problem that skills require feedback for their development, though of course it is difficult to determine whether you are getting things right morally.

Knowing what to do or making good decisions wouldn’t, however, necessarily equip one to explain to others what they should do or to give the sort of good advice generally that the wise across different cultures are expected to be able to provide. What’s needed rather is both theoretical and practical understanding or knowledge about how to live well. Such a requirement appears to pose a challenge to skill-based models of wisdom (for example, Annas 2011; Swartwood 2013; Stichter 2016; Tsai 2022). After all, it’s not enough to be able to have the skill to live well, even an expert skill, one must be able to deliberate, as well as advise others about what to do in their own life predicaments. Cheng-hung Tsai (2020), a defender of a skill-based model, considering the asymmetries between skill and wisdom, acknowledges that “…a person with a particular practical skill cannot deliberate about the end of the skill, and even if she can, she is not required to do so” (2020: 234). Nonetheless, Tsai (2022, 2023) and others offer skill-based models geared to overcome these difficulties. Tsai (2022), with an account that is structurally similar to Grimm’s account but with a substantive position on well-being, offers The Skill Theory of Wisdom with a Success Theory of Well-Being. His account has two theses (Tsai 2022: 617):

(T1)
S is practically wise if and only if S has skill in living well.
(T2)
S is practically wise only if
(i)
S knows that overall attitude success contributes to or constitutes well-being;
(ii)
S knows what the best means are to achieve well-being;
(iii)
S is successful at living well (in light of what S knows).

Grimm (2015), who doesn’t adopt a skills-based approach, similarly points out that the wise person must have knowledge of the means to living well. Grimm (2015, 140) provides the following necessary conditions for wisdom:

  • Knowledge of what is good or important for well-being.
  • Knowledge of one’s standing, relative to what is good or important for well-being.
  • Knowledge of a strategy for obtaining what is good or important for well-being.

These conditions seem compatible with the wise person not merely being a good theoretician of well-being. Nevertheless, a question remains about exactly how theoretical and practical someone’s understanding or knowledge of living well should be. On the one hand, it seems unrealistic and unnecessary to expect wise people, who may be from a variety of backgrounds with different levels of education to have a worked out theory of well-being akin to say, a desire-fulfillment theorist of well-being or indeed the Success Theory of Well-Being. On the other hand, it also seems unnecessary and overly demanding to count some particular knowledge and understanding as contributing to wisdom, despite it being very significantly important for well-being. For example, it would seem very odd to claim that expert medical knowledge, which no doubt has great significance for well-being, contributes to one’s wisdom. To put it differently, do we really want to defend the view that two agents who otherwise have the same understanding or knowledge with respect to living well differ in wisdom if one knows more about how to create an emergency airway puncture by piercing a neck? Even if one just knows someone who can perform such a procedure and the other doesn’t, it still seems odd to think that this alone would indicate any difference in wisdom.

Perhaps this shows us that there is an irresolvable problem as to the level of specificity/generality of the knowledge or understanding required for wisdom. Another response, however, is to reject the sort of accounts provided by Grimm (2015) and Tsai (2022) and simply hold that wisdom requires knowledge or understanding that remains at the general level and does not concern the particular. This would be in line with Aristotle’s claim that

it is thought to be the mark of a man of practical wisdom to be able to deliberate well about what is good and expedient for himself, not in some particular respect, e.g. about what sorts of thing conduce to health or to strength, but about what sorts of thing conduce to the good life in general. (EN iv.5 1140a)

Nonetheless, this response is not without its own theoretical costs. If we deny that wisdom pertains to the particular, then the sort of social role that the wise person is envisaged as having is affected too. The wise person can still be the sort of person that is in a good position to give good advice to others in difficult or important life situations, though the sort of advice that they can give as a wise person may be more limited than originally envisaged.

3. Living Wisely

Some accounts of wisdom, such as those defended by Grimm (2015) and Tsai (2022), hold that being wise implies that one lives successfully, where successfully implies that one lives well (and perhaps other things depending on the account). On another approach, being wise requires that a wise person’s beliefs and values cohere with one’s actions (Tiberius 2008). The main idea is that one’s actions are reflective of one’s understanding of what it means to live well. A view along these lines would be embraced by Zagzebski (for practical wisdom), Kekes, Nozick, and Tiberius. A more moderate position, supported by the thought that whether one lives well or not may not be within one’s control, is that the wise person is committed or disposed to living well (Sharon Ryan 2012; Shane Ryan 2016). The thought that wisdom is not simply confined to the epistemic but extends to action is captured by Kekes (1983: 281) who writes that “[w]isdom ought also to show in the man who has it”.

While the Stoics believed that being well regarded by others, achieving wealth, social status, good health, and other external achievements typically associated with a good life are not required for happiness, virtue, or wisdom, they believed that the wise person necessarily succeeds at living well (Epictetus The Encheiridion). As noted above, all that really matters for the Stoics is virtue, which involves understanding the true nature of things, accepting with tranquility all that is outside of our control, and holding the appropriate attitudes that are within our control. The Stoics held the extreme view that the wise person has the ability to live virtuously and happily even while being tortured on the rack (Cicero On Moral Ends III. 42). While considered “preferred” by the Stoics, the external conditions typically associated with the good life fall outside of our control so they should not be of concern to us. While this might appear to be a rejection of a living well condition on wisdom, it is not. This Stoic view is simply maintaining that most of us are deeply mistaken about what it means to live well.

The idea that one must succeed at living well in order to qualify as a wise person is not, however, embraced by all wisdom scholars. Whitcomb (2011), for example, clearly objects to all theories of wisdom that include a living well condition and even rejects the view that the wise person needs to desire or value living well. He gives several interesting objections against such views. Whitcomb thinks that a person who is deeply depressed and totally devoid of any ambition to live well could nevertheless be wise. As long as such a person is deeply knowledgeable about academic subjects and knows how to live well, that person would have all they need for wisdom. With respect to a very knowledgeable and deeply depressed person with no ambition but to stay in his room, Whitcomb (2011: 97) writes that

[i]f I ran across such a person, I would take his advice to heart, wish him a return to health, and leave the continuing search for sages to his less grateful advisees. And I would think he was wise despite his depression-induced failure to value or desire the good life. So I think that wisdom does not require valuing or desiring the good life.

In response to Whitcomb’s criticism, one could argue that a deeply depressed person who is wise, would still live as well as she can, and would still value living well, even if she falls far short of perfection. Such a person would attempt to get help to deal with her depression. If she really does not care at all, she may be very knowledgeable, but, on this alternative view, she is not wise. Indeed, in various wisdom traditions, it is precisely one’s ability to control one’s mental attitudes that indicates wisdom. Although discussing anger rather than depression, the Brahma Purana (235: 40–42, as translated in Radhakrishnan 1953: 109 n. 1) tell us that “[t]he wise man overcomes anger through mind-control”. Similarly, in the Bhagavad Gītā (II:56, Sargeant translation, 141) we are told that “[h]e whose mind is not agitated in misfortune… And whose meditation is steady, is said to be a sage”.

Furthermore, there seems to be something deeply irrational about knowing how to live well and refusing to try to do so. Such irrationality seems incompatible with wisdom. A person with this internal conflict may possess many intellectual virtues required for wisdom, but they seem to miss the mark if wisdom is the highest virtue. Wisdom as a virtue and a way of life requires more than mere intelligence or shrewdness.

A further question is whether being wise entails being morally good. Aristotle (EN vi.12 1144a 36–37) held that “it is evident that it is impossible to be practically wise without being good”. Stoics similarly held that one must be virtuous to be wise (Durand, Shogry, & Baltzly 2023). However, Whitcomb challenges any theory of wisdom that requires moral virtue. In fact, he contends that a deeply evil person could nevertheless be wise. Again, it is important to contrast being wise from being clever and intelligent. If we think of wisdom as the highest, or among the highest, of human virtues, then it seems incompatible with a deeply evil personality.

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Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the authors with suggestions.]

Acknowledgments

This entry by Shane Ryan and Sharon Ryan includes some short passages from the older entry on wisdom by Sharon Ryan.

Copyright © 2026 by
Shane Ryan <sgryan@cityu.edu.hk>
Sharon Ryan <sharon.ryan@mail.wvu.edu>

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