Essential vs. Accidental Properties

First published Tue Apr 29, 2008; substantive revision Fri Aug 21, 2026

The terms ‘essential property’ and ‘accidental property’ have many distinct senses in philosophy. Two have figured prominently in analytic metaphysics of the last 70 years or so. There is the modal sense, according to which (at least as a first pass) an essential property of an object is a property that it must have while an accidental property of an object is a property that it happens to have but that it could lack. This use was dominant among analytic metaphysicians during the second half of the 20th Century. There is another sense, the whatness sense, according to which (at least as a first pass) an essential property of an object is one that provides an answer to the question of what the object is while an accidental property of the object does not provide such an answer. This use, which is associated with a more traditional subject matter in the longer history of philosophy, started gaining on the modal use toward the tail end of the 20th Century. It is this use that is dominant among analytic metaphysicians today. (Robertson Ishii (2024) provides more—including references—on the uses of ‘essential property’ in recent analytic metaphysics.)

To avoid ambiguity and concomitant confusion, this article adopts the terminology of modally essential/accidental properties and whatness essential/accidental properties. (The term ‘whatness’ is borrowed from Almog (1991), who wrote at a time when ‘essential’ was typically used in its modal sense, and who therefore introduced ‘whatness’ as a term for the more traditional notion.) Related terms (such as the adverbs ‘essentially’ and ‘accidentally’) are similarly disambiguated. It is important for the reader of an author who uses ‘essential’ and ‘accidental’ (with no additional adornment) to attend to whether the author uses the modal sense, the whatness sense, or perhaps some other less prominent sense. Often an author will provide a disambiguating definition. But often an author simply uses the sense that was dominant at the time of writing. Sometimes authors move fluidly between various senses.

No matter which way the terms are used, there is an analytic constraint that they apply so as to be mutually exclusive and jointly exhaustive of the relevant class of properties. This is to say that for each object \(o\), no property in the class is both an essential property of \(o\) and an accidental property of \(o\) (this is exclusiveness), and every property in the class is an essential property of \(o\) or an accidental property of \(o\) (this is exhaustiveness). The constraint of exclusiveness is reflected in the use of the word ‘versus’ in the title of this article. What is the relevant class of properties? On the face of it, there are two natural candidates: (i) the class of properties that the object has, and (ii) the class of all properties. However, it is natural to use the term ‘essential’ (‘accidental’) so that if \(P\) is an essential (accidental) property of \(o\), then \(o\) has \(P\). If these conditionals hold, then given the exhaustiveness condition, the relevant class of properties cannot be the class of all properties (since no object has all properties whatsoever). There remains the other option: it is the class of all properties that the object has. This option corresponds to the way people commonly understand the essential/accidental distinction.

Whether one uses the modal sense or the whatness sense, it is common to use the adjective ‘essential’ (‘accidental’) and the adverb ‘essentially’ (‘accidentally’) in such a way that the following hold:

• \(P\) is an essential (accidental) property of an object \(o\) if and only if \(P\) is essential (accidental) to \(o\)

• \(P\) is an essential (accidental) property of and object \(o\) if and only if \(o\) has \(P\) essentially (accidentally)

Also, it is common to use ‘essence’ in such a way that the essence of an object is the class of all its essential properties. Note that, by contrast, it is not common to use ‘accident’ in a corresponding way for the class of all of an object’s accidental properties.

The two senses of ‘essential’ and ‘accidental’ are obviously very different from one another. Cohen (1978, p. 388) remarked that not all of an object’s modally essential properties provide suitable answers to the traditional (Aristotelian) question of what that object is. Plausible examples of such were given as part of an education in analytic metaphysics in the 1980s and 1990s and included Socrates’s property of being such that 2+2=4 and his property of being self-identical. Fine (1994) made this point vivid for a new generation by invoking some particularly memorable examples. (For more on these, see §3.) In spite of the fact that the modal and whatness notions are obviously distinct, it is somewhat easy to confuse the two—perhaps in part because there are many prominent cases in which a property is widely considered both modally essential (accidental) and whatness essential (accidental) to an object. For example, many would say that a given human is both modally and whatness essentially human. (And mutatis mutandis for individuals of other species—for example, that a dog, Emma, is both modally and whatness essentially a dog.) And many would say that a person who is in fact fond of dogs is so both modally and whatness accidentally.

The shift in the use of ‘essential’ has led to a somewhat orthogonal difference in the use of the term ‘essentialism’. Whereas ‘essentialism’ used to indicate primarily a doctrine according to which (at least as a first pass) some things have some properties modally essentially, nowadays ‘essentialism’ often indicates a doctrine according to which (at least as a first pass) modality is to be elucidated in terms of whatness. Essentialism so understood is typically contrasted with ‘modalism’, a doctrine according to which (at least as a first pass) whatness is to be elucidated in terms of modality (see Leech 2018, Leech 2021, Vetter 2021, Wildman 2013 and Wildman 2021).

This article explores the modal essential/accidental property distinction, the whatness essential/accidental property distinction, as well as the relationships in which they are thought to stand to one another. §1 provides a detailed look at the modal essential/accidental property distinction while §2 provides a brief initial look at the whatness essential/accidental property distinction, postponing a fuller consideration until §§4–5—after §3’s discussion of the view that whatness essentiality is modal essentiality.

1. The Modal Essential/Accidental Property Distinction

1.1 Core and Existence-Conditioned Characterizations

In the introduction, we said that (at least as a first pass) a modally essential property of an object is a property that it must have, whereas a modally accidental property of an object is one that it happens to have but that it could lack. The word ‘must’ indicates that necessity is involved, while the word ‘could’ indicates that possibility is involved. The distinction is modal inasmuch as it involves the modalities of necessity and possibility. These modalities are interdefinable: to say that something is necessary is to say that its negation is not possible; to say that something is possible is to say that its negation is not necessary; to say that an object must have a certain property is to say that it could not lack it; and to say that an object could have a certain property is to say that it is not the case that it must lack it. (It is worth taking a moment at the outset to reflect on a difference between the notion of a modally essential property of a thing—a property that that thing could not lack—and the notion of a property that that thing could not lose. Of course, any property that a particular person could not lack is one that that person could not lose, since by losing a property the person comes to lack it. But the reverse does not hold. There are properties that a person could not lose—like the property of having been an Athenian soldier—that are nevertheless not modally essential to that person.)

It is common to capture the distinction between modally essential and accidental properties using the operators ‘it is necessary that’ (or simply ‘necessarily’) and ‘it is possible that’ (or simply ‘possibly’) instead of the words ‘must’ and ‘could’, but the distinction thereby captured is the same. Thus, the following is another way of capturing what we will call the core characterization of the modal essential/accidental property distinction.

\(P\) is a modally essential property of an object \(o\) (or \(P\) is modally essential to \(o\), or \(o\) has \(P\) modally essentially) if and only if it is necessary that \(o\) has \(P\).
\(P\) is a modally accidental property of an object \(o\) (or \(P\) is modally accidental to \(o\), or \(o\) has \(P\) modally accidentally) if and only if both \(o\) has \(P\) and \(o\) does not have \(P\) modally essentially (that is, if and only if \(o\) has \(P\) and it is possible that \(o\) lacks \(P\)).

The language of possible worlds, which philosophers often adopt, provides another way of capturing this core characterization.

\(P\) is a modally essential property of an object \(o\) (or \(P\) is modally essential to \(o\), or \(o\) has \(P\) modally essentially) if and only if \(o\) has \(P\) according to (or “in”) all possible worlds.
\(P\) is a modally accidental property of an object \(o\) (or \(P\) is modally accidental to \(o\), or \(o\) has \(P\) modally accidentally) if and only if \(o\) has \(P\) and there is a possible world according to (or “in”) which \(o\) lacks \(P\).

Although the basic idea behind the modal characterization is clear enough from these statements, a moment’s reflection reveals a little bit of trouble. Many properties (some philosophers would say all properties) are such that in order for an object to possess them, that object must exist. According to the core characterization, any such existence-requiring property, if possessed by a contingently existing object, will be counted as an accidental property of that object. But this seems wrong. Consider the property of being a dog. It is plausible (and for present purposes we assume it is true) that an object must exist in order to possess this property. Now consider a particular dog, Emma, who in fact exists but who might not have. There is a possible world according to which Emma does not exist. And according to this world (given our assumption), Emma is not a dog, since she does not exist. So, on the core characterization, being a dog is an accidental property of Emma. This is problematic insofar as it rules out the intuitively compelling claim (noted in the introduction to this article) that any given dog is modally (as well as whatness) essentially a dog.

In response to this point, it is tempting to turn to what we will call the existence-conditioned modal characterization, which differs from the core characterization in the ways indicated by the underlined phrases below.

\(P\) is a modally essential property of an object \(o\) (or \(P\) is modally essential to \(o\), or \(o\) has \(P\) modally essentially) if and only if both \(o\) has \(P\) and it is necessary that \(o\) has \(P\) if \(o\) exists.
\(P\) is a modally accidental property of an object \(o\) if and only if both \(o\) has \(P\) and \(o\) does not have \(P\) modally essentially (that is, if and only if \(o\) has \(P\) and it is possible that \(o\) lacks \(P\) and yet exists).

A quick word is in order concerning our inclusion of the first underlined phrase (‘both o has P and’). It is not uncommon to leave it out. However, under plausible assumptions, the omission results in violence to language insofar as such a characterization allows for the possibility of there being a property that is modally essential to an object even though the object lacks the property. For example, consider a possible world, w, in which Emma does not exist. As noted, plausibly she is not a dog in w. Yet it is also plausible that she is a dog in all possible worlds in which she exists. If we leave out the first underlined phrase in the existence-conditioned characterization, we are left to say that in w, although Emma is not a dog at all she is nonetheless essentially a dog. By including the phrase, one does justice to the standard use of ‘essential’ according to which the essential properties of an object are had by the object (see the introduction). (By including the phrase, we are following, for example, Plantinga (1974, p. 56) and deviating from, for example, Forbes (1985, p. 97) and Fine (1994, p. 4).)

But the existence-conditioned characterization, like the core characterization, seems also to be less than satisfactory. The existence-conditioned characterization makes existence into a modally essential property of each object that exists, since no object (existent or otherwise) could lack existence and yet exist. Thus, this characterization effectively rules out the intuitively compelling view that existence is modally essential to numbers (or God) but only modally accidental to Emma.

Arguably neither the problem for the core characterization nor the problem for the existence-conditioned characterization is devastating. Those who favor the core characterization can say that typically when someone claims, for example, that Emma is modally essentially a dog, what is really meant is not that Emma has the property of being a dog modally essentially, but instead that Emma has the property of being a dog if existent modally essentially. And similarly for other existence-requiring properties. Existence, although it is an existence-requiring property, will be treated specially on this approach: the claim that an object has existence as a modally essential property will not be taken as the claim that the object has as a modally essential property the property of being existent if existent, but instead the claim will be taken at face value. Those who favor the existence-conditioned characterization can say that when someone says that numbers (or God) have existence as a modally essential property, what is really meant is that numbers (or God) have existence as a necessary property, where a necessary property of an object is a property that the object has necessarily (that is, in all possible worlds). (According to the core characterization, a modally essential property is the same as a necessary property and a modally accidental property is the same as a contingent property.) (For more on the duplicative terminology, see Robertson Ishii (2024, n. 5).)

Both approaches may be faulted for making a special case of the property of existence. But that is not perhaps such a great fault, given that existence does seem to be a special case and that it is treated specially in other areas of philosophy as well. (It is perhaps worth pointing out that according to many philosophers—Kant, Frege, and Russell to name three—existence is not a property at all. If this is right, then existence is indeed a very special case.)

The reasons that one philosopher may favor one of these characterizations over the other have largely to do with views that the philosopher holds in other areas. Let us start with some commonsensical views. It is natural to think that Emma might have had a sister that she does not in fact have—perhaps the dog that would have arisen (assuming there were one such dog) if a particular egg of Emma’s mother had united with a particular sperm from Emma’s father. Let us call this merely possible dog, ‘Gemma’. According to common sense, although Gemma is not a dog, she is nonetheless a dog if existent. Since on both the core characterization and the existence-conditioned characterization, having modally essentially or accidentally a property implies having the property, Gemma is neither modally essentially nor modally accidentally a dog, since she is not a dog at all. But, since Gemma does have the property of being a dog if existent, this is a property that she should have in exactly one of the two ways—modally essentially or modally accidentally. Both the core and the existence-conditioned characterization can accommodate the natural thought that if Emma is essentially a dog if existent then so is Gemma. On the core characterization, this is because in all possible worlds Gemma (like Emma) is a dog if existent. On the existence-conditioned characterization, this is because Gemma (like Emma) is a dog if existent and in all possible worlds she is a dog if existent if existent. Commonsense views may thus prefer the core characterization inasmuch as the existence-conditioned characterization merely seems to add an extra layer of complication (through the doubling up on the phrase ‘if existent’). But many philosophers hold the view that in order to have a property a thing must exist, and thus (assuming that they agree that Gemma does not exist) they would deny that Gemma has the property of being a dog if existent. For such philosophers (prominently Plantinga (1974, Chapter 4, Section 8)), the existence-conditioned characterization is preferable. The important point here is that although the core characterization and the existence-conditioned characterization provide different ways of characterizing the modal essential/accidental property distinction, the differing characterizations seem to result not so much from a disagreement as to the target notion, but instead from disagreement over other philosophical theses.

It is worth noting that if we draw a distinction between existence and being (so that Gemma, though she lacks existence nonetheless has being, or, to take a different example, so that when Socrates died, he ceased to exist but continued to have being enough to have properties like having been an Athenian soldier or being talked about well after his death), then among the properties that an individual has, there will be those that are necessary for its being (which, for present purposes we assume are the ones that are modally essential to it according to the core characterization) and those that are necessary for its existence (the ones that are modally essential to it according to the existence-conditioned characterization). In this way, the core characterization and the existence-conditioned characterization may each be seen as marking something significant. Any property of the former sort will be a property of the latter sort as well, but not vice versa. This suggests another category that may be significant—perhaps more significant than either of the other two—the properties that an individual has that are necessary for its existence but not necessary for its being (for example, in Emma’s case, the property of being a dog)—that is, properties of the individual that are modally essential in the sense given by the existence-conditioned characterization, but not modally essential in the sense given by the core characterization.

Such is roughly the stance taken by Zalta (2006)—at least for ordinary objects (like Socrates, Emma, and even Gemma) as opposed to abstract objects (like numbers and fictional characters).[1]

According to Zalta, every object, whether ordinary or abstract, necessarily exists, but ordinary objects are not necessarily “concrete”. (This view is also advocated by Linsky and Zalta (1994) and (1996) and Williamson (1998) and (2013).) For Zalta, to say that an ordinary object is contingent is not to say that there is a possible world in which it does not exist, but instead to say that there is a possible world in which it is not concrete. Zalta sees concreteness where we previously saw existence, and Zalta sees existence where we previously saw being. Thus, Zalta would count Gemma as existent but not concrete—for the same reasons that we earlier counted Gemma as being but not existing. For ordinary objects, Zalta distinguishes three senses of ‘modally essential’—(1) the properties a thing has in all possible worlds, (2) the properties a thing has in all possible worlds in which it is concrete, and (3) the properties that a thing has in all possible worlds in which it is concrete but not in all possible worlds whatsoever. Zalta’s (1) corresponds to our core characterization. Zalta’s (2) corresponds roughly to our existence-conditioned characterization. (A notable difference is that Zalta’s second sense allows that Gemma is essentially a dog even though she is not a dog at all.) Zalta’s (3) corresponds roughly to the properties that are modally essential according to the existence-conditioned characterization, but not according to the core characterization. (Again, a notable difference is that Zalta’s third sense allows that Gemma is essentially a dog even though she is not a dog at all.) And Zalta takes (3) to be the most significant sense of ‘modally essential’ for ordinary objects.

For the most part, in the remainder of this article, we will not be concerned with the details arising from the need for some sort of existence condition—either in the statement of the characterization of a modally essential property (as on the existence-conditioned characterization) or in the properties that are taken to be essential (as on the core modal characterization).

In the remainder of §1 and in the Supplement on Arguments for Origin Essentialism, for the sake of stylistic brevity we will often omit the qualifier ‘modal’ when talking about essentialism, essence, essential properties, etc.

1.2 Metaphysical Necessity/Possibility

The central notion involved in any modal characterization of the distinction between essential and accidental properties is that of metaphysical necessity/possibility. But, since there are a number of notions that correspond to the many ways that we use the words ‘necessity’ and ‘possibility’, it is helpful to contrast the relevant notion of necessity/possibility with some other notions with which it might be confused.

If one claims that something is possible, it is sometimes natural to take this to mean that one does not know it to be false. For example, suppose that you ask someone whether Socrates ever went to Sparta and she answers that it is possible. It is natural to understand her as saying that she does not know that Socrates did not go to Sparta. Thus, the possibility that is expressed here is a kind of epistemic possibility (in particular, one according to which \(p\) is epistemically possible for an agent \(X\) just in case the denial of \(p\) is not known by \(X\)). This notion of epistemic possibility is clearly distinct from the notion of metaphysical possibility, since there are cases of epistemic possibilities that are not metaphysical possibilities. Of Goldbach’s Conjecture (that every even number greater than two is the sum of two primes) and its negation, each is epistemically possible but one (we know not which) is not metaphysically possible. And there are cases of metaphysical possibilities that are not epistemic possibilities. That there are only two planets in our solar system is metaphysically possible but not epistemically possible for most of us, given that most of us know that there are not only two planets in our solar system. (This is not to deny that there may be some notions of epistemic possibility—for example, maximally complete ways the universe can coherently be conceived to be—for which it is at least plausible to suppose that every metaphysical possibility is also an epistemic possibility. Even if this is so, the notions of metaphysical possibility and epistemic possibility are distinct.)

In addition to various notions of epistemic possibility, philosophers have been concerned with three particular notions of possibility that are generally regarded as non-epistemic: logical possibility, metaphysical possibility, and physical possibility . On one common view, the physical possibilities are a subset of the metaphysical possibilities, which in turn are a subset of the logical possibilities. (But see Fine 2002 for an opposing view.) Here are a couple of examples of things that are logically possible but neither metaphysically nor physically possible: the Eiffel Tower’s being red all over and green all over at the same time; the Eiffel Tower’s being red but not extended.[2] Here is an example of something that is logically and metaphysically possible but not physically possible: the Eiffel Tower’s traveling faster than the speed of light. The Eiffel Tower’s being both red and not red at the same time is possible in none of the senses while its traveling faster than a speeding bullet is possible in all of them. For deeper introductions to the various modalities, see Roca-Royes 2023 and varieties of modality.

To supplement these examples, it would be nice to give characterizations of the three notions that are free from controversy. That is easier said than done. Nonetheless, we offer some characterizations that are relatively uncontroversial. Metaphysical possibility is often taken as a primitive notion that figures into the idea of a physical possibility (but see §5 for views according to which the metaphysical modalites are not primitive): a proposition is physically possible if and only if it is metaphysically compossible with the laws of physics. (Other nomological possibilities, such as chemical or biological possibility, can be understood similarly.) Assuming that the notion of a logical truth is understood, then the logical necessities are simply the logical truths, so that the logical possibilities are those things whose negations are not logical truths.

1.3 Ways of Characterizing Modal Essentialism

There are at least four fairly standard ways of characterizing modal essentialism, and by considering two extreme views, we can easily see the differences among these four characterizations. According to the first extreme view—one that it is natural to call maximal essentialism—

all of any given object’s properties are essential to it.

According to the other extreme view—one that it is natural to call minimal essentialism—

there are virtually no limits to the ways in which any given object might have been different from the way that it actually is, so that the only essential properties of an object are what we might think of as its trivial essential properties—properties like being either \(F\) or non-\(F\) (for any property \(F\)) and being self-identical.

Should so-called minimal essentialism really count as a form of essentialism? And should so-called maximal essentialism really count as a form of essentialism? There are four positions in logical space with respect to these questions: yes and yes; yes and no; no and yes; and no and no. Each of these positions is occupied by some reasonably prominent characterization of essentialism.[3]

The first position—according to which both “minimal essentialism” and “maximal essentialism” count as genuine forms of essentialism—is occupied by the characterization of essentialism that was offered at the outset:

the doctrine that (at least some) objects have (at least some) essential properties.

We are inclined to think that this simple and straightforward characterization is the most common understanding of essentialism, although it is rarely explicitly stated. (Mackie (2006, p. 1) provides an example of someone who does explicitly use this characterization.)

The second position—according to which “minimal essentialism” but not “maximal essentialism” counts as a genuine form of essentialism—is occupied by the characterization that Quine very famously offered:

the doctrine that some of the attributes of a thing (quite independently of the language in which the thing is referred to, if at all) may be essential to the thing, and others accidental (1953b/1976, pp. 175–6).

In more formal terms, essentialism, Quine (1953b/1976, p. 176) says, is the doctrine that there are true[4] sentences of this form: \(\exists x(\Box Fx \amp Gx \amp{\sim}\Box Gx)\) (where ‘\(\Box\)’ may be read as ‘it is necessary that’). According to “maximal essentialism” any given object has only essential properties. It has no accidental ones. That means that according to “maximal essentialism”, there will be no properties to “go in for” the ‘\(G\)’ in Quine’s sentence schema; and so, “maximal essentialism” is no form of essentialism at all on Quine’s characterization.

The third position—according to which “maximal essentialism” but not “minimal essentialism” counts as a form of essentialism—is occupied by the characterization of essentialism as

the view that (at least some) objects have (at least some) non-trivial necessary properties.

Della Rocca (1996a) thinks of essentialism in this way, and so counts “maximal essentialism” but not “minimal essentialism” as a form of essentialism. (It is natural to suppose that Della Rocca thinks that essential properties are non-trivial necessary properties, so that he can say things like, “Essentialism is the view that some objects have some essential properties.” If this is what Della Rocca thinks, then on his view, either the essential/accidental distinction is not exhaustive—since trivial necessary properties, like being such that there are infinitely many primes, are neither accidental nor essential—or the distinction is exhaustive but being such that there are infinitely many primes is counted an accidental property, contrary to intuition.)

The fourth position—according to which neither “minimal essentialism” nor “maximal essentialism” counts as a form of essentialism—is occupied by the characterization of essentialism as

the view that the accidental/essential property distinction is robust in the sense that (at least some) objects have (at least some) non-trivial essential properties and (at least some) objects have (at least some) accidental properties.

Yablo (1998) has this characterization in mind, and so he characterizes both “minimal essentialism” and “maximal essentialism” as forms of anti-essentialism.

In the remainder of this entry, essentialism will be understood in the first of the four ways. It is customary to count a doctrine as essentialist (or as a form of essentialism) in a slightly extended sense if it—together perhaps with uncontroversial facts—entails essentialism. Thus, for example, the claim that any human is necessarily human counts as essentialist because it together with the uncontroversial fact that there are humans entails that some object has some essential property.

1.4 Some Prominent Modal Essentialist Claims

A variety of particular forms of essentialism have been advocated. Starting at one extreme, there is maximal essentialism. Although Leibniz famously held this view, it nearly goes without saying that this view has had relatively few adherents. According to a less extreme and correspondingly more popular form of essentialism, origin essentialism, an object could not have had a radically different origin than it in fact had. The view that a particular table could not have been originally made from completely different material than the material from which it was actually originally made and the view that a person could not have originated from a completely different gamete pair than the pair from which he or she actually originated are both forms of origin essentialism. Forms of origin essentialism have been defended by Kripke (1972/1980), Salmon (1981), and Forbes (1985), among others. According to another moderate form of essentialism, sortal essentialism, an object could not have been of a radically different kind—at least for certain kinds—than it in fact is. Both the view that being human (or being human if existent) is an essential property of Socrates and the view that Socrates could not have been a credit card account are forms of sortal essentialism. The mildest form of essentialism is minimal essentialism. Mackie (2006) offers a sustained defense of roughly this view.

In addition to these sorts of claims about the essential properties of ordinary individuals, claims about the essential properties of natural kinds have figured prominently in the literature, since Kripke (1972/1980) and Putnam (1975) made essentialist claims concerning, for example, cats and water. The core intuitions are that in any possible world anything that is not an animal is not a cat and that in any possible world anything that is not composed of molecules of H2O is not water. Since we discovered empirically that cats are animals (and not, for example, robots) and that water is H2O (and not some other type of molecule), each of these claims asserts a necessary a posteriori connection between two properties. In the first case, what is asserted is that it is necessary that anything that is a cat is an animal. In the second case, what is asserted is that necessarily anything that is (a sample of) water is composed of molecules of H2O.[5] It is natural to construe these claims on the model of the essentialist claims we have so far considered: it is essential to a particular object, namely the species cat, to be such that all of its instances are also instances of the kind animal; it is essential to a particular object, namely the kind water, to be such that all samples of it are composed of molecules of H2O. Notice that one may hold that cats are essentially animals in the sense that there is a necessary a posteriori connection between the property of being a cat and the property of being an animal, without holding that any particular cat is essentially an animal. In other words, from the fact that it is necessary that every individual that is a cat is an animal, it does not follow that every individual that is in fact a cat is such that necessarily it is an animal. In still other words, this type of essentialism about natural kinds does not entail sortal essentialism.

It is perhaps worth mentioning that similar remarks apply to the case of a necessary a priori connection between properties. It is a necessary a priori truth that all mathematicians are rational. Following our model, we can say that it is essential to the kind mathematician to be such that all of its instances are also instances of the kind rational (thing). It does not follow that Andrew Wiles, who is in fact a mathematician, could not fail to be rational—in which case he would also fail to be a mathematician. To give an even more perspicuous example, it is a necessary a priori truth that all bachelors are unmarried. It does not follow that Michael, who is in fact a bachelor, could not be married.

Philosophers have thought not only about whether an object has this or that particular property essentially but also about whether an object has a special kind of essential property, an individual essence, a property that in addition to being essential to the object is also unique to it in the sense that having that property is modally sufficient for being that object (that is, it is not possible that something distinct from that object has that property). A trivial example of an individual essence is a haecceity or thisness of an object, the property of being (identical to) that very object. Some have defended the claim that there are substantive examples of individual essences. Leibniz famously held that there are, and that they can be given by purely qualitative (general) properties. Forbes (1985) also holds that there are substantive individual essences, but he disagrees with Leibniz that they can be given by purely qualitative properties. Instead, he thinks, an individual essence involves non-purely qualitative (singular) properties: for example, Socrates’s essence involves originating from the particular sperm and egg from which he actually originated. For more on modal sufficiency principles, see the

Supplement on Arguments for Origin Essentialism.

1.5 Suspicions About Modal Essentialism

In §1.3, we passed over without comment the parenthetical phrase from Quine’s characterization of essentialism. Adding that phrase to the first view of essentialism from §1.3 yields:

essentialism is the doctrine that (at least some) objects have independently of how they are referred to (at least some) essential properties.

The added phrase stresses that the essentialist thinks that it at least makes sense to ask of an object (“in itself”) whether it must have a particular property. Skeptics about essentialism have doubted the very intelligibility of such a question. Here is one prominent thought behind such anti-essentialism. (See Quine 1960, pp. 195–200.) Since it is necessary that one plus one is greater than one, when the number two is referred to as ‘one plus one’ it is essentially greater than one. But, since it is not necessary that the number of Martian moons is greater than one, when the number two is referred to as ‘the number of Martian planets’ it is not essentially greater than one. The point is supposed to be that it makes no sense to say of the number two, independently of any way of referring to it, that it is or is not essentially greater than one. Similarly, an anti-essentialist might say that when a person who is both a mathematician and a cyclist is thought of as a mathematician, being rational is essential to him, while being two-legged is not; but when the very same person is thought of as a cyclist, then although being two-legged is essential to him, being rational is not. Again, the point is supposed to be that it makes no sense to say of the very person who is the mathematical cyclist, independently of any way of thinking about him, that he is or is not essentially rational (or two-legged). According to the anti-essentialist, asking whether Andrew Wiles (who we may suppose is a cycling mathematician) could fail to be rational is like asking whether Andrew Wiles is taller than—both questions demand another relatum. Could he fail to be rational, relative to what way of referring to him? Is he taller than whom?

In response, the essentialist will point out that the anti-essentialist’s thought does not square very well with intuition. Consider the object that is referred to by all these phrases: ‘two’, ‘one plus one’, ‘the number of Martian moons’. Could that very object have failed to be greater than one? Intuitively the question seems intelligible, and the answer seems to be that it could not have failed to be greater than one. According to intuition then, the very object that is referred to by ‘the number of Martian moons’ (which is the very same object that is referred to by ‘one plus one’ and ‘two’) is essentially greater than one. Intuition also has it that the claim that the number of Martian moons is greater than one is not itself necessary. To add some jargon: Intuition has it that the claim that it is necessary that the number of Martian planets is greater than one is true read de re (“of the thing”), but false read de dicto (“of the dictum” or “of the statement”). (The de re reading is this: the number of Martian moons has the property of being necessarily greater than one. The de dicto reading is this: the claim that the number of Martian moons is greater than one has the property of being necessary.) The essentialist is pointing out that the anti-essentialist’s argument asserts that the latter intuition undermines the former, but does not say why.

In addition to the worry presented here, Quine (1943, 1947, 1953a, 1953b, and 1980) had other—more technical—reasons for being suspicious of essentialist claims. (Quine (1956) discusses a related worry in the case of propositional attitude reports.) Kripke (2015a and 2015b) concerns himself with (some of) Quine’s concerns, but finds them not concerning.

1.6 Knowledge of A Posteriori Modal Essentialist Claims

Assuming that we have knowledge of some essentialist claims, how might we account for that knowledge? For the purposes of the present discussion, let us assume that we know that being such that there are infinitely many primes, being human, and originating from egg \(e\) and sperm \(s\) (where this is understood in Kripke’s sense of not originating from gametes that do not include egg \(e\) and sperm \(s\)) are essential properties of Socrates. The first example is different from the last two in that it seems that we can know a priori that being such that there are infinitely many primes is essential to Socrates whereas it seems that we can know only a posteriori that being human and originating from \(e\) and \(s\) are also essential to him.

While it is a vexed philosophical issue just how to account for a priori knowledge of necessary truths such as logical truths, mathematical truths, and the homelier necessary truths like the truth that nothing can be red all over and green all over at the same time, accounting for our knowledge of the necessary truth that Socrates is such that there are infinitely many primes, does not seem to be problematic in some extra special way. If we had a good account of our a priori knowledge of the necessary truth that there are infinitely many primes, then it would take little more to account for our knowledge of the necessary truth about Socrates that he is such that there are infinitely many primes.

Kripke (1972/1980) suggests that our knowledge of some other essentialist claims is based in part on a bit of a priori knowledge and in part on a bit of empirical knowledge. For example, our knowledge that originating from \(e\) and \(s\) is essential to Socrates is based in part on our a priori knowledge that every organism has its origin essentially and in part on our empirical knowledge that Socrates (is an organism that) originated from \(e\) and \(s\). (Similarly our knowledge that Socrates is essentially human appears to be based in part on our a priori knowledge that everything has its kind essentially and in part on our empirical knowledge that Socrates is (of the kind) human.) Thus, our knowledge of the claim that originating from \(e\) and \(s\) is essential to Socrates should be no more problematic epistemologically than our knowledge of the two claims on which it is based and our knowledge of the validity of the argument from those two claims. As we have already mentioned, although there are difficult philosophical issues concerning our knowledge of logical truths, our knowledge of the validity of the argument in question does not seem to add any special problems of its own. Similarly, although there are philosophical issues concerning empirical knowledge, our knowledge that Socrates originated from \(e\) and \(s\) does not appear to add any special problems. However our a priori knowledge that every organism has its origin essentially does seem to have special problems over and above the problems associated with accounting for our a priori knowledge of logic, mathematics, and the homelier necessary truths. The latter claims are generally supported by universally held intuitions or by arguments that are universally accepted whereas the former, like most philosophical claims, is supported by a less robust intuition and by a more controversial argument. To see in some detail how philosophers have gone about defending origin essentialism, see the

Supplement on Arguments for Origin Essentialism.

For more about arguments for sortal essentialism, see Wiggins 1980 and Mackie 2006 (chapters 7 and 8). The entry on the epistemology of modality is useful on general issues in modal epistemology.

1.7 Modal Essentialist Claims in Arguments for Nonidentities

Leibniz’s Law of the Indiscernibility of Identicals, according to which, if “two” things are identical, then they share all their properties, can be used to argue for various claims of nonidentity. If you know, for example, that Charles is a philosophy major and that Yoko is not, then you can safely infer that Charles is not identical to Yoko. Essentialist claims have played a role in some prominent Leibniz Law arguments for nonidentity theses. A certain brand of mind-body dualism may be argued for in the following way: \(X\) is essentially a thinking thing; \(X\)’s body is not essentially a thinking thing; so \(X\) is not (identical to) \(X\)’s body. A similar argument can be given for the conclusion that a statue is not identical with the lump of material (wax, clay, marble, or what have you) that constitutes it. Borrowing roughly from an example given by Gibbard (1975), consider a human-shaped statue—call it ‘Goliath’—and the lump of wax that composes it—call it ‘Lump\(_1\)’. Goliath, we may imagine, is throughout its entire existence composed of Lump\(_1\) while Lump\(_1\) throughout its entire existence composes Goliath. In this case, Goliath and Lump\(_1\) are spatiotemporally colocated, which is just to say that they occupy the exact same spatial region at any given time whenever either of them exists. This being the case, they share many of their properties: Goliath weighs 17 kilograms and so does Lump\(_1\); Goliath has a white surface and so does Lump\(_1\); and so on. In fact, it may seem curious that we are writing as though there are two things at all. Why not say simply that Goliath and Lump\(_1\) are identical? Well, it at least seems that a pretty straightforward argument—one that relies on essentialist claims—establishes their nonidentity:

  1. Goliath is essentially human-shaped.
  2. Lump\(_1\) is not essentially human-shaped.
  3. So, Goliath is not identical to Lump\(_1\).

The plausibility of the two premises seems undeniable, given that we think, for example, that if the room containing Goliath/Lump\(_1\) were to get really hot (hot enough to melt the wax) and then to cool again (so that what was left was a lump of wax in the shape of something like a mountain), then Goliath would be destroyed while Lump\(_1\) would still exist. And the reasoning looks impeccable: if Goliath were Lump\(_1\), then each would have to have all of the same properties as “the other”; since they have different properties, they must not be identical. (Few things in philosophy are as uncontroversial as Leibniz’s Law of the Indiscernibility of Identicals, though there has been some dispute about the proper way of formulating it.) Figuring out how to reconcile our intuitions that (1) and (2) are true with our tendency to think that Goliath and Lump\(_1\) are not really two things but just one is a version of the problem of material constitution. There are a wide variety of ways to deal with this problem. A “two-thinger”—one who thinks that there really are two things, a statue and a lump of wax, in one location—may simply eschew the tendency to identify Goliath and Lump\(_1\). Other responses suggest that there is something amiss with Leibniz Law arguments for nonidentities when there is this kind of an appeal to essential properties: Della Rocca (1996c) holds that such arguments are question begging; Lewis (1971), Gibbard (1975), and Noonan (1991) hold that they are invalid; and Burke (1994) and Rea (2000) hold that in any such argument, at least one of the premises is false. For those who are interested, Rea (1997) and material constitution are good places to start to delve more deeply into this problem.

2. The Whatness Essential/Accidental Property Distinction

Alongside the modal use of ‘essence’ and cognate expressions stands another use with a much older pedigree—it is indeed important in many Socratic dialogues, and central to Aristotle’s metaphysical thinking. This use is tied to what-questions, such as:

(1) What is virtue? What is knowledge?
(2) What is Socrates? What is the number 2?

Answers to such questions specify the essence, in the relevant sense, of what the questions are about. As we suggested in the introduction, given this connection to what-questions, it is appropriate to attach the label ‘whatness’ to ‘essence’, ‘essential’ and cognates when they are understood in this Socratic/Aristotelian sense.

Importantly, whereas some answers to essentialist what-questions may provide “full” or “complete” specifications of the essence of their targets—i.e., they may uniquely identify them, some others only provide “partial” specifications. Plausibly, the answer ‘It is the successor of 1’ to the question ‘What is the number 2?’ is an illustration of the first case and the answer ‘He is human’ to the question ‘What is Socrates?’ an illustration of the second case.

Whatness essence is often associated with the concept of definition: (full or merely partial) answers to essentialist what-questions are often called real definitions of what they are about, where the qualification ‘real’ is used to stress that what is defined is not (except in special cases) words. Aristotle himself regarded definitions as answers to essentialist ‘What is …?’ questions. (See, e.g., Topics 102a3; on Aristotle on essence and definition, see the entry on Aristotle’s Metaphysics, §7. Fine (2015), Rosen (2015) and Correia (2017) propose accounts of real definitions of a broadly Aristotelian flavor, but which involve, in addition to the notion of essence, relations that induce links of comparative fundamentality.)

To the distinction between modal essential and modal accidental properties that we discussed in §1.1 corresponds the distinction between whatness essential and whatness accidental properties. The latter distinction, just like the former, is commonly taken to be exclusive and exhaustive over the class of all the properties had by a given object. This is secured if we characterize whatness accidentality in terms of whatness essentiality along the following lines:

\(P\) is a whatness accidental property of an object \(o\) if and only if both \(o\) has \(P\) and \(P\) is not a whatness essential property of \(o\).

If we assume in addition that the whatness essential properties of an object are had by the object, which is commonly taken for granted, then it follows that for a property to be either whatness accidental or whatness essential to an object, it must be had by that object.

As we stressed in the introduction, the whatness essential/accidental and the modal essential/ accidental distinction are quite different, and plausibly not even coextensive. As we mentioned there, we will discuss these points in §3.

Before we get into this, let us briefly introduce a dimension of whatness essentiality that we have left aside so far, which would deserve extensive elaboration that we cannot provide for reasons of space. The questions in (1) above can be reformulated as follows:

(1a) What is it to be virtuous?
(1b) What is it to know something?

The reformulations can surely be taken to be synonymous with the original questions. But it is also possible to understand them as not being synonymous. On the face of it, each of the questions in (1) makes reference to a given object—virtue or knowledge, as the case may be—and asks what that object is. On this understanding, the questions in (1) are just like the questions in (2) as normally understood. By contrast, it seems that questions (1a) and (1b) are not pointing to any entity at all. Correia (2006) calls essentialist questions of type ‘What is \(o\)?’ objectual and those of type ‘What is it to (be) \(F\)?’, understood in the suggested, non-referential sense, generic—and he uses the same labels to qualify the corresponding answers. Although (to our knowledge) the objectual/generic distinction has only been explicitly discussed recently, both objectual claims and generic claims (the latter perhaps even more) abound throughout the history of philosophy.

The objectual and the generic dimensions of essence are certainly not disconnected. Thus, for instance, it is plausible to hold that if it is part of what Socrates is that he is human (objectual statement), then it is part of what it is to be Socrates that he is human (generic statement)—and this connection generalizes in the obvious way. Or again, it is plausible to hold that if it is part of what \(o\) is that it is \(F\) (objectual statement), and if it is part of what it is to be \(F\) that things that are \(F\) are \(G\) (generic statement), then it is part of what \(o\) is that it is \(G\) (objectual statement). It might even be argued that objectual facts reduce to generic facts (on this, see again Correia 2006).

The views just mentioned are certainly worth discussing in detail, and the same is true of many questions which arise when we inspect, with an eye on the generic dimension, various issues we explore in this entry. But, again, we lack space. (For more on the generic/objectual distinction, see also Correia 2024 and, in a broader context, Fine 2015 and Correia and Skiles 2019.)

3. Is Whatness Essentiality Coextensive With Modal Essentiality?

One might wonder whether there are any significant connections between the modal essential/accidental property distinction and the whatness essential/accidental property distinction. Fine’s influential 1994 paper “Essence and Modality” speaks to this question. The paper has two major movements. In the first, Fine criticizes what he calls the modal account of essence (where Fine uses ‘essence’[6] in the sense of whatness essence). In the second, he presents a “reverse” account—that is, an account of modality (and hence modal essence) in terms of whatness essence. In this section, we are concerned with the first.

By “the modal account of essence” Fine has in mind an elucidation of whatness essentiality in terms of modality that has as a consequence a certain coextensionality thesis that we label ‘MAW’ (for modal account of whatness).[7]

MAW: \(P\) is a whatness essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if \(P\) is a modally essential property of \(o\).

Fine considers two versions of MAW—the core version, which characterizes a modally essential property in line with what we in §1.1 called the core characterization (so that on this version of MAW, \(P\) is a whatness essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if it is necessary that \(o\) has \(P\)) and the existence-conditioned version, which characterizes a modally essential property along lines similar to (but not exactly the same as) what we in §1.1 called the existence-conditioned characterization (so that on this version of MAW, \(P\) is a whatness essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if it is necessary that \(o\) has \(P\) if \(o\) exists). He also mentions a third version but suggests that it collapses into one of the other two.

As we noted in the introduction to this entry, there are many prominent cases in which a property is widely considered both modally essential (accidental) and whatness essential (accidental) to an object. For this reason, MAW may have some initial appeal. Nonetheless, as also noted in the introduction, the right-to-left direction (that is, that modal essentiality is sufficient for whatness essentiality) plausibly fails, for although it is necessary that Socrates is such that 2+2=4, say, his being that way is arguably not part of his whatness essence.

Fine (1994), who accepts the left-to-right direction of MAW (that is, that modal essentiality is necessary for whatness essentiality), provides additional counterexamples to the right-to-left direction. Consider Socrates’s property of being distinct from the Eiffel Tower (if he exists). This property is modally essential to Socrates but not whatness essential to him. In a similar vein, consider Socrates’s property of being a member of the set whose sole member is Socrates (if he exists). Again, we have a property that is modally essential but not whatness essential to Socrates.[8] In an added twist, Fine points to an “asymmetry” between Socrates and {Socrates} (that is, the set whose sole member is Socrates). The property of having Socrates as a member (if {Socrates} exists) is both modally essential and whatness essential to {Socrates}. The three objections against the right-to-left direction of MAW mentioned so far affect both the core version and the existence-conditioned version of MAW. A further objection put forward by Fine, which parallels an objection we mentioned in §1.1 against the existence-conditioned characterization of modal essentiality, affects only the existence-conditioned version of MAW: whereas everything is such that it is trivially necessary that it exists if it exists, existence is intuitively not a whatness essential property of every entity.

Fine (1994) famously claimed that “in the last twenty years or so” the modal account had become “the usual” view concerning the relationship between whatness and modality (p. 3). He did not, however, explicitly cite any philosopher of the relevant period by name. Perhaps Fine thought that his claim was so obviously true that no such citation was needed. In any case, his claim gained traction, especially among philosophers relatively unfamiliar with the literature in modal metaphysics (beginning with Quine in the mid-1950s and continuing through Fine (1994) and beyond). Sometimes these philosophers characterized the view, evidently on Fine’s authority (and without mentioning any specific advocates), as “widespread” (Correia 2007, p. 63), “once the dominant account” (Wildman 2013, p. 760), “once-dominant” (Skiles 2015, p. 100), and “traditional” (Leech 2018, p. 311). Sometimes, they mentioned specific (alleged) advocates. Both Wildman (2021, p. 1456, n.2) and Zylstra (2019, p. 339) cite exactly two still-living (at the time of their writing) philosophers: Kripke (1972/1980) and Plantinga (1974). Certainly, given the tenor of Fine’s paper and given how prominent Kripke and Plantinga were in modal metaphysics, it is natural to take Fine’s view to be that Kripke and Plantinga (and others working in this vein) held the view in question. Indeed, there can be no serious doubt that Fine’s paper suggested this—whether he intended to or not. We here adopt a neutral stance on the question of whether Fine intended to attribute the view to Kripke and Plantinga (and others working in this vein).[9]

Robertson Ishii (2024) argues that the modal account of whatness was not in fact “the usual” view among prominent modal metaphysicians of the relevant period. Importantly, the paper notes that in personal communication, both Kripke and Plantinga denied that they ever held MAW. Although this is not the place to adjudicate these claims, this is a good place to explain one relevant consideration. In the introduction to this entry, we counseled the reader of an author who uses ‘essential’ (and related terms) with no additional adornment (without saying, for example, ‘modally essential’ or ‘whatness essential’) to attend to whether the author uses the modal sense, the whatness sense, or perhaps some other less prominent sense. Consider the following sentence, which is ambiguous since it contains the ambiguous word ‘essential’.

E: \(P\) is an essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if it is necessary that \(o\) has \(P\).

The sentence contains ‘if and only if’, which indicates the material biconditional. However, it is common for philosophers to use such sentences to carry more force than a mere material biconditional. For example, such a sentence may be used to carry definitional force—to stipulate how one will use a term. (Perhaps in such a use, the philosopher implicitly attaches an operator such as ‘it is true by definition that’.) For another example, such a sentence may be used to provide a proposed analysis of a target concept. In such a use, typically (nowadays), the analysandum (the thing being analyzed, the target concept) is indicated by the left-hand side while the analysans (the thing that serves to analyze) is indicated by the right-hand side. (Perhaps in such a use, the philosopher implicitly attaches an operator such as ‘it is true as a matter of analysis that’.)

Philosophers who offer E in a definitional spirit thereby stipulate that they are using ‘essential property’ in the sense of modally essential property (on the core characterization). E itself (as opposed to E together with an implicit operator) then expresses a triviality to the effect that \(P\) is a modally essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if \(P\) is a modally essential property of object \(o\). (Compare the sentence ‘Something is a bachelor if and only if it is an unmarried man’, which, if ‘bachelor’ and ‘unmarried man’ are synonyms, expresses the triviality that something is a bachelor if and only if it is a bachelor—or otherwise put, expresses the triviality that something is an unmarried man if and only if it is an unmarried man.) By contrast, philosophers who have already made clear that they use ‘essential property’ in the sense of whatness essential property, may use E to offer a modal analysis of whatness essentiality. E itself (as opposed to E together with an implicit operator) then expresses a substantive claim to the effect that a thing’s whatness essential properties are all and only its modally essential properties. That is, it expresses the coextensionality claim MAW.

There is no doubt that many analytic modal metaphysicians of the relevant time used (or would have accepted) sentences like E. The question for the reader of such modal metaphysicians is whether in so doing they committed themselves to a triviality or to MAW.

The point here is not that modal metaphysicians who used ‘essential’ in the sense of modally essential were not committed to MAW and that those who used ‘essential’ in the sense of whatness essential were. (Correia (2024, n. 1) offers that Barcan Marcus (1971), another prominent modal metaphysician of the relevant time, “uses ‘essential’ in the Aristotelian sense [that is, the whatness sense] and heavily stresses that essentiality, understood in the Aristotelian way, is not the same as necessity.” If so, then although Barcan Marcus (1971) would have used ‘essential’ in its whatness sense, she eschewed MAW.) The point is that modal metaphysicians who used ‘essential’ in the sense of modally essential and who used (or would have accepted) sentences like E would thereby only have committed themselves to a triviality, not to MAW.

Nor is the point here that modal metaphysicians who used ‘essential’ in the sense of modally essential never concerned themselves with whatness essence. (When Kripke (1980 [1972, p. 125]) talks of the “nature of gold” and of “what this stuff is”, it is natural to take him to be talking about whatness essentiality or something close to it. But obviously how Kripke uses words other than ‘essential’ (for example, ‘nature’) shows little or nothing about how he uses the word ‘essential’ in the relevant contexts.) For more on the topic of the use of ‘essential’ in modal metaphysics of the relevant time, see Robertson Ishii 2024, Correia 2024, (n. 1), Fine 2022, and Robertson Ishii 2025.

Because of these considerations, it is difficult to find absolutely clear cases of philosophers who are committed to MAW—such philosophers would have to make clear that they are using ‘essential’ in the whatness sense rather than the modal sense when they use (or otherwise indicate that they would accept) a sentence like E. Since ‘essential’ was so widely used in the 1970s and 1980s for modal essentiality, the task of finding a philosopher who held such is especially difficult. Consider the opening lines of Cartwright’s once-famous paper, “Some Remarks on Essentialism”.

Essentialism, as I shall understand it, is the doctrine that among the attributes of a thing some are essential, others merely accidental. Its essential attributes are those it has necessarily, those it could not have lacked. Its accidental attributes are those it has only contingently, those it might not have had. Some attributes are essential to everything whatever—the attribute of being self-identical, for example, or perhaps the attribute of having some attribute or other (1968, p. 615).

To argue that this provides evidence that Cartwright held MAW, one would have to establish that he used ‘essential’ in its whatness sense. To establish this, one would have to rule out, among other things, that Cartwright was, in these opening lines, simply stipulating how he would use ‘essential’ in his essay. The task is all the more daunting, given that the examples Cartwright gives (or suggests) of “essential” properties are obviously (or plausibly) modally essential but not whatness essential properties of each and every object. (Indeed, many would find it odd to think that there are any properties that are whatness essential to each and every object.)

The task of finding philosophers committed to MAW is a little easier nowadays, since the use of ‘essential’ for whatness essentiality has become dominant. Koslicki and Raven, after indicating that they are using ‘essence’ in its whatness sense, clearly, even if inadvertently, commit themselves to MAW in their introduction to The Routledge Handbook of Essence in Philosophy:

Traditionally, essences (or natures) [that is, whatness essences] have been taken to play important roles in helping to answer such central questions about existence, identity, persistence, and modality. … If a certain feature is essential to an entity, then (at the very least) the entity in question cannot exist without having the feature in question; a feature that is not essential to any entity is accidental to it. For example, if Socrates is essentially human, but merely accidentally a philosopher, then Socrates must be human if he is to exist at all, but he could have existed without being a philosopher. For example, Socrates could have been an architect (2024, p. 1).

In this passage, Koslicki and Raven say that a feature of Socrates (in their example, being a philosopher) that is whatness accidental to him (that is, that is not whatness essential to him) is a feature that Socrates could have existed without (that is, is a feature that is modally accidental to him). Generalizing (as they clearly intend, since they are trying to make a general point by way of example, which is the natural language equivalent of the logician’s “universal-quantifier introduction” or “universal generalization”), they commit themselves to the claim that any feature that is whatness accidental (that is, not whatness essential) to Socrates is modally accidental (that is, not modally essential) to him. Contraposing, this is to say that any feature of Socrates that is modally essential to him is whatness essential to him. This is an instance of the right-to-left direction of MAW. The claim that any feature of Socrates that is whatness accidental to him is modally accidental to him is thus falsifiable by the Fine’s famous example: the property of being a member of {Socrates} is whatness accidental to Socrates but not modally accidental to him.

Although the main challenges to MAW have been to its right-to-left direction, more recently, Mackie (2020), Leech (2021), and others have attacked the left-to-right direction—that is, the claim that whatness essentiality is sufficient for modal essentiality. To be clear, these challenges are directed not so much to a modal account of whatness that entails MAW, but instead to whatness-essentialist accounts of modality like the one in the second movement of Fine’s “Essence and Modality”—ones that entail MAW’s left-to-right direction.

4. Proposals for Understanding Whatness Essentiality

The main reactions to Fine’s objections to the modal accounts of whatness essentiality have been the following ones.
(I) Take whatness essentiality as primitive, at least as a working hypothesis;
(II) Propose an improved modal account of whatness essentiality designed to escape the objections, at least those that are deemed serious;
(III) Advocate a non-modal account of whatness essentiality.

Option (I) has been advocated in print by Fine (1995, 2015), Correia (2006, 2012, 2020), Oderberg (2007), Lowe (2008, 2012, 2016), Koslicki (2012), Hale (2013, 2018a, 2018b), Kment (2006, 2014), Zylstra (2019a), Godman, Mallozzi & Papineau (2020) and Mallozzi (2021). We will not dwell on it, but let us elaborate a bit on options (II) and (III).

A natural strategy that goes along the lines of (II) is to add to the right-hand-side of the modal accounts a condition that restricts the range of candidate whatness essential properties. Being such that 2+2=4, for instance, is a “cheap” feature, it should obviously be ruled out as a candidate. The suggestion is that a feature is deemed whatness essential to an object if and only if the object necessarily has the feature (or necessarily has it if it exists) and the feature is not cheap. But what can ‘not cheap’ be taken to mean in the present context?

Two suggestions have recently been advocated: (i) ‘not cheap’ means joint-carving (Cowling (2013), Wildman (2013), De Melo (2019)); (ii) ‘not-cheap’ means intrinsic (Denby (2014), Bovey (2021)). The first suggestion looks prima facie tailor-made to get rid of counterexamples to (the right-to-left direction of) MAW that invoke necessary features such as being such that 2+2=4: on the face of it, such features are not joint-carving. The second suggestion arguably gets rid of the singleton counterexample: whereas it is plausible to hold that {Socrates} intrinsically has Socrates as a member, intuitively Socrates is not intrinsically a member of {Socrates}.

However, the merits of these suggestions, especially those of the first suggestion, are highly sensitive to the conception of the extra notion they invoke. To illustrate, consider the following modified existence-conditioned account of whatness essentiality: a feature is whatness essential to an object o if and only if (i) o necessarily has the feature if it exists and (ii) and the feature is joint-carving. Now assume a conception of joint-carvingness à la Sider (2011). Then, plausibly, existence is joint-carving. But if it is joint-carving, then the modified account predicts that existence is whatness essential to everything; that is to say, the modified account is as much as the original account affected by the objection from existence.

This example shows that the extra notion may fail to exclude features that we want to exclude. Other examples show that the extra notion may exclude too much. Take the following thesis of the necessity of biological origins: if organism \(O\) originates from \(X\) (a pair of gametes, say), then necessarily, if \(O\) exists, then \(O\) originates from \(X\). If you are convinced that the thesis is true, then you may also be convinced that the “whatness version” of the thesis is also true: if organism \(O\) originates from \(X\), then it is part of what \(O\) is that it originates from \(X\). But let \(O\) be a human being and \(X\) a given pair of gametes from which \(O\) originated. Originating from \(X\) looks very much like an extrinsic feature of \(O\). Granted that it is an extrinsic feature, taking whatness essential features to be intrinsic necessary features will force you to deny that \(O\) whatness essentially originates from \(X\). See Bovey 2021 for a discussion of this latter objection. For critical assessments of the general strategy under discussion, see Skiles 2015 and Zylstra 2019b.

A third suggestion is inspired by Della Rocca’s (1996a) characterization of trivial necessary features. Della Rocca proposes that a necessary feature of an object is trivial if and only if either (i) it is necessarily had by everything, or (ii) the object’s having that feature is a logical consequence of the object’s having a feature that satisfies (i). The suggestion is simply that ‘not cheap’ means not trivial à la Della Rocca. Being such that \(2+2=4\) satisfies Della Rocca’s condition (i). Being identical to Socrates does not, but it is a Della Rocca trivial feature of Socrates’s according to condition (ii): Socrates’s having this feature is a logical consequence of Socrates’s being self-identical. This latter claim can be formally justified using the resources of lambda abstraction: \((\lambda z)[z = \rSocrates](\rSocrates)\)—read: Socrates has the feature of being identical to Socrates—is indeed a logical consequence of \((\lambda z)[z = z](\rSocrates)\)—read: Socrates has the feature of being self-identical—in standard systems for the lambda calculus.

Interestingly, the same line of thought can be taken to argue that the proposed account is immune from Fine’s singleton example. If the argument just given is acceptable, then Socrates’s being a member of \(\{\rSocrates\}\)—in lambda notation: \((\lambda z)[z \in \{\rSocrates\}](\rSocrates)\)—is a logical consequence of Socrates’s having the feature of belonging to his singleton—in lambda notation: \((\lambda z)[z \in \{z\}](\rSocrates)\). Since belonging to one’s singleton—\((\lambda z)[z \in \{z\}]\)—is a feature necessarily had by everything,[10] being a member of \(\{\rSocrates\}\)—\((\lambda z)[z \in \{\rSocrates\}]\)—is a trivial feature of Socrates by clause (ii) of the definition of trivial feature. However, one cannot get rid of the Eiffel Tower counterexample in the same way.

A similar strategy along the lines of (II) is to add to the right-hand-side of the modal accounts a condition to the effect that the whatness essential properties of an object \(o\) do not make reference to objects that are distinct from \(o\) and on which \(o\) does not ontologically depend. This idea of mixing a modal condition and a condition of ontological dependence is at work in Fine’s (2000) semantics for the logic of essence, but Fine adopts an “instrumentalist” stance towards the semantics—he does not take it to provide an account of essential features. One potential problem with this approach concerns the concept of dependence that is invoked. It is natural to understand ‘x ontologically depends on y’ along the lines of Fine (1995): x ontologically depends on y if and only if x has a whatness essential property that makes reference to y. However, invoking this concept of ontological dependence in the present context would make the account of whatness essentiality circular.

Another option is to invoke a notion of ontological dependence defined in terms of metaphysical grounding, in the style of Correia (2005) and Schnieder (2006) (see below for references on metaphysical grounding). De Rizzo (2022) follows exactly this path. Whereas the general approach looks promising, De Rizzo’s own implementation of the approach may be found questionable. He gives a recursive specification of which sentences of type ˹Γ is/are essentially such that φ˺ are true, where Γ is a term for one or more objects and φ is a sentence, based on the grammatical structure of φ. Proceeding this way forces one to specify in advance which grammatical form φ can have. De Rizzo considers the case where φ is a sentence of a first-order language augmented with an operator for necessity and one for possibility. Yet surely, meaningful sentences of type ˹Γ is/are essentially such that φ˺ are not limited to those where φ is a sentence of such a language—as illustrations, take for instance essentialist sentences involving tense-logical operators like ‘John is essentially such that, sometimes in the future, he dies’ and sentences involving higher-order quantification and epistemic or doxastic operators like ‘God is essentially such that for all \(p\), if she believes \(p\), then \(p\)’. More generally, specifying in advance, for the purpose of a recursive definition, which grammatical form φ must have will leave out some cases. Such an account, one may accordingly complain, is bound to be incomplete.

Yet another strategy along the lines of (II) is to invoke non-orthodox modal notions. Correia (2007) and Brogaard & Salerno (2007a, 2007b, 2013) are in this camp.

Correia (2007) invokes a non-orthodox conception of modality partly inspired by Prior (1957). Correia distinguishes between local and global impossibility (and correspondingly between local and global possibility). A state of affairs is locally impossible if and only if it is impossible and its impossibility has its source in itself; a state of affairs is globally impossible if and only if it is impossible tout court. Thus, Socrates’ being both a philosopher and not a philosopher is locally, and hence globally, impossible, whereas, say, on some Leibnizian view about worlds and God, the non-existence of our world is locally possible but globally impossible (because God necessarily exists and necessarily decided to create our world). Corresponding to the distinction between local and global possibility is the distinction between locally and globally possible worlds. Correia’s account of whatness essentiality goes as follows:

Local Possibility Account: \(P\) is a whatness essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if in every locally possible world where \(o\) is something, \(o\) has \(P\).

Crucially, being something is not equated with existing, otherwise the objection from existence would immediately affect the proposal. Correia argues that Fine’s counterexamples do not affect his account because although they involve features that are had by the relevant objects at all globally possible worlds, or at all globally possible worlds at which they exist, there are locally possible worlds where these objects are something and yet fail to have the features. Fine (2007) argues that his arguments against the modal accounts of whatness essence were directed at accounts which involved standard modal notions, and expresses some sympathy for Correia’s Priorean account. See Torza 2015 for a critical voice.

Brogaard & Salerno (2007a, 2007b, 2013) have defended a version of the modal characterization that relies on a non-standard conception of counterfactuals:

Counterfactual Account: \(P\) is a whatness essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if (1) necessarily, if \(o\) exists, then \(o\) has \(P\) and (2) if nothing had had \(P\), then \(o\) would not have existed.

Standard accounts of counterfactuals have it that counterfactuals with impossible antecedents—so-called counterpossibles—are “vacuously true” (see Stalnaker (1968) and Lewis (1973)). Crucially for their account, Brogaard & Salerno hold that counterpossibles can be false. For example, they would say that the following counterfactuals are false: (a) if nothing had been such that 2+2=4, then Socrates would not have existed; (b) if nothing had been a member of {Socrates}, then Socrates would not have existed. If these counterfactuals are indeed false, then by the proposed account, Socrates is neither whatness essentially such that 2+2=4 nor whatness essentially a member of {Socrates}. Note that the account does not escape the objection from existence. See Steward (2015) and Torza (2015) for further objections.

Let us finally move on to option (III) (see Correia 2024 for a more thorough discussion). Two non-modal accounts of whatness essence have been developed, one by Gorman (2005, 2014) and the other one by Rayo (2013) and then by Correia & Skiles (2019).

Gorman’s account goes as follows:

Grounding Account: \(P\) is a whatness essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if (1) \(P\) is a real property of \(o\) and (2) there is no other real property \(Q\) of \(o\) such that \(o\)’s having \(P\) is at least partially grounded in \(o\)’s having \(Q\).

Appeal to real properties is meant to exclude features such as being such that 2+2=4. The concept of grounding invoked by Gorman is that of metaphysical grounding (see Correia & Schnieder 2012 and metaphysical grounding on that notion).

Gorman takes condition (1) in his account to rule out the properties that Fine invokes in his counterexamples to the modal accounts of essence, and hence suggest that friends of such accounts should add (1) as a restriction on candidate whatness essential properties. However, what Gorman says by way of clarifying what ‘real property’ means in (1) is not enough to make it clear that all the properties invoked by Fine fail to satisfy that condition.

Another objection to the account stems from the fact that it implies that the following cannot be true: an object \(o\) both whatness essentially has \(P\) and whatness essentially has \(Q\), where \(o\)’s having \(P\) is at least partially grounded in \(o\)’s having \(Q\). But why should such situations be ruled out? It seems perfectly coherent to hold that Socrates is both whatness essentially human and whatness essentially an animal, and at the same time that something’s being human is fully grounded in its being an animal and its being rational, from which it follows that Socrates’ being human is partially grounded in his being an animal.

The account of whatness essentiality put forward by Rayo (2013) and Correia & Skiles (2019) invokes the notion of generic identity. The linguistic vehicles of generic identity are, from the point of view of logical grammar, quite different from those of standard (numerical) identity. Whereas statements of standard identity take the form ‘\(a\) is \(b\)’ and cognates, where ‘\(a\)’ and ‘\(b\)’ are singular terms, statements of generic identity take the form ‘To be \(F\) is to be \(G\)’ or ‘To \(F\) is to \(G\)’ and cognates, where ‘\(F\)’ and ‘\(G\)’ are predicate expressions. This grammatical difference is suggestive of a semantic difference: on the face of it, whereas true statements of standard identity involve reference to an entity, true statements of generic identity do not—or at least need not be thought to involve such reference. Rayo as well as Correia & Skiles hold that there indeed is this difference. Despite this difference, generic identity is usually agreed to express something that is somewhat like what standard identity expresses. Just like ‘\(a\) is \(b\)’ holds just in case the bits of reality that ‘\(a\)’ and ‘\(b\)’ pick out are one and the same bit of reality, ‘To be \(F\) is to be \(G\) ’ holds just in case saying that something satisfies ‘is \(F\)’ and saying that that thing satisfies ‘is \(G\)’ amount to describing reality as being the very same way. (See Dorr 2016 for a thorough study of the notion.)

Alongside statements of generic identity stand statements of partial generic identity, i.e., statements of type ‘To \(F\) is in part to \(G\)’. It is natural to understand ‘part’ here as ‘conjunctive part’, and hence to understand partial generic identity in terms of generic identity along the following lines:

(A) To \(F\) is in part to \(G\) if and only if to \(F\) is to \(G\) and \(H\), for some \(H\).

This is the account given by Correia & Skiles. Given plausible principles for the logic of generic identity, (A) is equivalent to:

(B) To \(F\) is in part to \(G\) if and only if to \(F\) is to \(G\) and \(F\).

This is the account given by Rayo. The account of whatness essentiality given by Rayo and Correia & Skiles is framed in terms of partial generic identity, and goes as follows:

Generic Identity Account: \(P\) is a whatness essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if to be (identical to) \(o\) is in part to have \(P\).

Whether the account escapes the objections that were raised against the modal accounts is sensitive to the underlying conception of generic identity. Rayo advocates what we may call a “modal view” of the notion: ‘To \(F\) is to \(G\)’ holds if and only if ‘Necessarily, for all x, x \(F\)s if and only if x \(G\)s’ holds. This view makes the generic identity account equivalent to the existence-conditioned modal account, or at least close enough to be affected by some or all the objections in question. (The account is equivalent to the existence-conditioned modal account if existing is taken to be necessarily equivalent to being something and some weak principles of quantified modal logic are accepted.)

Rayo’s modal view is counterintuitive, as Correia & Skiles contend. Intuitively, for instance, contrary to what the view implies, to be Socrates is not to be a member of {Socrates}—nor is it to be a member of {Socrates} and to be Socrates; and to be Socrates is not to be distinct from the Eiffel Tower and to be Socrates. If these latter views that we qualify as intuitive are correct, then Fine’s singleton example and his Eiffel Tower example do not threaten the proposed account. Likewise, being such that 2+2=4 and existing intuitively do not count as whatness essential on the generic identity account.

5. Proposals for Understanding Modal Essentiality

On both the core characterization and the existence-conditioned characterization, the concept of modal essentiality is parasitic upon the concept of necessity: according to the former, a modally essential property of an object is a property the object necessarily has, and according to the latter, a modally essential property of an object is a property the object both has and necessarily has if it exists. Hence, how modal essentiality is understood is determined by how necessity is understood. Here we run through some important accounts of necessity and the corresponding accounts of modal essentiality.

Proposals for understanding necessity can be divided into reductionist accounts and non-reductionist accounts. Reductionist accounts propose that necessity can be understood entirely in terms of non-modal notions, while non-reductionist accounts deny that necessity can be so understood. Let us consider some important reductionist accounts and then some important non-reductionist ones.

In contemporary analytic metaphysics, the most widely discussed reductionist accounts are probably Lewis’s (1986) and Fine’s (1994).

According to Lewis, necessity can be understood roughly along the lines outlined in §1 of this entry, where possible worlds are invoked in order to make sense of modal discourse. Lewis identifies possible worlds with concrete physical universes, causally and spatiotemporally isolated from each other. Our own physical universe, the actual world, is simply the universe that we happen to inhabit, and it is not metaphysically special compared to other possible worlds, just as the house that I happen to inhabit is not metaphysically special compared to other houses. Furthermore, if \(o\) is an object that exists in a certain possible world, then \(o\) is not identical to any object that exists in any other possible world. However, a “counterpart” of \(o\) may exist in some other possible world, where a counterpart of \(o\) is, roughly, some object that sufficiently resembles \(o\). This forces Lewis to treat modal claims differently depending on whether they are de dicto or de re. For Lewis, a claim to the effect that a proposition is necessary, where the proposition does not specifically involve any object, is true if and only if the proposition is true in all possible worlds. In case the proposition does specifically involve one or more objects, the truth of the necessity claim depends on counterparts. On Lewis’s account, in particular, discourse about \(o\)’s modally essential properties is reduced to discourse about the properties that \(o\)’s counterparts have in other universes.

Counterpart Account: \(P\) is a modally essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if every counterpart of \(o\) in every possible world has \(P\).

(To be accurate, the Counterpart Account is Lewis’s account in case \(P\) is a property that doesn’t involve any object—unlike, e.g., the property of being smarter than Socrates or the property of being between Paris and London; for properties that do involve objects, the account has to be modified in a way that appeals to counterparts of these objects. We leave the details aside.) Granted that everything in a possible world is a counterpart of itself, a view that Lewis endorses, the account entails that if \(P\) is a modally essential property of \(o\), then \(o\) has \(P\). Interestingly, in Lewis’s framework, the distinction between the core characterization and the existence-conditioned characterization of modal essentiality is immaterial: ‘Necessarily, \(o\) has \(P\)’ and ‘Necessarily, \(o\) has \(P\) if \(o\) exists’ have the same truth-conditions. They are true if and only if \(P\) is a modally essential property of \(o\) in the sense of the Counterpart Account. (We again ignore cases where \(P\) is about specific objects.) For a more detailed discussion of Lewis’s account, including motivations for his account and objection against it, see §8 of David Lewis’s metaphysics.

Fine’s (1994) view is that necessity is to be understood in terms of whatness essence. His account presupposes that (i) whatness essentialist attributions can be irreducibly collective, and that (ii) what is whatness essential to one or more objects is, fundamentally, not that they have certain features, but rather that something is the case. The account goes as follows: it is necessary that \(p\) if and only if for some object/objects \(X\), it is whatness essential to \(X\) that \(p\). What motivated Fine to take (ii) on board was his willingness to formulate whatness essentialist claims in a way that is as close as possible to the standard, sentential way of formulating modal claims (see Fine 2015). Taking (i) on board is quite natural given the shape of the account and certain necessary truths. For instance, it is necessary that Socrates is distinct from the Eiffel Tower (let us assume). But it is not plausible to hold that there is a single object whose whatness essence guarantees that Socrates is distinct from the Eiffel Tower: Socrates alone intuitively does not do the job, neither does the Eiffel Tower, and if it is not one of them, then it is not clear which other object could do it. Holding that Socrates and the Eiffel Tower jointly do the job sounds at least prima facie plausible. That said, the Finean account of modal essentiality goes as follows:

Whatness Account (Core Version): \(P\) is a modally essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if for some object/objects \(X\), it is whatness essential to \(X\) that \(o\) has \(P\).
Whatness Account (Existence-Conditioned Version): \(P\) is a modally essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if \(o\) has \(P\) and for some object/objects \(X\), it is whatness essential to \(X\) that \(o\) has \(P\) if \(o\) exists.

Importantly, the Whatness Account does not rule out cases where a property is modally essential to an object and it is not whatness essential to this very object that it has the property (or that it has it if it exists). The Socrates / Eiffel Tower example illustrates the point: if the previous considerations are correct, then being distinct from the Eiffel Tower is a modally essential property of Socrates, but it is whatness essential to Socrates and the Eiffel Tower taken together, not to Socrates alone, that he has that property.

Correia (2012, 2020) elaborates on Fine’s account of necessity, taking on board Fine’s (1995) brief suggestion that the nature of the logical concepts is inferential rather than propositional in nature. Fine’s general view that necessity has its source in whatness essence has been endorsed in print, in various specific forms, by Kment (2006, 2014), Lowe (2012), Hale (2018) and Correia & Skiles (2022). For critical discussions of this view, see Hale 2018, Van Cleve 2018, Teitel 2019, Werner 2021, Wildman 2021 and Bovey 2022. Correia 2024 contains a compact discussion of Fine’s view and its critics which covers a significant part of the literature.

As for non-reductionist accounts, some treat necessity as primitive in that it is explanatorily prior even to the notion of a possible world. Examples here include Prior & Fine (1977), Forbes (1989), Peacocke (1999), and deRosset (2014). Stalnaker also suggests this view when he writes that

modal notions are basic notions, like truth and existence … One clarifies such notions, not by reducing them to something else, but by developing one’s theories in terms of them … I see the apparatus of possible worlds, not as a metaphysics, but as a framework for representing one’s commitments, and for clarifying disagreements between people with conflicting commitments (2003, pp. 7–8).

Note, however, that these theorists still sometimes attempt to explicate the notion of a possible world. For example, Prior & Fine explicate the notion in terms of propositions of a certain sort, Stalnaker explicates the notion in terms of properties of a certain sort, and deRosset explicates the notion in terms of model interpretations of a certain sort. Some other accounts of possible worlds include: Plantinga’s account (1974), where possible worlds are understood as maximal possible states of affairs; Adams’s account (1981), where possible worlds are understood as maximal consistent sets of propositions; and Salmon’s account (1989), where possible worlds are understood as maximal scenarios that might have obtained. Since the terms ‘possible’, ‘consistent’, and ‘might’ convey modal notions, these accounts are not reductionist in our sense. The literature on the metaphysics of possible worlds is vast, so there is significantly more to be said. For a starting point, see possible worlds.

There has also been a trend in analytic metaphysics to develop non-reductionist accounts of metaphysical modality that dispense with possible worlds. Let us conduct a brief survey of some of these accounts. Jubien (2007) proposes that necessity can be understood in terms of a certain relation between properties. This is the entailment relation. He regards entailment as a primitive modal relation, though we can say minimally that \(P\) entails \(Q\) if and only if it is not possible for something to have \(P\) without also having \(Q\). Thus, being a horse entails being an animal. According to Jubien, this is exactly why it is necessarily true that horses are animals. Furthermore, for any given object, there is the property of being that very object. The following account now suggests itself:

Property Entailment Account (Existence-Conditioned Version): \(P\) is a modally essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if \(o\) has \(P\) and \(P\) is entailed by the property of being \(o\).

That this account corresponds to the existence-conditioned notion of modal essentiality follows from Jubien’s view that \(P\) entails \(Q\) if and only if it is necessary that everything that has \(P\) has \(Q\) and basic principles of quantified modal logic with identity. It is unclear whether a core version of the account is available in this framework.

Other non-reductionist accounts appeal to dispositions (Borghini & Williams 2008), powers (Jacobs 2010), or potentialities (Vetter 2015), all understood as modal notions. The basic idea can be illustrated with the notion of a disposition. Roughly, to say that something is disposed to \(F\) is to say that it could easily \(F\) if certain conditions obtained. For example, to say that the lamp is disposed to break is to say that the lamp could easily break if certain conditions obtained. If these conditions actually obtain and the lamp actually breaks, then we say that the disposition is manifested. We can now characterize metaphysical possibility roughly as follows: \(p\) is possibly true if and only if there is some disposition whose manifestation includes a scenario where \(p\) is true (Borghini & Williams 2008, p. 26). Extrapolating from this idea, we can characterize modal essentiality roughly as follows:

Dispositional Account (Core Version): \(P\) is a modally essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if there is no disposition whose manifestation includes a scenario where \(o\) does not have \(P\).
Dispositional Account (Existence-Conditioned Version): \(P\) is a modally essential property of an object \(o\) if and only if \(o\) has \(P\) and there is no disposition whose manifestation includes a scenario where \(o\) exists and \(o\) does not have \(P\).

Analogous accounts of metaphysical possibility can be given in terms of powers or potentialities. Of course, the above is only a rough approximation of the idea. Much more needs to be said about dispositions (or powers or potentialities). For details, see the sources cited above. For further discussion, see Wang 2015, Warmke 2016, and Vetter 2011, 2013, 2021.

Closely related are non-reductionist accounts that invoke counterfactuals, expressed by subjunctive conditionals along the lines of ‘If \(p\) were the case, then \(q\) would be the case’. Counterfactuals are thought to be closely related to dispositions. For example, if the lamp is disposed to break, then the following sort of counterfactual will be true: ‘If such and such conditions were to obtain, then the lamp would break’. The idea here is to explicate necessity in terms of counterfactuals and then treat modally essential properties in the standard way. Bird (2007) observes that \(p\) is necessarily true if and only if the following counterfactual is true: If \(p\) were false, then \(p\) would be true. Because of the connection between dispositions and counterfactuals, he regards this as providing a “dispositional analysis of necessity” (2007, n. 146). For other accounts of modality that invoke counterfactuals, see Williamson 2007 and Lange 2009.

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Acknowledgments

The authors would like to thank to Nathan Wildman, Peter Montecuollo, Clark Sexton, and Edward Zalta for comments and suggestions.

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Philip Atkins <philip.atkins@temple.edu>
Fabrice Correia <fabricecorreia@gmail.com>
Teresa Robertson Ishii <trobertson@philosophy.ucsb.edu>

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